Plato’s Middle Period Metaphysics and Epistemology

First published Mon Jun 9, 2003; substantive revision Mon Jul 14, 2014

Students of Plato and other ancient philosophers divide philosophy into three parts: Ethics, Epistemology and Metaphysics. While generally accurate and certainly useful for pedagogical purposes, no rigid boundary separates the parts. Ethics, for example, concerns how one ought to live and focuses on pleasure, virtue, and happiness. Since, according to Plato (and Socrates), virtue and happiness require knowledge, e.g., knowledge of goods and evils, Plato's ethics is inseparable from his epistemology. Epistemology is, broadly speaking, the study of what knowledge is and how one comes to have knowledge. Among the many topics included in epistemology are logic, belief, perception, language, science, and knowledge. (‘Science’ derives from the Latin ‘scientia’, which in turn translates the Greek ‘episteme’, from which English derives ‘epistemology’.) Integral to all of these notions is that they (typically) are directed at something. Words refer to something; perception (aesthesis in Greek) involves perceptibles; knowledge requires a known. In this respect, epistemology cannot be investigated without regard to what there is.

Metaphysics, or alternatively ontology, is that branch of philosophy whose special concern is to answer the question ‘What is there?’ These expressions derive from Aristotle, Plato's student. In a collection of his works, the most detailed treatise on the general topic of things that are comes after a treatise on natural things, ta phusika (from which English derives ‘physics’). Since the Greek for ‘after’ is meta, this treatise is titled ‘Metaphysics’. In that work one finds the famous formula that (first) philosophy studies being—the Greek for which is on—qua being. Hence the account of being is ‘ontology’—the English suffix ‘-ology’ signifying ‘study of’: e.g., biology is the study of living things.

Metaphysics, then, studies the ways in which anything that is can be said or thought to be. Leaving to sciences like biology or physics or mathematics or psychology the task of addressing the special ways in which physical things, or living things, or mathematical objects, e.g., numbers, or souls (minds) come to have the peculiar qualities each, respectively, has, the subject-matter of metaphysics are principles common to everything. Perhaps the most general principle is: to be is to be something. Nothing just exists, we might say. This notion implies that each entity/item/thing has at least some one feature or quality or property. Keeping at a general level, we can provisionally distinguish three factors involved when anything is whatever it is: there is that which bears or has the property, often called the ‘subject’, e.g., Socrates, the number three, or my soul; there is the property which is possessed; e.g., being thin, being odd, and being immortal; and there is the manner or way in which the property is tied or connected to the subject. For instance, while Socrates may be accidentally thin, since he can change, that is, gain and lose weight, three cannot fail to be odd nor, if Plato is correct, can the soul fail to be immortal. The metaphysician, then, considers physical or material things as well as immaterial items such as souls, god and numbers in order to study notions like property, subject, change, being essentially or accidentally.

1. The Background to Plato's Metaphysics

Three predecessors heavily influenced Plato's thoughts on metaphysics and epistemology, Heraclitus (c. 540 B.C.–480–70), Parmenides (c.515 B.C.–449–40), and Socrates (470 B.C.–399). Only fragments remain of the writings of Parmenides and Heraclitus, including some contained in the dialogues of Plato. Socrates wrote nothing. Plato's depiction of his teacher is our primary source of evidence for his philosophy. Parmenides argued that there is and could be only one thing, Being. One could not even think or say what is not. Moreover, since change implies that something comes to be what it was not—I change from not being tan to being tan, nothing can change. Reality is static. The appearance of change is just that, a deceptive appearance. Unfortunately, what little we have left of Parmenides does not allow us to decide whether he argued that there is just one item, Being, in his universe—strict numerical monism—or whether there is just one kind of thing, beings or things that are. Parmenides' account of Being seems to have contributed to Plato's doctrine of Forms.

Heraclitus is the apostle of change. For Heraclitus, the ordinary objects of the physical world seem to be continually changing. The only constant, the underlying commonality, is the pattern of change itself. That there are entities that do not change is, for Heraclitus, an illusion. Heraclitus' notion of ‘flux’ seems to have influenced Plato's thinking about ordinary material objects.

In the opinion of most scholars, the seminal influence on all of Plato's thinking was Socrates. However, it appears from the writings of Plato, as well as those of the historian Xenophon and the comic poet Aristophanes, that Socrates was almost exclusively interested in ethics. This is not to say that metaphysical or epistemological issues were of no concern to him. Rather, these sources convey the impression that Socrates was not particularly interested in articulating a metaphysical or epistemological theory (see Vlastos 1991a). Rather, concerned with caring for the soul so that one might live happily (Apology 29d-30b), he uses both epistemological and metaphysical theses in search of answers to his ethical questions. However, it is not easy to distinguish when one is engaged in metaphysical theorizing from when is merely using metaphysical notions. The claim that Socrates was not a metaphysician or epistemologist is particularly hard to evaluate, for we have basically only Plato's dialogues as evidence. Since Plato uses Socrates as a mouthpiece in many of his writings, readers are forced to ask when or whether one is reading the doctrines of Socrates, or Plato, or neither. This ‘Socratic question’ is intimately involved with the question of Plato's development and the chronology of his dialogues.

In all likelihood, Plato wrote different dialogues at different times. We typically divide his writings into three periods. In the early ‘Socratic’ period, we find Apology, Crito, Euthyphro, Charmides, Ion, Lysis, Laches, Hippias Minor, Menexenus, Euthydemus and the Protagoras. The Hippias Major, Gorgias and perhaps the Meno belong to the end of this period, maybe with the Gorgias and more likely the Meno verging into the middle period. The middle period works include the Cratylus, Symposium, Phaedo, Republic and perhaps the Phaedrus. In the post-Republic phase we then find the Parmenides, Theaetetus, Sophist, Politicus, Timaeus, Philebus and Laws, along with the Critias.^[1] The Socratic dialogues, so-called because Socrates is always the chief interlocutor, are thought to present doctrines of Socrates himself. These are dialogues devoted to ethical inquiries into the virtues, e.g., what is courage, or what is justice? In contrast, the middle period dialogues are thought to present the views of Plato, though nonetheless Socrates remains the speaker. Here for the first time we find remarks about the immortality of the soul, about special entities called ‘Forms’ that exist outside of space and time and that are both the objects of knowledge and somehow the cause of whatever transpires in the physical world, and the doctrine of recollection, the thesis that the immortal soul, in a disembodied state prior to its incarceration in a body, viewed these Forms, knowledge of which is then recalled by incarcerated souls through a laborious process. Socrates, in the early Apology, is non-committal about the immortality of the soul. Similarly, in the early dialogues we find that Socrates, in keeping with the claim that he is neither a metaphysician nor epistemologist, has nothing to say about recollection and never explicitly appeals to Forms. It is thus in the middle period works that one locates Plato's first thoughts about epistemological and metaphysical issues. To those topics we shall turn shortly. But these are, in the eyes of many, just first thoughts; for the dialogues in the late period suggest changes to key ethical, epistemological and metaphysical doctrines found in these middle period works. Over the course of the last fifty years, scholars have debated whether and to what extent Plato changed his views. The debate has grown so involved that it is perhaps best not to worry whether anyone believes the extreme positions that, on the one hand, Plato conceived of every one of his major doctrines before he ever wrote, or, on the other hand, that he changed his mind on central theses from one dialogue to the next. Broadly speaking, those who maintain that Plato keeps to his central theses from one period to the next are Unitarians (see, for instance, Shorey 1903). Those who believe that he changes his views from one period to the next are Developmentalists (see, for instance, Owen 1986a). The most plausible position, and the perhaps the dominant position in the contemporary scholarship, is somewhere in the middle. About some theses, Plato, over the course of his writings, expands his thoughts, recognizes difficulties, and even changes his mind. About other theses he stands by his fundamental insights.

A prime example of the interpretative problems facing the student of Plato is the development of his most distinctive doctrine, the theory of Forms. Aristotle, in recounting Plato's intellectual development, reports that “Socrates was the first to seek the universal in ethical matters but that he did not separate it. Plato, marrying Socrates' philosophy with that of Heraclitus, separated the universal, on the grounds that the sensible order, where Socrates had focused, was in flux.” Plato, Aristotle tells us, called these separated universals ‘Forms’ (Metaphysics 1078b12–34). Universal is a technical notion in metaphysics: a universal is that which is predicable of many. It is meant to capture the intuition that a variety of things can all have the same feature or property. For instance, a bowling ball, a basketball, and a figure drawn on a blackboard can all be round. What many things have in common, or a feature they share, is a universal or, in Plato's terms, a Form. Of course there seems to be a huge number of properties. Many different things are white. Many different things are animals. Each (shared) property is a universal—a ‘one over many instances,’ whiteness over the many white things, roundness over the many round things, and so on. Thus, for Plato, Roundness and Whiteness are Forms. Following the lead of Aristotle, scholars have focused on what it means for Plato, in contrast to Socrates, to have separated his universals, the Forms. The starting point, then, for the study of Plato's metaphysics, is the Socratic dialogues and Socrates' investigation into universals of the ethical variety, namely Justice, Piety, Courage and others.

In the early dialogues, Socrates seeks these ethical universals through a distinctive mode of inquiry, the ‘elenchus’ (see Vlastos 1992; Kraut 1983). Elenctic inquiry is fundamentally a form of cross-examination, where Socrates tries to elicit from others their beliefs about matters of justice or piety, etc. Typically the result is that his interlocutors turn out to have an inconsistent set of beliefs about the virtues. At the heart of the Socratic elenchus is the ‘What is X’ question (where ‘X’ typically names an ethical property). The answers offered to these questions fail usually because they are too narrow or too wide. An answer is too narrow if it fails to include all cases. An answer is too wide if, while it includes all cases of, for instance, piety, it also includes other things, cases of justice or impiety. We can infer from these failed definitions a set of conditions Socrates places on an adequate answer to his ‘What is X’ questions. He is seeking an answer which picks out a Socratic Property, e.g., Piety, that is a universal such that: it is found whenever and wherever there is an instance of Piety; and it ‘causes’ or ‘makes’ the instance to be such as it is. Piety's power to make, e.g., Socrates, pious derives from Piety's itself being pious. Piety self-predicates: Piety is pious. Because it is pious, when Piety is present to/in Socrates, Piety causes Socrates to be pious. In the Socratic dialogues Plato does not distinguish the (metaphysical) way in which Socrates is pious from the way in which Piety is pious—in these dialogues there appears to be just one ontological predication relation. One has knowledge of a Socratic Property when she can give an account (logos) that says what X is, that is, when she can give the definition of the property under investigation. Treating a definition as a linguistic item, we can say that the definition specifies or picks out the essence (ousia) of the property, and a definitional statement predicates the essence of the property whose essence it is. It is unclear from the Socratic dialogues whether any other property is predicated of a Socratic Property: arguably Piety is pious and only pious. In contrast, the things that are pious, e.g., Socrates or saying a prayer, have many properties. From what we can infer from Plato's remarks in these early dialogues, and from Aristotle's remarks, a Socratic property is in the sensibles—It is an immanent universal. In this respect, the essence of Piety is also found in Socrates (and thus the linguistic definition of Piety is also linguistically predicable of Socrates). Plato's distinctive ‘separation of the universal’ might then be viewed as his rejection of Socrates' assumption that the universal (and/or its essence) is in the sensibles, (and accordingly a rejection of Socrates' assumption that the definition is predicable, or predicable in the same way, of the sensible instances as well as the universal.) If Aristotle is right, Plato's problem with sensibles is that they change.

2. The Metaphysics of the Phaedo

The Phaedo is Plato's eulogy to Socrates. It recounts the last hours of Plato's teacher. Socrates/Plato wants to convince us that we should care about our souls and that the best way to care for the soul is to live philosophically. Towards that end we find a series of arguments whose aim is to prove the immortality of the soul. At least three of these arguments, the Argument from Recollection and its prelude (65a-67a and 72e-78b), the Affinity Argument (78b-84b), and the Final Argument (102a-107a) and its prelude (95a-102a), are crucial for understanding Plato's initial thoughts on metaphysics and epistemology. Here Plato draws a contrast between unchanging Forms and changing material particulars. Unfortunately, neither in the Phaedo nor in any other dialogue do we find Plato giving a detailed description of the nature of Forms, or particulars, or their interaction. What is referred to as Plato's theory of Forms is thus a rational reconstruction of Plato's doctrine. In such a reconstruction scholars try to determine a set of principles or theses which, taken together, allow us to show why Plato says what he does about Forms, souls, and other metaphysical items. In the attempt to make more precise what Plato is after, one risks attributing to Plato notions that are either not his or not as well developed in Plato as scholars would hope. Perhaps the notion of a particular is such a case. Intuitively, particulars are things like my dog Ajax, Venus, my computer, and so on, the ordinary material things of the everyday spatio-temporal world. (But we also speak of particular actions, particular events, particular souls, and much else.) In a rational reconstruction, we can be more precise by stipulating, for instance, that a particular is that of which properties are predicated and which is never predicated of anything (or anything other than itself). This ‘stipulated definition’ is nowhere in Plato, though it may well capture his thinking about ordinary particulars. For the sake of exposition, I will assume that in the Phaedo Plato is appealing to our naïve, intuitive understanding of what it is for something to be a material particular. In the author's opinion, the metaphysics of the Phaedo and other middle period works is devoted to developing the account of Forms; perhaps because while most of us think that included in what there is are the various, e.g., dogs, people, mountains and trees, few of us ever think about whether there is some universal/Form, Justice Itself, The Large Itself, and so on, that exists outside of space and time. (In the late dialogues, especially the Timaeus and Philebus, Plato attempts to give a systematic account of material particulars.)

The argument of the Phaedo begins from Plato's assertion that the soul seeks freedom from the body so that it may best grasp truth, because the body hinders and distracts it: the soul comes to be separate (choris) from the body, itself by itself ((aute kath auten) (64c5–8)). The senses furnish no truth; those senses about the body are neither accurate nor clear. The soul reckons best when it is itself by itself, i.e., not in contact with body (65a-65d3). At this juncture, Socrates changes course:

What about these things? Do we say that justice itself is something? Of course. And the fair and the good? Surely. Then have you ever seen any of these sorts of things with your eyes? In no way. But then have you grasped them with any other sense through the body. I am talking about all (of them), for instance about size, health, strength, in a word about the essence (ousia) of all of them, what each happens to be. Is it through the body then that what is most true of these things is contemplated? Or does it hold thus? Whoever of us should prepare himself to consider most accurately each thing itself about which he inquires, that one would come closest to knowing each thing. … he would do this most cleanly …who using his intellect itself by itself, unmixed would undertake to hunt down each of the beings, itself by itself unmixed (65d4–66a3).

This is the first passage in the dialogues widely agreed to introduce Forms. First, Forms are marked as auto kath auto beings, beings that are what they are in virtue of themselves. In subsequent arguments we learn other features of these Forms. From the next argument concerning Recollection (see §11), Forms are said to be perfect and what particulars strive to be like but fall short of. Then in the Affinity Argument we discover that Forms are simple or incomposite, of one form (monoeidetic), whereas particulars are complex, divisible and of many forms. In the crucial Final Argument, Plato finally presents the hypothesis of Forms to explain coming into being and destruction, in general, i.e., change. Once Cebes accepts the hypothesis, a novel implication is announced (100c3–7):

Well then, consider what then follows if you also accept my hypothesis. For it seems to me that if anything else is beautiful besides Beauty Itself, it is beautiful on account of nothing else than because it partakes of Beauty Itself. And I speak in the same way about everything else. Do you accept this sort of cause or explanation?^[2]

In this passage, Plato introduces two predication relations, Being and Partaking. Understanding how Being and Partaking function to ‘tie’ together the various subjects and properties mentioned in his metaphysical discussions is crucial to reconstructing his metaphysics and epistemology. At first blush, it seems that there are two kinds of subjects of which properties are predicated, namely Forms and material particulars. (I exempt souls from this list). Similarly, at first blush it seems that there are Forms for every property involved in the changes afflicting material particulars.^[3] For instance, since particulars, e.g. Helen of Troy, change from being not-beautiful to being beautiful, there is the Form Beauty Itself. In this passage, Plato asserts that particulars like Helen, because she is not the Form but rather is a material particular, is related to, or ‘tied to’ Beauty in virtue of what he calls ‘partaking.’ Beauty Itself, on the other hand, not being something ‘other than Beauty’, does not partake of Beauty—it simply is beautiful. Generalizing from what is said here about Beauty Itself, it seems that Forms inherit from the Socratic Properties their self-predicational status: Beauty is beautiful; Justice is just; Equality is equal. Partaking in Beauty makes Helen beautiful because Beauty Itself is beautiful. Call this way in which a Form is related to the property it is ‘Being’. Understanding Being, the way in which Beauty is beautiful, that is, determining what it is for a Form to self-predicate, is central to understanding Plato's Theory of Forms and his middle period metaphysics.

3. The Nature of Forms: Self-Predication

The debate over self-predication involves both statements and what the statements are about, i.e., the ontological correlates of those statements. (Thus at times it may be important to distinguish linguistic predication from ontological predication.) In investigating self-predication statements, perhaps it is again easiest to distinguish three factors, the subject or subject term, ‘The Just’, the linking verb, ‘is’, and the predicate adjective ‘just’. Apparently both the subject and the predicate adjective, ‘The Just’ and ‘just’, refer to the same thing, namely the Form of Justice. One question then concerns the copula, or linking verb: in what manner is the predicate related to the subject, or how is the Form related to itself? There are three basic approaches to consider. In his seminal discussion of self-predication, Vlastos maintained that we should understand the relation between the Form and itself to be the same as that between a particular and the Form (Vlastos 1981d). This is to say that Justice is just in the same way as Socrates is just, or that Beauty is beautiful in the same way as Helen is beautiful, or that the Circle Itself is circular in the same way as my basketball: both are round. Let us label this way of understanding the copula in self-predication statements ‘characterization’. Then Beauty is a beautiful thing, an item to be included in an inventory of beautiful things right along with Helen.

Some scholars, e.g., John Malcolm (1981), while accepting this characterizing reading of the ‘is’, deny that the property predicated of the Form and the particular are exactly the same. According to the Approximationist, the Form is the perfect instance of the property it stands for. A particular that participates in the Form is an imperfect or deficient instance in that it has a property that approximates the perfect nature of the Form. For instance, the Circle Itself is perfectly circular. A drawn circle, or a round ball, is deficient in that it is not perfectly circular, not exactly 360 degrees in circumference. It follows that the very properties particulars possess will differ from the property ‘of the same name’ possessed by the Form. If Beauty Itself is characterized by perfect beauty, then Helen has imperfect beauty and she does not have perfect beauty. Since nothing rules out that there are numerous kinds of imperfect beauty, perhaps as many as there are beautiful participants, it seems either that there is no one kind of beauty that particulars have in common, or that there are one or more (commonly shared) imperfect kinds of beauty. In the former case, there will be no need to posit a ‘one’ over the many beauties. In the latter case, there is every reason to posit a Form(s) of Imperfect Beauty in which the commonly qualified imperfect particulars participate. Neither alternative is a happy one. While the appeal to the perfection of the mathematical properties is great, even in these cases it is doubtful that Plato adopts an approximationist strategy (see Nehamas 1999b; 1999c).

An alternative is to allow that while both Beauty Itself and other items are characterized by beauty, Beauty Itself is simply and solely beautiful. This characterizing variant emphasizes the Phaedo's claims that a Form is monoeides and one (Phaedo 78b4ff). Beauty is nothing but beautiful and thus is completely beautiful, differing from other beautiful things in that they are much else besides beautiful. Helen is a woman and unfaithful and beautiful.^[4]

According to the second approach (see Cherniss 1977a; Allen 1965), self-predication statements assert identity between the Form and its essence. The ‘is’ is an ‘is’ of identity. We should not then understand ‘Beauty Itself is beautiful’ to assert that (the Form) Beauty is characterized by beauty. (Indeed, typically backers of this approach exclude the possibility that a Form is characterized by the property it is, thus, e.g., eliminating Beauty from a list of beautiful objects.^[5]) Since Identity accounts treat self-predications as asserting that a Form and its essence are identical, with respect to Forms, Being and Identity can be viewed as the same relation in the middle period dialogues.^[6]

The third approach, the Predicationalist (see Nehamas 1999c; Code 1986; Silverman 2002), joins with the Identity approach in denying that self-predication statements signal that the Form is characterized by the property it constitutes. And while ultimately it allows that a Form and its essence are identical, it does not regard the self-predication statement itself as an identity claim (see Code 1986; Silverman 2002 Ch. 3). Rather, a self-predication claim asserts that there is a special primitive kind of ontological relation between a Form (subject) and its essence (predicate). This approach begins from the two relations of Partaking and Being introduced in the last argument of the Phaedo. An intuitive first approximation of their respective functions is to treat Partaking as a relation between material particulars and Forms, the result of which is that the particular is characterized by the Form of which it partakes. So, Helen, by partaking of Beauty, is characterized by beauty; Helen, in virtue of partaking, is (or, as we might say, becomes) beautiful. All particulars are characterized by the Forms in which each participates, and whatever each is, it is by partaking in the appropriate Form. On this account, then, there can be Forms for each and every property had by particulars (Phaedo 100–101, esp. 100c6). In contrast to the characterizing relation of Partaking, the relation of Being is always non-characterizing. Each Form, F, is its essence (ousia), which is to say that the relation of Being links the essence of beauty to the subject, Beauty Itself.^[7] Being, then, is a primitive ontological relation designed exclusively to capture the special tie between that which possesses an essence and the essence possessed. Put differently, whenever essence is predicated of something, the relation of Being is at work. (By ‘primitive’ I do not mean to suggest that Plato does not study (what) Being (is). Nor do I mean to suggest that everything else in the metaphysics can somehow be deduced from it. Rather, I mean to indicate that the relation of Being is not explained by appeal to another more basic relation or principle. Its nature, and the nature of other primitives in the theory, such as Participating, is displayed in the ways in which the theory attempts to save various phenomena.)

4. The Simplicity of Forms

Throughout the dialogues, Forms are said to be one, hen, or monoeides. (See especially the Affinity Argument in the Phaedo, 78b-84b.) These passages suggest that the self-predicational nature of Forms implies that the only property predicable of a Form is itself: i.e., Justice is just and the only thing Justice is is just. (There are epistemological reasons that support this reading: See §11 infra.) But other passages suggest that Forms cannot be simple in this strict sense. From the Republic we know that all Forms are related to the Good. While it is difficult to be certain, Plato seems committed to the claim that each Form is good, that is, that each Form is a good thing or is characterized by goodness.^[8]

More doubts about the strict simplicity of Forms emerge from reflection on the nature of definition in Plato's middle period. Ontologically, all definitions predicate the essence of the Form whose essence it is. Plato is attempting to discover through scientific investigation, or (inclusive or) through an analysis of what words mean, or through any other method, what the nature of, say, Justice is—compare the ways in which philosophers and scientists work to discover what, e.g., gold, or red, or justice, is. Ultimately, then, the answer to any ‘what is X?’ question will be some specific formula unearthed at the end of much study. According to this line of reasoning, the self-predication statements in the texts are promissory notes, shorthand for what will turn out to be the fully articulated definition. Plato is thus committed to there being Forms whose nature or essence will ultimately be discovered. To say that ‘Justice is just’ is then to stake a claim to the ultimate discovery of the nature of Justice. The problem is that the fully articulated linguistic definition, when it is ultimately discovered, will turn out to be complex. For instance, Heat, one thing, is mean molecular kinetic energy, a seemingly complex notion. So in Plato we find (Republic, 441d) that Justice is Doing One's Own, that a Name is (Cratylus, 388b) a tool that is informative and separates nature, or, though Plato never says it, that Human is rational bipedal animal. Since philosophical and (scientific progress) is supposed to teach not that Justice is just but what Justice is, at some level at least Forms cannot be considered to be utterly and strictly simple. The problem is that given just two predication relations, it is unclear whether Plato thinks that Forms partake of the properties to which they are related or whether they are those properties.

5. The Separation of Forms

The best guide to the separation of Forms is the claim that each Form is what it is in its own right, each is an auto kath auto being. In asking ‘What is (the Form) F?’, Plato seeks what F is in a particular and special way: He seeks what F is independent from any of its material instances, and in some sense independent of anything else, whether another Form or the soul. What each Form is, what each Form is in its own right, it is in virtue of its essence, ousia. The connection between the Form and the essence being predicated of it is exhibited in the Republic's formula that a given on (being) is completely or perfectly (477ff), as well as the so-called self-predication statements. According to the predicationalist reading, the relation connecting an essence with that Form of which it is the essence is Being (see Code 1986, esp. 425–9). (I capitalize the ‘is’ used to represent the predication relation of Being, e.g., Justice Is just.) The predicate in such self-predication statements stands for the (real) definition of the Form, conveniently captured by Nehamas' ‘what it is to be F’.^[9] Each Form, then Is its essence.

The special relationship between a Form and its essence is captured in two principles

Each essence is the essence of exactly one Form.
Each Form has (or is) exactly one essence;^[10]

II captures the ontological force of the expression that each Form is monoeides: of one essence. In light of these principles, and in keeping with the account of the ontological relation of Being, it follows that each Form self-predicates, in so far as each Form Is its essence. Self-predication statements are thus required of Forms, since every Form must Be its respective essence. Self-predication, then, is a constitutional principle of the very theory of Forms. A Form, then, is what it is in its own right in that it Is its essence, and since the only thing it Is is its essence, each Form is monoeides, ‘of one essence’. In virtue of Being its essence, each Form Is something regardless of whether any particular does or even may participate in it. Thus each Form is separate from every particular instance of it. Moreover, since its essence is predicated of the Form independently from our knowledge of the Form or from its relation to another Form, a Form is not dependent on anything else. On this definitional interpretation of separation, an item is separate just in case the definition (essence) is predicable of it and not of what it is alleged to be separate from. So, a Form is separate from particulars that partake of it, or any particular, if the essence is predicable of the Form and not predicable of the particular/s. Whether or not a Form is existentially separate, i.e., whether it exists separate from everything else, turns on whether one thinks that being an essence qualifies the Form as existing. To the extent that Plato recognizes the notion of existence, since being an essence seems, by Plato's lights, to be the superlative way to be, it is likely that Forms are both definitionally and existentially separate.

6. The Range of Forms

The middle period dialogues contain few arguments whose conclusion is that such and such a Form therefore exists. Even when ‘argument’ is given a very broad reading, the dialogues tend to address themselves to a limited number of Forms. These include the moral properties familiar from Socrates' ethical inquiries and properties such as Beauty, Equality, Hot and Cold, or Largeness. While these are not the only properties mentioned in the course of discussion, the Argument from Recollection, the arguments about the objects of knowledge and the ‘summoners’ from Books V (477ff) and VII (523ff), respectively, of the Republic, as well as the final ascent to Beauty in the Symposium and the Final Argument of the Phaedo all point to a particular kind of property, what scholars have labeled ‘incomplete properties’ (see Fine 1993; Irwin 1977). There is no precise way to specify what counts as an incomplete property. Roughly, the idea is that an incomplete property is one which, when serving as a predicate, yields a statement that cannot be understood on its own, because they must be added on to, or completed in some sense, typically with a prepositional phrase. For instance, the predicate ‘large’, functioning in a statement such as ‘Shaquille O'Neal is large’ must be completed with ‘for a human’; for while Shaq is large for a human he is not large compared with a tree. For some readers, then, while the Plato of the middle period may believe in a wide range of properties, he is theoretically committed only to a limited number or range of Forms, namely Forms of incomplete properties.

Forms are limited to these incomplete properties because, on this line of reasoning, these properties present special problems when they are instantiated in particulars. Chief among these problems is ‘the compresence of opposites’. This is the phenomenon where, with respect to any incomplete property, F, every sensible particular that is F is, in some sense, also not-F. So, if Elsie the cow is large, she is also not-large; for Elsie is large in comparison to her calf but not-large in comparison to Elmer the bull. Thus Elsie is large and not-large. Since, according to this approach, Plato is seeking a large that is the unqualified bearer of largeness, and since every particular is disqualified in light of compresence, Plato postulates a Form, Largeness Itself, to be the unqualified bearer. By way of contrast, properties such as being brown or being a cow do not suffer compresence when instantiated by particulars. That is, Elsie is a cow and is not not-a-cow; she is brown (imagine she is brown all over) and is not not-brown. (In the modern parlance, being a cow is classified as an essential property of Elsie whereas being brown is an accidental property. Thus the proponent of Forms only for incomplete properties looks to a special subset of the accidental properties, namely those where there is no unqualified possessor.)

In order to appreciate fully the rationale for this account, one needs to consider Plato's account of particulars, for the compresence of opposites is meant to capture in what sense particulars are deficient with respect to Forms. Before turning to particulars, note that it is left open by proponents of this position how we are to think of the nature of Forms and the self-predication statements involving Forms, whether, for instance, ‘Largeness is Largeness' signals that Largeness is what it is to be largeness, identical with largeness, or a large item, maybe the largest thing there is. Rather, we are told that the key notion is being completely. So, just as Elsie is completely a cow, so Largeness is completely large: Largeness is a complete bearer of an incomplete property.

7. The Deficiency of Particulars

Metaphors dominate Plato's remarks about the relation of particulars to Forms. Of special importance are the metaphors of image and original, copy and model, example and paradigm. The physical world and all of its constituents are, according to Plato, a copy or image of the Forms, and since all copies are dependent on the original, the physical world is dependent on Forms. In so far as Platonic Forms are not dependent on particulars, i.e., they are not immanent universals, the dependence is only ‘one way’. A second important metaphor from the Phaedo also suggests that particulars are dependent on Forms whereas Forms are not dependent on them. Particulars strive to be such as the Forms are and thus in comparison to Forms are imperfect or deficient. Forms, then, are independent, whereas particulars are dependent on Forms and thus deficient with respect to them.

The Phaedo (especially the Affinity Argument, 78b-84b) also points up a host of features, usually found in pairs, which differentiate particulars from Forms. Forms are immaterial, non-spatial and atemporal. Particulars are material and extended in space and in time. Forms do not change and may not even be subject to Cambridge-change, i.e. relational changes involving, for instance, a soul cognizing them at various moments. Particulars change, may even be subject to change in any respect, and may even be subject to change in every respect at any given moment, i.e., total Heraclitean flux. Particulars are complex or multi-form (polyeidetic) composites (suntheton), whereas Forms are pure, simple or uniform (monoeidetic, hen). Particulars are the objects of the senses and of belief. Forms are the objects of knowledge, grasped by the intellect through definitions, dialectic, or otherwise. Particulars appear, and perhaps are, both F and not-F for some property F: particulars suffer from the compresence of opposites. The Form of F cannot be conceived to be not-F (and perhaps is never not-F). Hence the Form, The F Itself, does not suffer compresence (at least with respect to being F).

Aristotle's account of Plato's reasons for introducing Forms indicates that change and essence are critical to Plato's thinking about the deficiency of material particulars. “…Socrates sought the universal in them and turned to definitions. Plato, accepting this, thought that this (defining) comes to be about different things, and not about sensibles. For it is impossible that the common definition be about any of the sensibles, for these are always changing.” (Metaphysics 987b1–7) At the very beginning, then, the search for knowledge leads to definitions. The question is where one can find definitions or definables. Aristotle asserts that Plato thought that definitions could not be found in the sensibles because they were always changing.

Following Aristotle's lead, a most economical way to account for the cognitive superiority of Forms and the inferiority of sensibles would be to allot essences only to the Forms. Since we know from the early and the middle dialogues that knowledge is of essence, it is tempting to think that the absence of essence is responsible for the deficiency of the particulars. Particulars are deficient because they can or do change. They change because their properties are contingent. Their properties are contingent because they lack any essences (or any essential properties). But this is too quick. First, Plato's particulars may not change with respect to all of their properties. Perhaps some have essential properties along with a host of contingent properties. Then Aristotle might be taken to imply that only with respect to a certain number of contingent properties did Plato posit definable Forms. Moreover, Aristotle seems to allude only to an epistemological difficulty arising from changing particulars. It is possible that this difficulty arises independently of whether some particulars have essential properties. For instance, particulars might be epistemologically problematic because they have many properties, only some of which are changing.

Certain passages (e.g., Phaedo 74ff., 78ff., Republic 476e-479, 523aff) suggest that particulars are cognitively deficient because they are complex. Suppose that a particular is F. Complexity entails that a particular has at least two properties, F and G. Since the G is not-F, every complex particular can be said to be F and not-F. Our inability to grasp the property (F) in the particular is then grounded not in the compresence of an opposite property, but in the compresence of another property. The inquiring mind is unable to isolate the desired property from any other. This suggests that a fundamental contrast between the particulars and the Form F is that the latter is simple, or monoeidetic, in that it possesses just itself—It is just F.^[11]

At other times, the cognitive reliability of the Forms seems grounded in the analyticity, or logical certainty, or necessity, that holds between the essence of a Form and various properties ‘discernible in its nature.’ Looked at in this light, the factor responsible for the deficiency of sensibles is that their properties are contingently related to them, in contrast to the Forms whose properties are necessarily stuck to them with ‘logical glue’ (see Vlastos 1969; Code 1993).

If we emphasize the contingency of all of its properties, a particular cannot have any essential properties. On the other hand, if we emphasize the complexity of the particular, then we are free to ascribe essences to (some) particulars. Hence, there could be knowledge of these particulars, i.e., knowledge that Socrates is a man. Conversely, if complexity is the cause of cognitive deficiency, then with respect to Forms, the fact that all their properties are necessary properties would not suffice to render Forms knowable. For if a Form has many properties, then in the broad sense the Form F Itself, since it is F and G, will be F and not-F. Thus Forms, too, might not be knowable.

There is reason to doubt that the compresence of opposites or the mere complexity of particulars is responsible for their deficiency (but see Fine 1993, esp. Ch. 4). According to Aristotle, change is critical, especially in so far as it precludes definability and thus knowledge. Given that knowledge requires essence, and essence excludes change (in the case of the essential properties), Aristotle would have us deny that essence is predicable of particulars for the Plato of the middle period. Particulars will be epistemologically deficient in that there can be no knowledge of them, unless we abandon the thesis that knowledge is of essence. And particulars will be metaphysically deficient, at least to the extent that possessing an essence is a better state than lacking one. But more can be said about the peculiar contingent manner in which particulars have their properties and why it is that one cannot look to the particular beauties to obtain knowledge of, e.g., Beauty.

From the outset of the Phaedo, particulars are branded as material and, as a result, spoken of in the pejorative. Indeed, matter seems to be at the root of the other features that characterize particulars. What is extended in space (and through, or in, time) is body. The composite is also linked with the material. Because a material particular is composite, it is also multi-form or complex (Phaedo 80b4). Complex material particulars are subject to change in so far as their composite nature invites dissolution or construction, or more generally coming-to-be or perishing.^[12] When taken broadly, as it is at Phaedo 100ff (or in the analogies of the middle books of the Republic), generation and destruction includes the exchange of properties. And since compresence requires complexity, the material nature of particulars is one of the roots of each material, sensible particular being both F and not-F.

The spatio-temporal, material character of particulars also contributes directly to the explanation of their suffering, and seeming to suffer, the compresence of opposites. In the middle period, Plato seems to accept an account of perception that has as a necessary component the interaction of material elements. There may be subsequent or simultaneous psychic activity,^[13] the judgment part of ‘perceptual judgment’, but there is at least some material intercourse between the body of the perceived object and the sense faculty whose sensory object it is. The qualifications needed to account for a particular's being F and not-F are temporal, or a function of being comparable to other extended material objects, or standing in different relations to perceivers.^[14] Since material extension is a necessary condition for their perceptibility, no particular could appear to have compresent properties unless it were material.

In virtue of their material nature, particulars are extended, mutable, and subject to generation and destruction. How then is the materiality of the particular related to the characterization for which participation is responsible? What materiality induces is that a property be manifested in a specific way. So, when we consider a particular stick to ask what is its length, we expect to be told a specific quantity: the stick is five inches long. The same is true of its weight: it is six ounces. If we are concerned to explain why the stick is that long, one answer is that the matter of the particular compels it to have determinate length.^[15] Only when we shift to the question ‘What is length?’, do we begin to reflect upon the relations between length and the fact that each of these material particulars has a specific length. In the Meno (74ff), Plato develops the notion of determinable and determinate. There the properties themselves are determinates falling under a determinable, e.g., crimson and scarlet under red, red under color. Now, the properties under consideration are all generic or determinable, but when present in the particular they take on a specific, determinate character. Consider, for instance, mathematical figures. The Triangle itself will be a three-sided figure whose lines lack breadth and whose angles have no determinate degree. But all particular triangles will have lines with some breadth and angles with certain degrees.^[16] There is, then, a gap between the non-specific and non-determinate property and the way it is manifested in the particular. The immaterial Form of Triangle is abstract and can have no particular dimension. The property in the particular, on the other hand, must be specific and determinate—the property in the particular is always a specific, determinate length, or color (hue), or size, or so on—because the particular is concrete, and because the property in the particular is itself a particular instance of the non-determinate property.

The determinacy of the material particular is set against the non-determinacy of the Form. This determinacy of property is only one aspect of the difference. A second is the contingent way in which the particular has this determinate property. The material aspect is, in the case of particulars, partly responsible for the contingency of its property possession. Matter is a sufficient condition for contingency but not necessary, since souls are in many respects contingently what they are, e.g., desirous of money. (Matter is also a sufficient condition for complexity, though again not necessary, if souls, or Forms, can be complex.)

8. Being and Partaking

The rigid separation of Forms from sensible particulars, Plato's idea that there are ‘Two Worlds’, is embodied in Plato's isolation of the two ways of being, Being and Partaking. The criteria and the properties which differentiate Forms and particulars are related to their respective ways of being, but mutability, extendedness, etc., are not equivalent to Partaking and they do not explain it nor are they explained by it. Still, the deficiency of the sensible is aptly viewed in terms of its way of being, i.e., in virtue of the fact that every sensible acquires all of its properties through participation. The deficiency of the sensible is its deficient way of being. Lacking any essence, it can only fail to Be.

This notion of deficiency has a long pedigree. In one sense it is a new way of cashing out the idea that Forms and particulars are different kinds or types of entities.^[17] It clearly is not an Approximation view or a view according to which Forms are treated as paradigmatic particulars. The very same property, Beauty, is related, via Being, to the Form Beauty Itself that is related to the sensible particular via Partaking. The beauty of Helen is not itself deficient, her way of having it is. And since beauty does not characterize Beauty, there is no case to be made that Beauty Itself could be a paradigmatically beautiful object. It would appear, then, that only Forms are definable, since essence is not predicated of particulars. But it is not so simple. Based on the Phaedo's account of Being and Participating (cf. Principles I and II, supra), we can conclude that:

Each Form, F, Is its essence, Y.

and that

For all particulars, P, and for all properties Y, if Y is predicated (able) of P, then P Has Y.

Furthermore, since the Phaedo asserts that particulars are what they are in virtue of the Form's being what it Is, it follows that

If P has Y, then P has something which Is Y.

The motivation for this claim is our understanding of the thesis at 100c that Beauty Itself alone Is beautiful and that other things acquire their beauty in virtue of partaking in what Is beautiful. The traditional and obvious way to parse this claim is to allow that it is the Form Itself which the particular has, for it seems that only the Form whose essence is Y, Is Y. But if this is true, then if, as the Identity view maintains, the Form and its essence are identical, it follows that the essence must also be predicable of the particular. In which case it seems that the particulars do have essences, albeit via Partaking, for they have something which is identical with an essence.

Form-copies, the-large-in-Socrates, the hot-in-fire, and such, provide a way out of this predicament. There is no consensus as to whether they are bona fide members of the ontology of the Phaedo (102bff). Many have argued that the so-called form-copies are nothing more than the Forms conceived of as inherent in, or immanent in, particulars, the particularization of the Form, or Forms as they function in the participation relation.^[18] But if Plato wishes to avoid the consequence of predicating Forms and, thus, essences directly of particulars, then there is a compelling reason for him to admit form-copies into his ontology. They differ from their parent Form in that they are singular or unit-properties, whereas the Form is general and abstract.

The relation of the form-copy to the particular is a real problem. The crucial issue is whether form-copies are dependent on particulars, especially whether their claim to be individual or unit-properties is only as good as the company they keep. Part of the difficulty results from the metaphor Plato's uses throughout the last stage of the Final Argument in the Phaedo. In anticipation of what will be his ultimate ‘proof’ of the immortality of the soul, Plato contends that when something possessed of an essential property, as for instance snow possesses cold, is confronted by the ‘opposite’, heat, then the-cold-in-the snow must withdraw or perish. (The soul, because it cannot perish, must therefore withdraw.) Which of the two possibilities developed in the military metaphor does Plato envisage for form-copies: do they ‘withdraw or perish’? It is a struggle to understand just what the military metaphors amount to, but if the form-copies perish at the approach of their opposite, this suggests that form-copies are dependent on the particulars to which they belong.^[19] Those who deny that form-copies are bona fide beings cite their perishing as a principal reason to take them as nothing more than a metaphor for the particular's (temporary) participation in the Form. Conversely, if they are able to withdraw, they are in some sense independent from the particulars. In this fashion they are akin to individual souls, since neither souls nor form-copies will be dependent for their existence on the particular to which they temporarily belong.

But even if they withdraw and thus exist apart from the particulars, their individuality seems to be determined by the company they keep, e.g., Socrates, or this bit of snow. ‘Belonging-to-Socrates’ is a relational property and seems to require that there be something, namely Socrates, to which the form-copy can belong. However, if form-copies are thus dependent on particulars, there is a problem with respect to the nature of particulars lurking in the Phaedo. For it seems that particulars have all of their properties in virtue of participating in the relevant Forms. Particulars, then, are ultimately to be identified in terms of the properties they have, namely their form-copies. But if these form-copies, in turn, are themselves individuated by the particulars whose form-copies they are, we are confronted with a circle.

Plato may be able to avoid this circle of individuation by not making form-copies depend on particulars for either their being or their individuation. If their status as individuals is primitive, form-copies will not be individuated by the particulars to which they belong. In this respect they are like the individual souls, which, since they pre-exist and postdate the particulars they inhabit, are not and cannot be individuated by them. A form-copy is, in the strict sense, a simple individual, incapable of possessing anything besides (the essence of) the Form of which it is a copy. Finally, they are not dependent on particulars, even for their individuation, because they can withdraw when necessary and thus continue to be what they are when the particular has perished. They can be said to perish, but only in the sense that the particular to which they temporarily attach can itself perish or change. (Were they dependent on the particular, form-copies would in fact perish.) The reason they survive is that a form-copy Is what it is. In so far as anything Is what it is, it cannot cease to be, i.e., cease to be what it Is. In this respect, too, they are like souls. Both souls and form-copies are then individuals in their own rights, apart from any particulars in which they inhere.

Form-copies belong to particulars and derive or emanate, to borrow a neo-Platonic term, from Forms. Form-copies allow Plato to respond to a threat posed by the metaphysics of Forms: to wit, that particulars might be indiscernible. If particulars are nothing in their own right, and in the absence of both matter and form-copies, then particulars are merely bundles of Forms;^[20] but if they are bundles, then two particulars composed of the same Forms would be indiscernible and identical. If we admit form-copies, particulars are not bundles of Forms. Particulars will be bundles of form-copies. And unlike a Form, which would seem to have to be numerically the same in each particular, the form-copies will differ from one another since they are distinct individual property-instances, not universals. However, while the particulars are no longer identical, this still allows that two bundles of form-copies could be indiscernible, since the form-copies of any one Form differ, it seems, solo numero. Helen's form-copy of Beauty cannot differ in quality from Andromache's, but their form-copies are distinct. If we allow that Helen and Andromache are presumed to be distinct particulars in virtue of their matter, we can further distinguish the particulars and the form-copies, i.e. the-beautiful-in-Helen versus the beautiful-in-Andromache. Here again, then, the assumption of the material particular is relevant. When Plato recognizes that he has yet to account for matter, and thus the individuation of particulars, he has to compose the Timaeus.

Particulars, then, have the properties they have because they have Form-copies derived from the Forms, which Are those properties. And when they inhere in the material particular, the particular has a definite, determinate property instance of Largeness or Beauty. The particular is assumed to be a combination of matter and form-copies (and in some cases, soul). All the form-copies can be lost, for the particular has no essential properties or essence, and so too the soul can be lost. In fact, since Plato seems to think that the body also dissipates, the particular can totally disappear. Not so the Form, which Is what it is, an auto kath auto being, precisely in that its essence is predicated via Being of it, and it is the only Form of which that essence is predicated.

A particular, x, is what it is in virtue of Partaking. What makes x beautiful, for instance, is its having something which Is beautiful. This something can either be a Form or form-copy, for these alone Are beautiful. It might seem, however, that the qualitative aspect of property possession is being explained in terms of items that are not qualified or characterized in the appropriate manner. This would be the result were Partaking analyzed in terms of, or reduced to, the relationship of Being. But in the middle period at least, Partaking is itself a primitive relation alongside Being. Moreover, at this juncture the participating subject is assumed to be a material particular, whose material nature goes without analysis. The primitive relation of Partaking, along with the effects of matter, are thus responsible for the characterization of the particulars: in virtue of having something, which Is beautiful, Helen is a beautiful woman. The form-copy is not responsible for the concrete, determinate character of her beauty. Her being a material object, and her having of the form-copy cause her to be so characterized. That her determinate character is the character of Beauty, on the other hand, is due to the form-copy that she has, and this form-copy, in turn, causes her to be beautiful in virtue of being a form-copy of Beauty Itself. In this respect, Plato sustains the Socratic notion that Forms are logical causes. The Form, Beauty Itself, makes possible the fact that Helen is beautiful, in so far as a form-copy of Beauty is something she has. Since she has all of her properties in this fashion, and since we seem to be able to identify her, and any particular, only through descriptions that refer to her properties, form-copies and their respective Forms are responsible for our epistemic access to particulars.^[21]

9. Introduction to Plato's Epistemology

Epistemology, for Plato, is best thought of as the account of what knowledge is. A reader who has some familiarity with philosophy since Descartes may well think that epistemology must address the question whether there is any knowledge. Plato never considers the global skeptical challenge. He assumes that there is knowledge, or at least that it is possible, and he inquires into the conditions that make it possible. These conditions, broadly conceived, concern, on the one hand, the rational capacities of humans, or more accurately souls, and, on the other hand, the objects of knowledge. With respect to objects, Forms certainly are objects of knowledge. However, there is much dispute as to whether anything in the material world is a suitable object. The physical world is an image, an imperfect world of change. Many passages in the Phaedo and, most dramatically, the Republic's great metaphors of Sun, Line and Cave, imply that Plato is a skeptic about knowledge of the physical, sensible world. Humans can have only beliefs about it. But many recoil at the prospect that Plato is such a skeptic. Citing the thrust of other discussions, these readers argue that while all knowledge for Plato must be based, in some sense, on Forms, one who knows Forms can also acquire knowledge of the physical world (see Fine 1978; 1990).

Concerns about the inherent intelligibility, or lack thereof, of the physical world, prompt Plato to propose the doctrine of recollection, i.e., the thesis that our disembodied, immortal souls have seen the Forms prior to their incarceration in the body. If Forms are the (basic) objects of knowledge, and Forms are not in the physical world, then we must have acquired that knowledge at some point prior to our commerce with that world. But metaphysical issues about the simplicity of Forms also affect how we are to conceive of knowledge in these middle period works. If Forms are simple, then it seems that knowledge is intuitive or acquaintance-like: in a non-propositional manner one somehow sees a Form, itself by itself. The central books of the Republic suggest such a picture. On the other hand, the many passages in which Plato declares that in order to know a Form one must be able to give its definition suggest both that Forms are related to one another, e.g., the Form of Human is related to the Forms of Rationality, Bipedality, Animality, the ‘elements of its definition, and that knowledge is propositional or akin to knowledge by description (cf. Gorgias 465a, 501a2–3, Republic 534b). These passages seem to imply that perhaps knowledge is some form of justified true belief. A critical question then is how one obtains the appropriate kind of justification to tie down or convert a belief into knowledge. Plato offers little in the way of detail on this score, but twice he alludes to a method of hypothesis, suggesting both in the Phaedo and Republic that hypotheses and their ultimately being rendered ‘non-hypothetical’ is part of the process by which one comes to know a Form. Thus we have four broad notions to explore in Plato's middle period epistemology: knowledge, belief, recollection and the method of hypothesis.

10. The Meno

The Meno is probably a transitional work, bridging the Socratic and the middle period dialogues. While the first third of the Meno is concerned with ethical questions, what is virtue and is virtue teachable, the last two-thirds address themselves to epistemological details generated from the thesis that virtue is knowledge. Here we find for the first time mention of recollection, which Socrates proposes as a solution to a paradox of inquiry put forward by Meno. The paradox is this (80d-e):

For anything, F, either one knows F or one does not know F.
If one knows F, then one cannot inquire about F.

If one does not know F, then one cannot inquire about F.

Therefore, for all F, one cannot inquire about F.

Plato resolves the paradox by showing that there are different ways in which one might be said to ‘know’ something and that sometimes having a belief about F is adequate to begin an inquiry into F. In his famous question and answer with a slave about how to find the diagonal of a given square, Socrates argues that latent within the slave is an understanding of how to determine the diagonal (81–86b). The slave has various beliefs, some false and some true, about the way to discover the length of the diagonal. What is needed is only a set of prompts, here a set of questions, to elicit from the boy the knowledge that is latent within him. Socrates contends that he is leading the slave to recollect what he already knows. In the subsequent stages of the argument, Socrates distinguishes the sense in which a person can be said to merely have a belief about something (into which one might inquire), from the sense in which he can be said to know the same thing (97ff). For instance, suppose that Jones has looked at a map and determined how to drive from New York City to Chicago though he has not done so: just get on Interstate 80 and go west. On the other hand, suppose that Smith has actually driven numerous times from NYC to Chicago by getting on 80 and heading west. Both Jones and Smith have the same belief about how to get from NYC to Chicago and both will get there by acting on their belief. But only Smith has knowledge of the road, whereas Jones has a true belief. The truth of the belief is then not at issue. Rather, Smith has something more, some kind of justification, here based on experience, that distinguishes her from Jones: Jones has only a true belief about how to get there; Smith actually knows. Thus in the Meno, we have perhaps the first attempt to offer a justified true belief account of knowledge: Knowledge is a true belief tied down with an account (aitias logismos, 98a). The Meno, then, with its discussion of recollection, knowledge and belief sets the stage for the middle Platonic epistemology.

11. Recollection in the Phaedo

The Phaedo's discussion of recollection begins with a remark by Cebes in support of the claim that our souls preexist their incarceration in the body: “Such is also the case if that theory is true that you are accustomed to mention frequently, that for us learning is no other than recollection. According to this, we must at some previous time have learned what we now recollect. This is possible only if our soul existed somewhere before it took on this human shape” (72e-73).

Of special importance in this initial description is the ‘for us’ and the identification of learning (mathesis) with recollection. There is no way to determine whether ‘we’ here are the close, philosophical confidants of Socrates, or the human race. Part of the solution to the problem of who recollects will hinge on how we understand the claim that learning is nothing other than recollection. On the broad reading, recollection concerns the application of concepts in all thought (see, most recently, Bedu-Addo 1991). That is, since learning is a dynamic process whose termini are roughly our first thoughts and talk about the world, on the one hand, and knowledge of Forms on the other, and since in thinking and talking about the world we must apply concepts, recollection is viewed as a doctrine of innate ideas whose effects are felt almost immediately in the conscious mind.

Those who would limit the kind of learning that is recollection isolate the last stage(s) of learning, namely those concerned with the move from beliefs about the (properties of) the material world to knowledge of Forms (see, most recently, Scott 1995; Bobonich 2002, Ch. 1). Since only philosophers will engage in these late stages, the ‘us’ for whom learning is recollection are only philosophers, and what is learned/recollected is just Forms. On this narrow reading Plato would have to offer an account of ordinary thought and talk, i.e., an account of concept acquisition and application, which claims that the concepts so deployed by most of us are derived from ordinary particulars and acquired through our conversations with one another and our sense-perceptions and beliefs about physical objects. In sum, both readings agree that Plato is concerned to explain the distinctive capacity of humans to classify sense-perception under universals. According to the broad reading, Plato thinks that this cannot be done unless one appeals to one's prior, latent knowledge of the Forms under which one ranges perceptions. According to the narrow reading, there is no need to appeal to prior knowledge of Forms to explain the ordinary classificatory activities of humans. Rather, prior knowledge of Forms is needed only to explain the philosophical understanding of Forms. Innate Forms thus need not contribute anything to the formation of concepts in ordinary thought and talk. Precisely what the relation is between the concepts garnered from ordinary perception and used in ordinary thought and talk and the innate Forms or concepts used in philosophical thinking remains to be determined.

Concepts are, roughly, the units or elements of thoughts. In the Theaetetus (189e), a dialogue written after the Republic and Phaedo, Plato contends that thought is the silent dialogue of the soul with itself. If we can read back from this dialogue to the epistemology of the middle period, concepts are conceptual analogues to the subjects and predicates of spoken statements: corresponding to the predicate ‘equal’ of a statement such as ‘The sticks are equal’ is the concept [equality]. To debate whether there are ordinary versus philosophical concepts of [equality] thus invites consideration of how to distinguish concepts from one another. Basic in the Phaedo is that we have knowledge of Equality; that we perceive sensible equal objects, that we compare these sensible equals with the Form, and that in order to do this we must have had prior knowledge of Equality. Now, one question is whether the same concept applies both to the Form and the particulars. Whereas we moderns often focus on synonymy to distinguish co-referential concepts, issues of reference dominate Plato's thoughts. By the end of the Final Argument, it is clear that in a strict or primary fashion the concept/term is applied to the Form and in an indirect manner it is applied to the many instances that fall under the Form. (Using the language of names, ‘equal’ is the name of Equality and the eponym of the many particular equal things. (Cf. 102bff) With respect to the concept of Equality, it is individuated by its relation to the Form of Equality and, at best, derivatively to the many equals.^[22] What individuates concepts or names, is not what is in the head of speakers, but rather just their relation to Forms.

This privileging of reference over meaning with respect to what a concept is lends credence to the broad or innatist interpretation of what it is to acquire or even to have a concept. One has the concept from birth. One is not aware of having it. As you mature, learn to speak and make your way in the world, you may and in all likelihood will associate many beliefs or things with this concept, though still you might not think of it as a concept. (That is, nothing in Plato's account suggests that people need be aware of having a concept qua concept in order to have or even use concepts.) Conversely, lacking the individuation condition for concepts provided by Forms and Innatism, the narrow reading must provide an account of how one acquires any concept. There is little in the primary or secondary literature to suggest how concepts are acquired. Though it is a controversial dialogue with respect to doctrine and period, the Cratylus’ rejection of the Protagorean/Heraclitean account of names (383–387c, 434e-435d), strongly suggests that Plato thinks that no empiricist or abstractionist account is workable. One problem, then, with the narrow interpretation is its picture of (ordinary) concepts and their contents. Concepts are treated as hollow shells to be filled with varying beliefs or ideas, contents gleaned from conversations with one another or contact with the world. Into my concept of beauty goes pale skinned, into yours bright color, into a third, some other filling. The problem is that if the concept itself is identified with its contents, then there is no reason to think that any of us have the same concept. There are just too many different beliefs associated with a concept by different individuals to think that anyone could ever mean the same as another. Empiricism with respect to concept acquisition is liable to lead to private languages at best. Moreover, it would seem that our concept changes anytime we add or subtract from its contents.

Of course, the fact that there are philosophical objections to the narrow reading should not dictate that we reject it. The broad reading may also have problems. Indeed, Plato's account of Recollection, whatever it is, is liable to suffer difficulties. So what is the account?

At the outset (73c-74a), Socrates places certain conditions on what is to count as recollection. If x reminds one of y, then

one must have known y beforehand
one must, in having any sense-perception of something (x), recognize x and take y in mind (think of y)
y must not be the object of the same knowledge as x.
Since recollection can be occasioned by objects that are similar and by objects that are dissimilar (Simmias and a picture of Simmias versus Simmias and his lyre), when the recollection is caused by similar things, one must also of necessity experience this: one must have in mind whether or not x is lacking in some way with respect to similarity vis à vis y.

It is not clear how these conditions can be satisfied. In order to recollect Simmias upon seeing his picture, (1) I must have known Simmias beforehand and (2) I must be somehow cognizant of the picture and of Simmias. (3) And were Simmias and his picture not the objects of different knowledge, that is, were they the object of the same knowledge, it seems that I would not realize that they are different objects. The picture would not remind me of Simmias, it would just be thought of as a picture (or as Simmias). But, recognizing the picture cannot involve recognizing Simmias, lest we already be thinking of Simmias (y) in thinking about the picture (x): that is, we cannot be reminded of what we are occurrently thinking about. There must then be a way of cognizing the picture apart from what it is a picture of. Condition 3 is more transparent when we consider recollection from unlikes: we can recognize a lyre as a lyre or as a musical instrument, a piece of wood with strings, etc., easily enough without introducing Simmias in order to think about it. Condition 4 then spells out the peculiar way in which recollection from likes occurs; e.g., we realize that a picture or image is different from what it is a picture of: images fall short or are lacking in some respect with regard to what they are an image of. We recognize this perhaps because we recognize that it is an image and that images always are deficient with respect to what they are images of. But we need not be thinking of the very thing the image is an image of in order to recognize these facts.

The argument to this point is a preliminary sketch of recollection. The next stage attempts to prove that one can and must recollect Forms, since only with that proof will Socrates have demonstrated the pre-existence of the soul. So Plato turns to showing that we cannot have acquired knowledge of the Form Equality from perceptual encounters. But 2, 3 and 4, when applied to the example of the equal sticks, appear to land the doctrine in difficulties. For it seems that if, according to 4, we need to be comparing the equal sticks to the Form of Equality, then we need to be aware of the Form in thinking of the sticks. But if we must be aware of the Form even to think about the equal sticks then we must already have the Form in mind in conducting the comparison. We cannot then be in the process of forming the concept of Equality nor recollecting the Form.

The next stage finds Socrates getting Simmias' rapid agreement that there is an Equal that they know besides the equal sticks and stones. (74ab). The question is whence they acquired this knowledge. It cannot have been from the sticks and stones from which it differs; for they can sometimes appear equal and sometimes unequal, whereas Equality Itself, on the other hand, never appears unequal. Socrates concludes that we cannot have derived our knowledge of Equality from these many equals because we realize that they are deficient or lacking with respect to Equality. He does not specify in what way they are lacking, save for the aforementioned fact that they can and do appear unequal whereas Equality does not and apparently cannot do so.

Plato provides little guidance in this argument or elsewhere as to why the Form cannot appear to be unequal (See White 1987; 1992). Perhaps the easiest way to parse the Form's insusceptibility to appearing unequal is to treat the claim as implying that the Form cannot appear other than itself, i.e., equal. This fact, in turn, would then be explained by citing the Form's incomposite, or simple, nature (See §4, supra). Equality could then have no other property (or be no other property). Thus, to be aware of it at all would be to recognize it as equal. Of course there remains the problem of distinguishing being aware of the Form from thinking one is aware of the Form when one is not. In this circumstance, one could perhaps mistakenly think all sorts of things about the Form. A related but distinct consideration is to determine whether it is possible in some sense to have the Form in mind without being aware of it. Certainly the broad or innatist reading must allow for this possibility, since Forms are regarded as latent in one's mind.

If Forms are not utterly simple, then this explanation of their immunity to appearing other than they are is weakened. Suppose that Equality is also beautiful. Then in some fashion, it would seem that by attending to its beauty Equality could seem other than Equality and thus seem unequal. In order to avoid this outcome, while allowing for some complexity in the Form, those emphasizing the compresence of opposites can insist that it is the strict opposite, Inequality or being unequal, that Plato excludes from the Form, not another property, e.g., beauty, which happens not to be identical with Equality.

Alternatively, the predicationalist (See §4 supra.), who emphasizes the special relation between a Form and its essence, maintains that in knowing Equality, one knows what it is, that is, one knows its essence. This essence is itself simple or a unity, despite the apparent complexity of the linguistic definition that picks it out. One is not aware, or at least one is not knowingly aware, of Equality unless one knows this definition. Whatever else may be predicable of Equality, one cannot be aware of Equality without realizing that it is whatever it is, namely this essence. Regardless of how we understand the difference between the Form and the sticks, Plato seems only to have shown that the Form and the particulars are not identical. How we are to conclude that one cannot derive the knowledge of the Form from the sensibles is not revealed.

12. The Epistemology of the Republic: The Two Worlds Doctrine

The Republic is unquestionably Plato's most elaborate defense of his central ethical doctrines in the middle period. It explores the question what is Justice over the course of ten books, with the aim of demonstrating that the best life for a human is the life devoted to virtue and knowledge, for such a life will result in happiness for the individual. The virtuous person will be one who has all three parts of her soul working in a harmonious fashion, i.e., her reason, cognizant of the Form of the Good and the other Forms, will with the support and consent of her appetite and spirit govern all of her pursuits. The analogue of the virtuous individual with her tripartite soul is the ideal state, the Republic, with its three parts or classes, rulers, warriors and laborers, all working in harmony with one another under the auspices of the ruler, i.e., reason. Having established that justice is psychic harmony at the end of Book Four, Plato next turns to show what it is that the philosopher ruler (or reason in the individual) knows that licenses his claim that they will rule for the benefit of the respective parts and the whole state or person

At the end of Book V (474bff), Socrates begins his defense of the rule of the philosopher by contrasting his epistemological condition with that of a group of sightlovers. The philosopher, who accepts that there are Forms, e.g., Beauty Itself, has knowledge. The sightlover, who denies that there is Beauty Itself but rather insists that there are just the many (different) beautiful plays, paintings and such, lacks knowledge. He has only belief. In support of this contention, Socrates distinguishes three different kinds of mental states or capacities and three generic ‘objects’ for these capacities. Knowledge is set over ‘what completely is’; ignorance is set over ‘what completely is not’; and, belief, being intermediate between knowledge and ignorance, is set over what is intermediate between the other two generic objects, namely ‘what is and is not’. Capacities are distinguished, Socrates contends, by two criteria: 1) difference in objects; and 2) difference in what they do (with/to their objects). Examples of 1) include colors and sounds, and of course what completely is and what is and is not. The second criterion is seemingly satisfied by the difference between being true versus being true and false. Thus, knowledge is always true, whereas belief admits of both truth and falsehood.

Much turns on how one understands the ‘is’ (es) of ‘what completely is’ and ‘what is and is-not’, and, concomitantly, whether one treats what belief and knowledge are ‘set over’ as propositions or objects. Three different readings of the ‘is’ seem possible: a) the existential; b) the veridical; and c) the predicative.

On the existential reading, knowledge is set over what exists; belief is set over what exists and does not exist. On the predicative reading, knowledge is set over Forms, what is F, for any property F (or some privileged kinds of properties, e.g. incomplete properties); belief is set over what is F and not-F, the material particulars. The existential and predicative readings typically are committed to objects as what knowledge and belief are set over. Since it is hard to make sense of what it could be for an object to exist and not exist, the existential reading has found little support. (There are other objections to an existential reading, principally that many think that Plato never works with an ‘is’ of existence (see Owen 1986c).

The predicative reading, on the other hand, lends itself to a defense of the Two Worlds account of Plato's metaphysics. The objects of belief and knowledge are distinct. Accordingly, one can have only beliefs about the particulars and about particulars only beliefs, and only knowledge of Forms and of Forms one can only have knowledge. It follows that knowledge cannot be any kind of justified true belief, not even one ‘tied down’ by the account of the appropriate cause. (See Meno 98a). Moreover, since one can have only knowledge of Forms, one cannot have any false beliefs about Forms. Given that in Book I of the Republic the interlocutors seem to have many false beliefs about Justice, e.g., that Justice is returning what is due, this consequence may be more worrisome than that which proscribes knowledge of the affairs of actual cities.

According to the veridical reading (see Fine 1978; 1990), the ‘objects’ of belief and knowledge are best treated as propositions. Knowledge is set over what is true, i.e., the set of true propositions; belief is set over what is true and not true, or false, namely the set of all propositions. The veridical reading regards the overlap between the objects of the distinct faculties—the set of true propositions—as a virtue, since it allows one to give a justified true belief interpretation to knowledge and allows one to have both beliefs about and knowledge of Forms and of sensible objects.

13. Sun, Line and Cave

The argument at the end of Book Five is a prelude to the argument and analogies of Sun, Line and Cave in Books Six and Seven. The point of Sun is to contrast the visible and intelligible realms. The former is generated, nurtured and governed by the sun, which also provides the light required by the eye to gain access to the physical world. Corresponding to the sun in the intelligible realm is the Good: “What gives truth to the things known and the power to know to the knower is the Form of the Good. And though it is the cause of knowledge and truth, it is also an object of knowledge.” (508e). Indeed, the Good is responsible for the very ‘being’ of the knowable objects, though Plato never says in what sense the Good is responsible for the knowability and being of the objects of knowledge (see Santas 1980).

Line starts from the broad division stipulated by Sun: there is the intelligible realm and the visible realm. Each of these is again divided into two (unequal) parts. At the bottom of the visible one finds images, shadows and such. The ordinary physical objects of which the images are images occupy the upper portion. Set over the images is the faculty of eikasia, imagination. Set over the physical world is the faculty of pistis, literally faith or conviction, but generally regarded as belief. Plato next turns to the lower segment of the intelligible portion of Line:

In (this) subsection, the soul, using as images the things that were imitated before, is forced to investigate from hypotheses, proceeding not to a first principle, but to a conclusion. In the other subsection, however, it makes its way to a first principle that is not a hypothesis, proceeding from a hypothesis, but without the images used in the previous subsection, using Forms themselves and making its investigation through them (510b).

The top-most segment of Line is clear enough. The objects are Forms and the faculty set over Forms is Nous, Knowledge or Understanding. Included in this group is the Good itself, best regarded as having the status of first among equals. Precisely what to make of the objects in the third section, the faculty of dianoia, and the nature of hypotheses are matters of great controversy. Given Plato's examples, the capacity of dianoia seems distinctive of scientific or mathematical reasoning. (On the question of hypotheses and the relation of this passage to the hypothetical method of the Phaedo, see §15 supra.) The objects of dianoia are then, roughly, the objects of the sciences. There appear to be two basic approaches to the ‘objects’ of dianoia, depending on how one understands the participial phrase “using as images the things that were imitated before”: 1) The objects of this segment are some kind of ‘abstract’ image of ordinary material things - a kind of image different from the kind that are shadows and reflections; or 2) the objects are either the material objects themselves though now treated (abverbially, as it were) in a special, different way, or they are Forms, though treated in a way different from that way in which noûs treats Forms (see Burnyeat 1987).

Cave, arguably the most famous analogy in the history of philosophy, reinforces the message of line. Seated prisoners, chained so that they cannot move their heads, stare at a cave wall on which are projected images. These images are cast from carved figures illuminated by a fire and carried by people on a parapet above and behind the prisoners. A prisoner is loosed from his chains. First he sees the carved images and the fire. Then he is led out of the cave into ‘the real’ world. Blinded by the light of the sun, he cannot look at the trees, rocks and animals around him, but instead looks at the shadows and reflections (in water) cast by those objects. As he becomes acclimatized, he turns his gaze to those objects and finally, fully acclimatized, he looks to the source of illumination, the sun itself.

In the analogy of Cave, corresponding to the physical objects over which belief is set are the carved statues in the cave. Corresponding to the ‘using as images what before were imitated’ are the reflections in the pond. If, however, Cave is our guide, these dematerialized images are generated not from the carved statues but from the animals, i.e., the Forms themselves.

14. The Development of Mind

The Seventh Book continues with the kinds of study conducive to the education of the philosopher-ruler (521cff). The goal of intellectual development is knowledge of Forms, ultimately acquired through dialectic. Dialectic, however, is practiced late in life by a select few with the requisite memory and quickness of mind, after they have studied various, essentially mathematical disciplines. The winnowing process eliminates most people from ever developing the necessities for philosophical thought. The first steps (523a-525a) in the turn towards abstract thinking are occasioned by the need for the mind to settle questions arising from ordinary perception; that is, the mind of everyman is liable to be summoned to reflect upon the confused, and confusing, reports of perception. About a host of perceptual qualities, thick, thin, hard, soft, large and small, the senses report that they are the same, at least in certain perceptual circumstances. Lumped in with these properties is also number. The mind is summoned to settle what is large and what is small, and what is one.

The brief discussion of the summoners raises suspicions about the faculty psychology presented in the final argument of Book V and in Line and Cave. It seems at times that Plato thinks that belonging to each part of the soul are capacities or faculties capable of issuing judgments (cf. 602c-603a; see Burnyeat 1976). So, for instance, there are the judgments of sense that can and often do conflict with the judgments of reason. But taken literally, if each faculty has its own objects such that no other faculty can be set over them, then there can be no conflict in judgments. The case of perception poses a special difficulty. Perception, unlike discursive thought or belief, is aligned not with the so-called rational part of the soul, but with the desiderative part. As we saw in the Phaedo, as well as in the passages about the sightlovers and the summoners, the senses are disparaged as a source of confusion and falsehood. The senses mislead us. One of Plato's complaints seems to be that people rely on perception, or belief relying on perception, with the result that they come to think that what is real is the physical, sensible world. And, perhaps even worse, they come to think that one can understand (know) things about the world such as what makes (for example) a temple beautiful or a stick equal or a person large by appealing to properties that are perceptual or observational or sensible.

Proponents of the thesis that Plato posits Forms only for incomplete properties locate the problem for the sensible world not in the objects themselves, but in the kinds of explanations that sightlovers and non-philosophers rely on to justify their claim to know (propositions about) the sensible, material world (see Fine 1978; 1990; Irwin 1977; Gosling 1960). It need not be the case, as the predicative reading in terms of objects would have it, that a given temple is and is not- beautiful. In their view, the problem is the sensible property types cited by the sight-lovers in their accounts of what makes something beautiful. For example, there is the sensible property type, bright-color, that allegedly explains why the temple at Bassae is beautiful. But, bright-color itself, the property type, is and is not-beautiful, for it accounts for beauty in some things but accounts for ugliness (not-beauty) in others. The crucial text for this reading is 479d3–5: “So we have discovered, apparently, that most people's varying standards (nomima) of beauty and things like that are rattling around somewhere in the middle, between what is not something and what purely and simply is something” (Ferrari/Griffith trans.) The veridical reading translates nomima as ‘beliefs’ and contends that because most people rely on sensible property types as the justification for their beliefs, they are condemned to live in the realm of belief. For, according to this reading, every sensible property type suffers from this compresence of opposites, i.e., is F and not-F. In appealing to such properties in their accounts, the sight lover can never be justified in any of his beliefs about the many beautifuls, because their accounts or reasons for their beliefs about the world must be false. Hence, the sightlover can have only beliefs about the many beautifuls, or equals, or, for any incomplete property F, the many fs. The sight-lover can never achieve knowledge so long as he relies on sensible properties in his accounts. And since Plato thinks that there is knowledge, he infers, says the veridical reading, that there must be non-sensible objects, or rather there must be accounts or explanations available which can be phrased in terms of ‘non-sensible’ properties, i.e., must appeal to properties which are not both F and not-F, or more precisely, do not make some things, say beautiful, and others ugly.

The veridical reading, combined with the account that limits Forms to incomplete properties (See §6, supra), allows for the possibility that the philosopher can have knowledge of the visible realm. This can come about for at least two reasons. On the one hand, there will be a host of non-sensible properties and propositions about ordinary particulars and such properties, e.g., ‘Socrates is a man’. Since arguably Plato thinks that Socrates is completely or essentially a man, and since there is no Form of Man, the philosopher (and, perhaps, anyone) can know such a proposition. On the other hand, the philosopher, once he comes to know the Forms of the Incomplete Properties, can then have knowledge of the external world in any and all respects. Not misled by the compresent opposite properties, and able to base all his accounts on the Good and the other Forms, nothing stands in his way of knowing the material world (520c).^[23]

The predicative reading of the argument of Book V and the analogies of the central books does not limit the range of Forms and does not commit itself to the possibility of knowledge of the external world. If one treats the physical world as metaphysically defective, as victimized in any and every respect by its being and not-being, then that suffices to preclude one from knowing anything about such a world. The objects of the physical world are simply not the right sorts of things to qualify as objects of knowledge, regardless of what sorts of reasons or justifications or explanations one has at her disposal.

Regardless of the epistemic status of the physical world, one task is to understand how Plato thinks the transition is made from one's perceptions and beliefs about the physical world to knowledge of the Forms. In the Republic, Socrates says that every human being is capable of becoming a philosopher and thus able to know the Good and all the Forms (518c). On the other hand, the Republic leaves little doubt that Plato expects that few will actually achieve the knowledge each is capable of. Most of us will give in to the ordinary beliefs generated through our perceptual encounters with the sensible world, as well as those resulting from the conversations we have with one another. Most will never even begin, it seems, the course of study outlined in Book VII, and most of those who begin will not become dialectically sophisticated so that they can give an account of what they know that will ‘destroy the hypotheses'. But despite the odds, from the Phaedo and Republic we can locate two elements of Plato's epistemological program that can lead to knowledge if properly exercised, recollection and the method of hypothesis. The latter is mentioned explicitly in the Phaedo and seems again to be alluded to in Plato's remarks about the differences between the top two sections of line. Since this method, assuming that it is the same in both, appears to be deployed as part of the final stages of the pursuit of knowledge, there is reason to postpone consideration of the method until after consideration of perception and belief, i.e., the first two stages of Line.

The Phaedo's discussion of Recollection suggests that there is something inherently flawed with empiricist or abstractionist accounts, at least those that attempt to derive any concept from our contacts, perceptual or linguistic, with the external world. It seems that Plato thinks that the deficiency of the external, sensible, material world vitiates all efforts to build or acquire concepts from it. The deficiency of the sensible material world makes it an unreliable source of information. Depending on how one accounts for this deficiency, the trouble for perception, and belief based on perception, is explained in different ways. Aristotle's account emphasizes that it is changing. Another source of difficulty is that the abstract, general Forms are always manifested in a concrete, determinate fashion (See §7, supra). The Affinity Argument points to the complexity of material particulars. Rather than present a single property, as it were, to perception, perception is required to focus on some aspect of the complex particular. If it is also true that at least with respect to some properties, namely the incomplete or relative properties addressed by the Compresence accounts, every object is both F and not-F, then no sensible will be an unqualified bearer of these properties. Perception, considered in its own right, seems to be unable to explain how any feature of an object is selected for study. It also seems that Plato thinks that the psychological faculties of perception, or even belief, are incapable of processing the information in a reliable manner, or at least in a manner requisite for knowledge. At times it seems that they distort or alter perceptions (Phaedo, 65ff). At other times, e.g., when we emphasize the difference between the faculties, it seems that they are confined to work on whatever they process in such a manner that they do not pass along anything to the rational faculty, or if they do, they pass it along to belief. One problem is that whenever one engages in perception, and belief based on perceptual reports, one can never overcome the inherently perspectival situation. For instance, no matter where one is situated, the round penny will appear to the eye, we might say, somewhat elliptical. Or, to use Plato's example from Book Ten, the straight stick in water will seem bent (owing to the laws of refraction), even though an experienced person will believe that it is straight (602c-603a).^[24]

15. The Method of Hypothesis

However we account for the inadequacy of perception the task remains to explore how we get from perception, which stimulates the recollective process, to belief and eventually to recollect or otherwise know Forms. Plato is less than forthcoming about how one moves from one stage to the next. The elenctic method probably plays some role in advancing one's understanding, especially the step from perception to belief. At a certain point, we naturally begin to offer reasons for our beliefs. The elenchus questions our reasons, typically by revealing an inconsistency in our accounts of why we believe what we do. But we can also place Plato in a tradition that seeks a systematic explanation of the natural phenomena. One aim of the Presocratics, as Socrates narrates in the Phaedo (95a4ff), is to find a single explanation, or a single kind of explanation, to save the phenomena. Socrates complains that the Presocratics had mistakenly looked to material causes. Such explanations fail to meet minimal standards: the same explanation (aitia) accounts for opposite phenomena, e.g., ‘by a head’ explains both why something is tall and something else is short; or sometimes the same phenomenon is subject to explanations by opposite causes, being two by ‘division and addition.’ However, Socrates reports, Anaxagoras' nod towards Mind was at least a step in the right direction (though Anaxagoras failed to follow the path). The best account is teleological in nature, in terms of the Good. Thus the Phaedo gestures at the critical role assigned to this Form in the Republic. In the Phaedo Plato begs off from directly investigating the nature of the good or teleological explanations. Instead he turns to what he describes as a method of hypothesis, the first of which is the hypothesis of Forms as causes (see $sect;2 supra), and its ‘first corollary’, that particulars are/come-to-be what each is in virtue of partaking in Forms.

Precisely what the connection is between the Phaedo's method of hypothesis (99eff) and the Republic's remarks on hypothesis and the ascent to an unhypothetical first principal is a subject of controversy. Equally controversial is its connection within the Phaedo to the method of recollection and to philosophical practice in general. In attempting to study what there is (onta), Socrates says that he shrinks from things (erga) to concentrate on propositions/accounts (logoi), which he denies are more images (of what there is) than the physical things: “I started in this manner: taking as my hypothesis in each case the theory that seemed to me most compelling, I would consider as true, about cause and everything else, whatever agreed with this, and as untrue whatever did not agree.” (99e-100a). Since the hypothesis of Forms is offered next, with its corollary of participating particulars, it would seem that the logoi are opinions about Forms. These logoi are to be treated as provisional. Socrates' is the strongest logos and the safest, in explicit contrast to the wise explanations of others. From the examples provided, it seems that ‘agreement’ here is not a notion of entailment or logical consequence. Rather, Plato directs us to posit initially a general hypothesis and to determine whether there are particular cases within the target domain—here the cause of generation and destruction—that are inconsistent with, i.e., not adequately explained by, it (see Bedu-Addo 1991).

Complicating matters is Plato's additional remark that one needs also to examine the initial hypothesis to see whether there are ‘higher’ hypotheses that account for it:

But you would cling to the safety of your own hypothesis and give that answer. If someone then attacked your hypothesis itself, you would ignore him and would not answer until you had examined whether the consequences that follow from it agree with one another or contradict one another. And when you must give an account of your hypothesis itself you will proceed in the same way: You assume another hypothesis, the one which seems to you best of the higher ones until you come to something acceptable. (101d)

Since the initial hypothesis is the theory of Forms, it is uncertain what Plato has in mind in mentioning hypotheses ‘higher’ than the theory or what sort of test he has in mind. The elenctic practice of Socrates would determine whether other accounts are consistent with one another. But that still leaves the question of higher hypotheses unanswered. One temptation here is to think that the teleological account of the Good is the higher/est hypothesis. While this may well be so, there are perhaps intermediate accounts between the full-blown teleology of the Good—an account that Plato steadfastly throughout his writings refuses to provide—and the initial statement of the theory of Forms and its corollary of participation (see Rowe 1993). These intermediate stages might then be viewed as different accounts of the nature of Forms, the nature of particulars and of the participation relation itself. For instance, Aristotle might offer a different account of ‘Forms’ than Plato, one that espouses an immanent realism wherein some particulars might be said to have essential properties. Or, looking to the clever explanations that follow, where perhaps Forms of Fire and Heat, Cold and Snow or Three and Odd are linked, one might ponder whether Forms are indeed utterly simple or monoeidetic, in contrast to an account of Forms in which they may bear a special relation to their essence—Three is what it is to be three—and a different relation to another property, e.g. oddness. Seen in this light, the Theory of Forms in the Phaedo (and Republic) is hypothetical or provisional, awaiting a defense in which the nature of Forms, the role of the Good and the relations between Forms are examined.

When one turns from the Phaedo to the Republic, the notion of hypothesis appears in the two ‘upper’ segments of the line. They are distinguished in part by the fact that those considering their subject matter dianoetically still make use of hypotheses, whereas those using nous have arrived at an unhypothetical first principle and descending the line have destroyed the hypotheses. It seems that the mathematicians, for example, use discursive thought because they assume the starting points, i.e., the axioms or definitions, of their sciences. In this respect, they are like Socrates of the Phaedo positing the Forms to explain generation and corruption. In Plato's hands, scientific inquiry seems to emerge from reflection on the everyday material world. The step from conviction to dianoia, however, is taken by far fewer individuals than those who step from eikasia to conviction.

The move from the second to the third level crosses the barrier between the visible and the intelligible. One derives ‘images' from the objects of pistis or considers them differently, developing different propositions about what one previously took for granted. Perhaps the scientist describes these images in non-sensible terms, or perhaps he regards the ‘image of triangle’ apart from the particular, determinate angles or lengths that even any image must have—he abstracts away these features, treating the abstract image as applying to all triangles. Or, similarly, the objects of dianoia and nous may be identical: the philosopher thinks about them differently from the scientist. If one assumes that here Forms are first posited, as seems required if we are to understand the descent from nous to secure the Forms, then the objects of dianoia and pistis cannot be the same. For the latter are not Forms but ordinary particulars. We can then explain ‘destroying the hypotheses’ as similar to what, in the Phaedo, was described as finding the higher logoi. The initial strongest hypothesis, i.e., the Theory of Forms, is then rendered non-hypothetical when, and only when, the philosopher has determined which of the many accounts of the general nature of Forms, e.g., immanent vs. transcendent realism, simple versus complex Forms, the nature of the Good and its relation to others forms, is best. The same route would secure the hypotheses of the sciences, i.e., the various interpretations of the objects of the sciences would be eliminated leaving only that one justified by the theory of Forms. The peculiar properties or axioms of the individual sciences would remain the provenance of the scientists. Dialectic or understanding would concern how we are to think about the nature of those properties and the structure of the sciences.

16. Conclusion

The images of the central books do not settle the question of whether or not the objects of the different faculties are the same. In appealing to a contents analysis, fundamentally an analysis that takes propositions to be the contents or ‘objects’ of belief and knowledge, as opposed to the objects themselves, i.e., material particulars or Forms, one allows that there is a path from belief to knowledge. The same proposition can be believed or known, depending on one's reasons or justification for holding the belief. But a contents analysis is not committed to a justified true belief account of all knowledge. It is left open that knowledge of Forms is somehow basic. Descending the line furnishes justification for the claims of the dianoetic sciences and beliefs about the material world, including the states of affairs in actual cities. What to do about the basic knowledge of Forms is a key issue. Sun, Line and Cave suggest to many readers that knowledge of Forms is intuitive or acquaintance-like. On the other hand, the refrain that one who knows can give an account (logos) of what he knows suggests knowledge by description or a propositional analysis. To emphasize relations between Forms, starting from the relation of the Good to all Forms, lends credence to the view that Plato is an epistemological holist. Holism is fueled by the search for definitions, since in order to know what, for instance, Human is, one must know all the elements of its definition, Animal, Rationality, Bipedality, and thus the definition of these elements, and so on. In order to know a given Form, one must know all the Forms, an extreme version of holism, or at least one must know all the Forms in a given science. The results of this analysis, the genera and species of a given science, are then hypostasized as Forms, nodes in a web or the elements of a field. There is a virtuous circle of justification.

Holist readings can also be combined with the narrow reading of recollection. The same (token) proposition may well be entertained by the philosopher as by those who still rely on concepts gleaned from their everyday encounters. Whether or not one knows or believes that ‘The triangle has three sides’ depends on what one is doing with that content or how one is justifying one's belief. The problem is that if somehow knowing that the triangle has three sides makes ‘triangle’ in the statement refer to the Form, while believing that (same?) proposition makes it refer to something else, then the content of the two states is different, and the content of the states is different because, it seems, the objects of the two states are different. Or one can try to save one's holism by allowing that the different states of mind cause (the contents of) the propositions to be different. Those who see recollection as an act engaged in only by philosophers maintain that their concept differs from the empirically grounded concept of the non-recollector, the occupant apparently of at least two of the other three stages of Line. But how one gets from the one concept to the other is unspecified. The concepts are linked by the ‘external fact’ that the temple, for instance, participates in Beauty. The holist program seems to entail that one can continue to add to beliefs about Beauty, where one is deploying the empirical concept, until one in a proper justificatory exercise acquires all the appropriately related beliefs about properties. Once that is accomplished, the philosophical concept is recollected. It remains open on this account, when one has recollected the Form and then descends, whether the contents of the philosopher's beliefs about the empirical world use the philosophical or empirical concept.

Those who read Plato as subscribing to different objects for Knowledge and Belief also need a story about how one gets from one stage to the next. If we assume that Forms are at work throughout the learning process, then Plato is best viewed as not identifying the Form with the propositional contents of his states. The same expression will, depending on the state of the agent, have different referents: the images; the material objects; some immaterial, abstract intermediary, or a mathematical in the case of dianoia. On the objects account, Plato has little to say about the status of the concepts deployed in thought. The Form of Equality is not the concept. The concept is present throughout the developmental life of the human. Because (knowledge of) the Form is latent in the mind, sensation and everyday talk are capable of ‘triggering’ the concept. A select individual will come to disdain the senses and the material objects of the sensible world and try to explain what accounts for the similarities present in his experience. The first fundamental moment of transition seems to be a shift from the many particulars to some abstract general notion, an inchoate ‘one-over-many’. That she is able to isolate these ‘ones' at all is, according to the broad reading of recollection, due to the unconscious operation or influence of the Form that allows her to sort the perceptions into kinds. The ontological status of these kinds is not, as yet, clear to her. With the further development of her dialectical capacity, the philosopher-to-be comes to think that there are Forms; that is, comes to think that there are special entities variously related to particulars and property-instances. The objects of these beliefs are still not the Forms themselves, if the state of mind of the scientist or Phaedan hypothesizer is not yet knowledge. At this stage, or even earlier, one might even be in possession of the definition of the Form and still not have knowledge. Exactly why one lacks knowledge is hard to say. It is not, it seems, because he lacks beliefs about the relation the Forms bear to other mathematical notions. On the one hand, it is doubtful that Plato believes that one can know all of mathematics or that one can know what a triangle is only if one knows every other shape. On the other hand, the mathematician does seem to know as much as would be needed to qualify as having knowledge of the mathematical Forms. The philosopher is not said to know more mathematics than the mathematician. He secures his knowledge in way the mathematician can't or doesn't.

If ‘more truths’ are added to the truths in the possession of the mathematician, these can only be truths about the nature of Forms. These higher logoi will then be general metaphysical principles about the role of the Good, the simplicity or complexity of Forms, the specification of the participation relation and so on (not a trivial ‘and so on’. ) Plato does then place fantastically high demands on knowledge. The desire to ensure irrefutability, perhaps the legacy of reflection on the Socratic elenchus, drives him to the conclusion that one really has recollected the Form only when one has become a metaphysician. She need (only!) know the general metaphysical theory.

There is little reason to think that Plato espouses a holism of knowledge of the sort discussed above. Plato never says that the mathematician or the philosopher needs to know all the truths of mathematics or ethics to know some Form. Moreover, while Plato does prescribe a course of study in the Republic designed to promote one's dialectical abilities, and while it is agreed by both holists and intuitionists, those who allow for atomic or acquaintance-like knowledge of a Form, that the same Forms are the basic objects of knowledge, it does not follow that Plato thinks that there is only one way to secure knowledge of the Forms. If there are different paths to knowledge, or different ways to know a given Form, then Plato's epistemology is liable to appear to be both holistic and acquaintance-like. As for when and where Recollection is operative, or whether Plato allows that a philosopher (or scientist) can know anything about the physical world, it is left to each reader of the dialogues to judge whether Plato is committed to gulfs between both the ordinary concepts of most humans and the special concepts of the few philosophers, as well as between the perfect Forms and the seemingly imperfect physical world. Since a Platonic dialogue is a dialectical conversation designed to summon the mind of the reader towards philosophizing, it is appropriate that each reader struggle to discover for himself What Knowledge Is.

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