Plato on Knowledge in the Theaetetus

First published Sat May 7, 2005; substantive revision Fri Feb 7, 2025

This article introduces Plato’s dialogue the Theaetetus (section 1), and briefly summarises its plot (section 2). Two leading interpretations of the dialogue, the Unitarian and Revisionist readings, are contrasted in section 3. Sections 4 to 8 explain and discuss the main arguments of the chief divisions of the dialogue. Section 9 provides some afterthoughts about the dialogue as a whole. One of the most challenging issues in this dialogue, as in all Platonic dialogues, is the comparison with Plato’s other writings, and especially the understanding of its chronological and theoretical placement within the corpus of Plato’s works. Alongside the numerous significant themes present in the dialogue, there are bibliographical references to the extensive secondary literature on the Theaetetus. These references will point to the most important and recent studies.

1. Introduction

The Theaetetus, which probably dates from about 369 BC, is arguably Plato’s greatest work on epistemology. (Arguably, it is his greatest work on anything.) Plato (c. 427–347 BC) has much to say about the nature of knowledge elsewhere. But only the Theaetetus offers a set-piece discussion of the question “What is knowledge?” (on the place and meaning of the Theaetetus within Plato’s oeuvre see Migliori 2022). Moreover, one must not overlook the great influence this dialogue had already in antiquity, for example, in Hellenistic philosophies, particularly in Epicureanism and Stoicism. Some studies have shown how the Theaetetus was one of the most important Platonic dialogues with which the Epicureans, the Stoics and the Academics closely and consistently engaged in the development of their theories of knowledge (see, for example, Long 2006, Ioppolo 2013, Verde 2020 and 2024b).

Like many other Platonic dialogues, the Theaetetus is dominated by question-and-answer exchanges, with Socrates as main questioner. His two respondents are Theaetetus, a brilliant young mathematician (see Narcy 1995, 63–69 on Theaetetus’ role in the development of Greek mathematics), and Theaetetus’ tutor Theodorus, who is rather less young (and rather less brilliant). It is highly significant that Plato chooses two mathematicians as interlocutors: the dialogue is aporetic, meaning that not even the brilliant mathematician Theaetetus, who engages with one of the “exact sciences,” is able to define what knowledge truly is. It is hard not to discern, behind this point, a subtle Platonic critique of the mathematics of his time.

Also like other Platonic dialogues, the main discussion of the Theaetetus is set within a framing conversation (142a–143c) between Eucleides and Terpsion (cp. Phaedo 59c). This frame may be meant as a dedication of the work to the memory of the man Theaetetus. Sedley 2004 (6–8) has argued that it is meant to set some distance between Plato’s authorial voice and the various other voices (including Socrates’) that are heard in the dialogue. Alternatively, or also, it may be intended, like Symposium 172–173, to prompt questions about the reliability of knowledge based on testimony. (Cp. the law-court passage (Theaetetus 201a–c), and Socrates’ dream (201c–202c).)

It is well known that the literary framework is an extremely important element for understanding Platonic dialogues (see Capuccino 2014). The framework of the Theaetetus is particularly significant because it features Socrates’ disciple, Eucleides of Megara, recounting to Terpsion the dialogue between Socrates and Theaetetus (which took place shortly before Socrates’ death), the content of which Socrates himself had related to Eucleides. Eucleides (142d–143a) notes that he wrote down some notes (hypomnēmata) to capture the reasoning of that dialogue; he further adds that whenever he traveled to Athens, he would ask Socrates if there was anything he did not remember, which allowed him to correct what he had written. This is an exceptionally important and unique element within the entire Platonic corpus: according to Platonic literary fiction, the Theaetetus is a dialogue written by Eucleides under the supervision of Socrates, who would correct what Eucleides had written each time (see Kaklamanou-Pavlou 2016). This indicates the central role of Socrates in this text and the crucial importance of this dialogue within Plato’s philosophical project.

The Theaetetus’ most important similarity to other Platonic dialogues is that it is aporetic—it is a dialogue that ends in an impasse. The Theaetetus reviews three definitions of knowledge in turn; plus, in a preliminary discussion, one would-be definition which, it is said, does not really count. Each of these proposals is rejected, and no alternative is explicitly offered. Thus we complete the dialogue without discovering what knowledge is. From the outset, it must be clarified that the object of analysis in the dialogue is not a generic notion of knowledge but the epistēmē—that is, scientific knowledge (which could also be translated as “science”) that is absolutely stable, grounded, and incontrovertible. We discover only three things that knowledge is not (210c; cp. 183a5, 187a1). This is a crucial point that highlights the positive and heuristic role of aporia in Plato (see, for instance, Erler 1987): at the end of the dialogue (210a-b), Socrates clearly rules out the possibility that the definition of knowledge could coincide with perception (aisthêsis), correct opinion (orthê doxa), or even correct opinion with justification/account (logos). From a Platonic perspective, this is not a meager result but rather an essential foundation for continuing the inquiry and for definitively excluding what cannot be considered knowledge.

It is normally supposed that Plato’s Parmenides and Theaetetus are dialogues strictly connected each other, probably in that order. If so, and if we take as seriously as Plato seems to the important criticisms of the theory of Forms that are made in the Parmenides, then the significance of the Theaetetus’s return to the aporetic method looks obvious. Apparently Plato has abandoned the certainties of his middle-period works, such as the theory of Forms, and returned to the almost-sceptical manner of the early dialogues. (It should be noted that here the term ‘sceptical’ is used in its more common sense and has nothing to do with Ancient Scepticism whether in its Academic or Pyrrhonian variants.) In the Theaetetus, the Forms that so dominated the Republic’s discussions of epistemology are hardly mentioned at all. The fact that there is very likely no clear and explicit reference to the theory of Forms in the dialogue is a striking fact, especially in a text fully dedicated to knowledge, given that the Forms are undoubtedly Plato’s definitive response to the problem of what knowledge is. The key question, then, is to understand why, in the Theaetetus, Plato does not directly address the Forms to resolve this central issue in his philosophy. A good understanding of the dialogue must make sense of this fact.

2. Summary of the Dialogue

Like other Platonic dialogues, the Theaetetus also possesses an ethical-moral significance, which is clearly marked by the so-called Digression on the philosophical life. This significance is evident from the very beginning of the text: the dialogue (142a) opens with Eucleides of Megara recounting how he saw Theaetetus at the port, returning from the Battle of Corinth (either the one in 394 BC or, more likely, the one in 369 BC), in critical condition (see Mele 2002). Thus, Plato presents Theaetetus not only as an excellent mathematician but also as a patriot who offers his life for his polis; this suggests that science and philosophy must always carry moral and civic value. At the gates of the city of Megara in 369 BC, Eucleides and Terpsion hear a slave read out Eucleides’ memoir of a philosophical discussion that took place in 399 BC, shortly before Socrates’ trial and execution (142a–143c); according to a passage from the Anonymous Commentator on the Theaetetus (PBerol. 9782, coll. III 28-IV 6 Bastianini-Sedley; the most recent critical edition of the papyrus – with Italian translation and commentary – is by Bastianini-Sedley 1995; on this text see Tarrant 2000, Ch. 11 and Bonazzi 2003, Ch. 5), there was a double prologue of the Theaetetus circulating in antiquity. This has led some scholars to believe in the existence of two different versions of the dialogue (see Tulli 2011). In this, the young Theaetetus is introduced to Socrates by his mathematics tutor, Theodorus. Socrates questions Theaetetus about the nature of expertise, and this leads him to pose the key question of the dialogue: “What is knowledge?” (143d–145e). Theaetetus’ first response (D0) is to give examples of knowledge such as geometry, astronomy, harmony, arithmetic (146a–c). Socrates objects that, for any x, examples of x are neither necessary nor sufficient for a definition of x (146d–147e; this argument inevitably recalls the passage about the swarm of virtues in the Meno 71e). Theaetetus admits this, and contrasts the ease with which he and his classmates define mathematical terms with his inability to define knowledge (147c–148e). Socrates offers to explain Theaetetus’ bewilderment about the question “What is knowledge?” by comparing himself with a midwife: Theaetetus, he suggests, is in discomfort because he is in intellectual labour (148e–151d). In this regard, it is important to note that the Theaetetus is a significant dialogue as it contains one of the most detailed descriptions of the Socratic maieutic method (see Ioppolo 1999, xiv-xvi and Giannopoulou 2022). From the outset (144c), Theaetetus is presented by Plato as a true alter ego of Socrates—that is, as the quintessential (Socratic) philosopher who, despite his hesitance to engage directly with Socrates, is filled with a desire for knowledge and seeks to pursue it through dialogue (see Verde 2024a on the ‘Socratic’ nature of the young Theaetetus). Socrates (150a-b) compares himself to midwives but asserts that his role is superior to theirs. His greatest skill, he explains, is the ability to distinguish and ascertain whether the soul of his interlocutor is “giving birth” to something false or true. It should be noted that Socrates does not do this because he himself possesses the truth; rather, he is only able to discern whether his interlocutor’s response is valid for the continuation of the inquiry. Socrates, therefore, aided also by divine intervention (150d), assists those he recognizes as truly “pregnant” with knowledge—that is, those who, metaphorically, are in labor (151a-b). Here, the metaphor of labor signifies aporia, literally the lack of a way out, which for Socrates holds heuristic value: to be in aporia means to be in the ideal state to continue the search for knowledge.

Thus prompted, Theaetetus states his first acceptable definition, which is the proposal that

(D1)
“Knowledge is perception (aisthêsis)” (151d–e).

Socrates does not respond to this directly. Instead he claims that D1 entails two other theories (Protagoras’ and Heracleitus’), which he expounds (151e–160e) and then criticises (160e–183c). Socrates eventually presents no fewer than eleven arguments, not all of which seem seriously intended, against the Protagorean and Heracleitean views. If any of these arguments hit its target, then by modus tollens D1 is also false. A more direct argument against D1 is eventually given at 184–187.

In 187b4–8, Theaetetus proposes a second definition of knowledge:

(D2)
“Knowledge is true belief (orthê doxa).”

D2 provokes Socrates to ask: how can there be any such thing as false belief? There follows a five-phase discussion which attempts to come up with an account of false belief. All five of these attempts fail, and that appears to be the end of the topic of false belief. Finally, at 200d–201c, Socrates returns to D2 itself. He dismisses D2 just by arguing that accidental true beliefs cannot be called knowledge, giving Athenian jurymen as an example of accidental true belief.

Theaetetus tries a third time. His final proposal is:

(D3)
Knowledge is “true belief with an account (logos)” (201c–d).

The ensuing discussion attempts to spell out what it might be like for D3 to be true, then makes three attempts to spell out what a logos is.

In 201d–202d, the famous passage known as The Dream of Socrates, a two-part ontology of elements and complexes is proposed. Parallel to this ontology runs a theory of explanation that claims that to explain, to offer a logos, is to analyse complexes into their elements, i.e., those parts which cannot be further analysed. Crucially, the Dream Theory says that knowledge of O is true belief about O plus an account of O’s composition. If O is not composite, O cannot be known, but only “perceived” (202b6). When Socrates argues against the Dream Theory (202d8–206b11), it is this entailment that he focuses on.

Socrates then turns to consider, and reject, three attempts to spell out what a logos is—to give an account of “account.” The first attempt takes logos just to mean “speech” or “statement” (206c–e). The second account (206e4–208b12) of “logos of O” takes it as “enumeration of the elements of O.” The third and last proposal (208c1–210a9) is that to give the logos of O is to cite the sêmeion or diaphora of O, the “sign” or diagnostic feature wherein O differs from everything else.

All three attempts to give an account of “account” fail. The day’s discussion, and the dialogue, end in aporia. Socrates leaves to face his enemies in the courtroom.

3. Overall Interpretations of the Theaetetus

The Theaetetus is a principal field of battle for one of the main disputes between Plato’s interpreters. This is the dispute between Unitarians and Revisionists.

Unitarians argue that Plato’s works display a unity of doctrine and a continuity of purpose throughout. Unitarians include Aristotle, Proclus, and all the ancient and mediaeval commentators; Bishop Berkeley; and in the modern era, Schleiermacher, Ast, Shorey, Diès, Ross, Cornford, and Cherniss.

Revisionists retort that Plato’s works are full of revisions, retractations, and changes of direction. Eminent Revisionists include Lutoslawski, Ryle, Robinson, Runciman, Owen, McDowell, Bostock, and many recent commentators.

Unitarianism is historically the dominant interpretive tradition. Revisionism, it appears, was not invented until the text-critical methods, such as stylometry, that were developed in early Nineteenth-Century German Biblical studies were transferred to Plato.

In the Twentieth Century, a different brand of Revisionism has dominated English-speaking Platonic studies. This owes its impetus to a desire to read Plato as charitably as possible, and a belief that a charitable reading of Plato’s works will minimise their dependence on the theory of Forms. (Corollary: Unitarians are likelier than Revisionists to be sympathetic to the theory of Forms.)

Unitarianism could be the thesis that all of Plato’s work is, really, Socratic in method and inspiration, and that Plato should be credited with no view that is not endorsed in the early dialogues. (In some recent writers, Unitarianism is this thesis: see Penner and Rowe [2005].) But this is not the most usual form of Unitarianism, which is more likely to “read back” the concerns of the Phaedo and the Republic into the Socratic dialogues, than to “read forward” the studied agnosticism of the early works into these more ambitious later dialogues. Likewise, Revisionism could be evidenced by the obvious changes of outlook that occur, e.g., between the Charmides and the Phaedo, or again between the Protagoras and the Gorgias. But the main focus of the Revisionist/Unitarian debate has never been on these dialogues. The contrasts between the Charmides and the Phaedo, and the Protagoras and the Gorgias, tell us little about the question whether Plato ever abandoned the theory of Forms. And that has usually been the key dispute between Revisionists and Unitarians.

Hence the debate has typically focused on the contrast between “the Middle Period dialogues” and “the Late dialogues.” Revisionists say that the Middle Period dialogues enounce positive doctrines, above all the theory of Forms, which the Late dialogues criticise, reject, or simply bypass. The main place where Revisionists (e.g., Ryle 1939) suppose that Plato criticises the theory of Forms is in the Parmenides (though some Revisionists find criticism of the theory of Forms in the Theaetetus and Sophist as well). The main places where Revisionists look to see Plato managing without the theory of Forms are the Theaetetus and Sophist.

Ryle’s Revisionism was soon supported by other Oxford Plato scholars such as Robinson 1950 and Runciman 1962 (28). Revisionism was also defended by G.E.L. Owen. More recently, McDowell 1976, Bostock 1988, and Burnyeat 1990 are three classic books on the Theaetetus of a decidedly Revisionist tendency. (McDowell shows a particularly marked reluctance to bring in the theory of Forms anywhere where he is not absolutely compelled to.)

Revisionists are committed by their overall stance to a number of more particular views. They are more or less bound to say that the late Plato takes the Parmenides’ critique of the theory of Forms to be cogent, or at least impressive; that the Sophist’s theory of “the five greatest kinds” (Sophist 254b–258e) is not a development of the theory of Forms; and that the Timaeus was written before the Parmenides, because of the Timaeus’ apparent defence of theses from the theory of Forms. Their line on the Theaetetus will be that its argument does not support the theory of Forms; that the Theaetetus is interesting precisely because it shows us how good at epistemology Plato is once he frees himself from his obsession with the Forms.

On the other hand, the Revisionist claim that the Theaetetus shows Plato doing more or less completely without the theory of Forms is very plausible. There are no explicit mentions of the Forms at all in the Theaetetus, except possibly (and even this much is disputed) in what many take to be the philosophical backwater of the Digression and in the introduction of common concepts/properties (koina). The main argument of the dialogue seems to get along without even implicit appeal to the theory of Forms. In the Theaetetus, Revisionism seems to be on its strongest ground of all. It must be emphasized, however, that if Forms were explicitly present in the dialogue, its outcome would likely not be aporetic. Everything suggests that Plato is well aware—based on comparisons with other dialogues—that absolute knowledge coincides with the knowledge of Forms. However, such knowledge, as especially indicated in the Phaedo, is only possible for the disembodied soul (see Trabattoni 2012 and the reply by Ferrari 2013).

The usual Unitarian answer is that this silence is studied. In the Theaetetus, Unitarians suggest, Plato is showing what knowledge is not. His argument is designed to show that certain sorts of alternatives to Plato’s own account of knowledge must fail. Plato demonstrates this failure by the ‘maieutic’ method of developing those accounts until they fail. Thus the Theaetetus shows the impossibility of a successful account of knowledge that does not invoke the Forms. From this perspective, the Theaetetus demonstrates, on the one hand, what knowledge certainly is not (perception, true opinion, etc.), and, on the other, the impossibility of arriving at a definitive and absolutely valid definition of knowledge within the confines of present life.

The fault-line between Unitarians and Revisionists is the deepest fissure separating interpreters of the Theaetetus. It is not the only distinction among overall interpretations of the dialogue. It has also been suggested, both in the ancient and the modern eras, that the Theaetetus is a sceptical work; that the Theaetetus is a genuinely aporetic work; and that the Theaetetus is a disjointed work. However, there is no space to review these possibilities here. A few words on the sceptical interpretation of the Theaetetus. As mentioned at the outset, the Theaetetus has been one of the most extensively “pillaged” dialogues by Hellenistic philosophies. However, Platonic dialogues were often not read and interpreted in their entirety; rather, various philosophical schools emphasized the importance of select parts, sometimes even out of context. It is highly likely that the so-called Academic sceptics, beginning with Arcesilaus, saw in the Theaetetus—and especially in its aporetic outcome—a crucial dialogue for their view that absolute, dogmatic knowledge, assumed as possible by the Stoics and Epicureans, was a chimera. Nevertheless, when this dialogue is considered within the larger Platonic corpus, it is difficult to conclude that Plato would have been or became a sceptic precisely with the Theaetetus. To regard Plato as a sceptic, in the sense that this label would later assume—particularly with Neo-Pyrrhonism from Aenesidemus onward—is a considerable overstatement. Plato, as noted earlier, fully recognizes that the knowledge of Forms is absolute knowledge; however, within the limits of earthly life, it is essentially impossible to provide a definitive definition of knowledge or to attain solid epistēmē. In brief, Plato seems to suggest that it is not possible to provide an absolutely valid definition of knowledge, yet this does not mean that knowledge does not exist or (for the disembodied soul) cannot be attained. Indeed, the Socratic inquiry into knowledge presupposes its existence. From this perspective, the Theaetetus is and remains a quintessentially Socratic dialogue—not because Plato pushes Socratic thought to its limits to declare its failure in the realm of knowledge, but because it is the Socratic dialogue itself that concludes that an absolutely valid definition is unattainable. To this, Plato, so to speak, adds the theory of Forms, which, going well beyond Socratic philosophy, constitutes the genuine Platonic response to the problem of knowledge (the fact that this genuinely Platonic theory is not explicitly present in the Theaetetus does not necessarily indicate that Plato abandoned it or that, for Plato, knowledge is impossible). It is time to look more closely at the detail of the arguments that Plato gives in the distinct sections of the dialogue.

4. The Introduction to the Dialogue: 142a–145e

We should not miss the three philosophical theses that are explicitly advanced in the Introduction. They are offered without argument by Socrates, and agreed to without argument by Theaetetus, at 145d7–145e5:

  1. The wise are wise sophiai (= by/ because of/ in respect of/ as a result of wisdom: 145d11).
  2. To learn is to become wiser about the topic you are learning about (145d8–9).
  3. Wisdom (sophia) and knowledge (epistēmē) are the same thing (145e5).

All three theses might seem contentious today. (1) seems to allude to Phaedo 100e’s notorious thesis about the role of the Form of F-ness in any x’s being F—that x is F “by the Form of F-ness.” (2) looks contentious because it implies (3); and (3) brings us to a second question about 142a–145e (which is also an important question about the whole dialogue): What is the meaning of the Greek word that we are translating as “knowledge,” epistēmē? It can be stated that the identification of sophia and epistēmē (which appears multiple times in the dialogue) is the key to understanding the type of knowledge Socrates seeks (see Benitez-Guimaraes 1993 and Moss 2021, 234–242). Socrates is not concerned with a generic or superficial concept of knowledge; rather, he seeks epistēmē that coincides with sophia, understood as a form of knowledge that is absolute and incontrovertible.

5. Definition by Examples: 146a–151d

At 145d Socrates states the “one little question that puzzles” him: “What is knowledge?” Theaetetus’ first response (D0) is to offer examples of knowledge (146c). Socrates rejects this response, arguing that, for any x, examples of x are neither necessary nor sufficient for a definition of x. They are not necessary, because they are irrelevant (146e). They are not sufficient, because they presuppose the understanding that a definition is meant to provide (147a–b). Moreover (147c), a definition could be briefly stated, whereas talking about examples is “an interminable diversion” (aperanton hodon).

Theaetetus is puzzled by his own inability to answer Socrates’ request for a definition of knowledge, and contrasts it with the ease with which he can provide mathematical definitions. He gives an example of a mathematical definition; scholars are divided about the aptness of the parallel between this, and what would be needed for a definition of knowledge. Socrates’ response, when Theaetetus still protests his inability to define knowledge, is to compare himself to a midwife in a long and intricate analogy.

Many ancient Platonists read the midwife analogy, and more recently Cornford 1935 has read it, as alluding to the theory of recollection (see Trabattoni 2022). But it is better not to import metaphysical assumptions into the text without good reason, and it is hard to see what the reason would be beyond a determination to insist that Plato always maintained the theory of recollection. With or without this speculation, the midwife passage does tell us something important about how the Theaetetus is going to proceed. As previously mentioned, the fact that the Theaetetus contains one of the most comprehensive descriptions of Socrates’ maieutic method (in addition to the fact that, in the literary fiction crafted by Plato, the Theaetetus has been “checked” and “reviewed” by Socrates himself) appears to be a clear authorial signal of the importance that Socratic teaching holds for Plato in the domain of knowledge. In line with the classification that the ancient editors set at the front of the dialogue, it is going to be peirastikos, an experimental dialogue (see Diog. Laert. III.49–51; see too Alb. Prolog. III.148, 23 ff., p. 31 Nüsser). It has rightly been clarified that ancient commentators attempted to classify the Platonic dialogues primarily to “neutralize” their aporetic nature, which could indeed hinder any effort to systematize Plato’s corpus and philosophy (Ferrari 2011,141). Given that the Theaetetus possesses a philosophical scope that might even be considered superior to the Sophist or the Parmenides (see again Ferrari 2011, 141–142), reducing a dialogue “supervised” by Socrates himself to a mere zetetic exercise seems excessive and is a reading that Plato himself would likely not have endorsed. The aporetic nature of the dialogue should not only not be neutralized but stands as an undeniable fact; it is, in fact, a method Plato uses to assert what knowledge certainly is not and to demonstrate the impossibility of attaining absolute knowledge during earthly life, even for “pure scientists” such as mathematicians like Theodorus and Theaetetus (see Tschemplik 2008, Ch. 5). Anyway, this dialogue will try out a number of suggestions about the nature of knowledge. As in the aporetic dialogues, there is no guarantee that any of these suggestions will be successful (and every chance that none of them will be).

So read, the midwife passage can also tell us something important about the limitations of the Theaetetus’ inquiry. The limitations of the inquiry are the limitations of the main inquirers, and neither (the historical) Socrates nor Theaetetus was a card-carrying adherent of Plato’s theory of Forms. Perhaps the dialogue brings us only as far as the threshold of the theory of Forms precisely because, on Socratic principles, one can get no further. To get beyond where the Theaetetus leaves off, you have to be a Platonist. This is an extremely delicate point because it represents the central issue on which interpretations of the dialogue diverge. If we consider the Theaetetus as a fully philosophical text, Plato intends to communicate doctrines of significant relevance within his philosophy. According to one interpretation, the Theaetetus can be seen as the text marking the crisis of Socratism and Plato’s radical departure from Socratic philosophy: within the limits of Socratism, it is impossible to reach any universally valid definition—i.e., to arrive at truth—achieving only a temporary and always debatable concord (homologia). However, the Theaetetus can also be interpreted differently: not as a sign of Socratism’s definitive crisis but rather as Plato’s distinctly Socratic acknowledgment that human inquiry cannot exceed certain well-defined limits (which, incidentally, coincide with the limits of logoi, the discourse that underpins any investigation) without this leading to scepticism.

According to this interpretation, the Theaetetus contains no explicit reference to the theory of Forms (for if it did, it would not be an aporetic dialogue), yet this does not exclude the existence of absolute knowledge. Instead, under this view, absolute knowledge is the prerogative of disembodied, rather than embodied, souls. This does not mean that knowledge is unattainable in this life, but it is not possible to achieve knowledge that is absolute and incontrovertible. (For book-length developments of this reading of the Theaetetus, see Sedley 2004 and Chappell 2005.)

6. First Definition (D1): “Knowledge is Perception”: 151e–187a

Between Stephanus pages 151 and 187, and leaving aside the Digression, 172–177 (section 6.4), 31 pages of close and complex argument state, discuss, and eventually refute the first of Theaetetus’ three serious attempts at a definition of knowledge:

(D1)
“Knowledge is perception.”

As before, there are two main alternative readings of 151–187: the Unitarian and the Revisionist. On the Unitarian reading, Plato’s purpose is to salvage as much as possible of the theories of Protagoras and Heracleitus (each respectfully described as ou phaulon: 151e8, 152d2). Plato’s strategy is to show that these theories have their own distinctive area of application, the perceptible or sensible world, within which they are true. However, the sensible world is not the whole world, and so these theories are not the whole truth. We get absurdities if we try to take them as unrestrictedly true. To avoid these absurdities it is necessary to posit the intelligible world (the world of the Forms but, of course, as has been indicated several times, Plato is by no means explicit in the dialogue about introducing the intelligible realm) alongside the sensible world (the world of perception). When this is done, Platonism subsumes the theories of Protagoras and Heracleitus as partial truths. On this reading, the strategy of the discussion of D1 is to transcend Protagoras and Heracleitus: to explain their views by showing how they are, not the truth, but parts of a larger truth. In the process the discussion reveals logical pressures that may push us towards the two-worlds Platonism that many readers, e.g., Ross and Cornford, find in the Republic and Timaeus.

On the Revisionist reading, Plato’s purpose is to refute the theories of Protagoras and Heracleitus. He thinks that the absurdities those theories give rise to, come not from trying to take the theories as unrestrictedly true, but from trying to take them as true at all, even of the sensible world. Anyone who tries to take seriously the thesis that knowledge is perception has to adopt theories of knowledge and perception like Protagoras’ and Heracleitus’ (on Heracleitus, it is also important to consider Aristotle’s testimony in the De Anima, I.2, 405a 25–28 = 22 A 15 Diels-Kranz = III 9 R43 Laks-Most, where it is stated that for Heracleitus the soul is incorporeal and in constant flux. Therefore, what is in motion—namely, the reality of things—can be known only by what is also in motion, that is, the soul). But their theories are untenable. By modus tollens this shows that D1 itself is untenable. On this reading, the strategy of the discussion of D1 is to move us towards the view that sensible phenomena have to fall under the same general metaphysical theory as intelligible phenomena.

6.1 The Definition of Knowledge as Perception: 151d–e

At 151d7–e3 Theaetetus proposes:

(D1)
“Knowledge is nothing other than perception” (aisthêsis).

Socrates immediately equates D1 with Protagoras’s thesis that

(Hm)
“Man is the measure of all things” (homo mensura; to correctly understand Protagoras’ doctrine, attention must be paid to the term hôs: “of all things—chremata, which could also be translated as ‘facts’ or ‘substances’—man is the measure, of those that are as (hôs) they are, and of those that are not as (hôs) they are not.” In this context, hôs (= as) precisely indicates the manner in which things appear or are phenomenally presented to the subject; see on Protagoras’ doctrine Corradi 2012: 112–132).

and takes this, in turn, to entail the thesis:

(PS)
Things are to any human just as they appear to that human (phenomenal subjectivism).

Socrates then adds that, in its turn, PS entails Heracleitus’ view that “All is flux,” that there are no stably existing objects with stably enduring qualities. Of course, Heracleitus is mentioned in the text, but it should not be overlooked that Socrates is primarily referring to Protagoras, to whom a secret or private doctrine is attributed (see Lisi 2020). According to some scholars (for example, Brancacci 2011; see too Zilioli 2022), this doctrine is not an invention of Plato but rather a historically authentic teaching of the sophist. In addition to Protagoras and Heracleitus (152e) as proponents of the doctrine of flux, Socrates also mentions Empedocles, as well as Epicharmus (one likely reference could be the so-called fragments ex Alcimo of Epicharmus transmitted by Diogenes Laertius III 9 ff.), and Homer. Of particular interest is the fact that Socrates explicitly excludes Parmenides from the group of philosophers who support the doctrine of flux; indeed, Plato interprets Parmenides’ philosophy as a form of immobility, whereby genuine knowledge is possible only if things remain unchanging (there are no compelling reasons to exclude the possibility that Plato himself genuinely believed that perception cannot constitute knowledge because sensible objects are in constant flux). In this respect, the exclusion of Parmenides suggests that, at least in the realm of knowledge, Plato aligns himself much more closely with Parmenides than with the other philosophers mentioned (see Trabattoni 2018, 178 n. 60).

The first of these deft exchanges struck the Anonymous Commentator as disingenuous: “Plato himself knew that Protagoras’ opinion about knowledge was not the same as Theaetetus’” (Anon., col. LXII 8–12 Bastianini-Sedley). Certainly it is easy to see counter-examples to the alleged entailment. Take, for instance, the thesis that knowledge is awareness (which is often the right way to translate aisthêsis; on this concept see Aronadio 2016). Or take the thesis that to know is to perceive things as God, or the Ideal Observer, perceives them, and that we fail to know (or to perceive) just insofar as our opinions are other than God’s or the Ideal Observer’s. These theses are both versions of D1. Neither version entails the claim that “man is the measure of all things” (Hm)—nor the Protagorean view that lies behind that slogan.

So how, if at all, does D1 entail all the things that Socrates apparently makes it entail in 151–184? And does Plato think it has all these entailments? Evidently the answer to that depends on how we understand D1. In particular, it depends on the meaning of the word aisthêsis, “perception,” in D1. If the slogan “Knowledge is perception” equates knowledge with what ordinary speakers of classical Greek would have meant by aisthêsis, then D1 does not entail Protagoras’ and Heracleitus’ views. In the ordinary sense of aisthêsis, there are (as just pointed out) too many other possible ways of spelling out D1 for the move from D1 to Hm to be logically obligatory. But if the slogan “Knowledge is perception” equates knowledge with what Protagoras and Heracleitus meant by aisthêsis, D1 does entail Protagoras’ and Heracleitus’ views. Of course it does; for then D1 simply says that knowledge is just what Protagoras and Heracleitus say knowledge is.

6.2 The “Cold Wind” Argument, and the Theory of Flux: 152a–160e

At 152b1–152c8 Socrates begins his presentation of Protagoras’ view that things are to any human just as they appear to that human by taking the example of a wind which affects two people differently. Such cases, he says, support Protagoras’ analysis: “that the wind is cold to the one who feels cold, but not cold to the one who does not feel cold.”

In 155c–157c the flux theory is used to develop a Protagorean/Heracleitean account of perception, to replace accounts based on the object/property ontology of common sense. At 156a, Socrates mentions the doctrine of unnamed kompsoteroi—literally, “more refined” philosophers—who proposed a variation on the theory of flux. The identity of these kompsoteroi has been widely debated. If they are not a Platonic “invention” (cf. Sedley 2004, 46 n. 9) and if we exclude a reference to the Cyrenaics (according to Zilioli 2012, 47–71, they would be Aristippus and the early Cyrenaics; Giannantoni 1958, 129–145, and Tsouna 1998, 124–137, hold a different view), one might also consider them as disciples of Protagoras. The core of the kompsoteroi doctrine lies in the idea that everything (to pan) is kinesis: it is an especially radical doctrine, as it categorically excludes the existence of anything outside of motion. Socrates states that they acknowledge two types of kinesis: one capable of acting (poiein) and another of suffering/undergoing (paschein). Closely connected to this distinction is that between aisthêton and aisthêsis (156b)—the sensible (what is the object of perception) and perception itself. This differentiation is decisive for Socrates in clarifying how the perceptual process is, in every case, the result of a relationship between poiein and paschein, between aisthêton and aisthêsis.

Socrates notes the subversive implications of the theory of flux for the meaningfulness and truth-aptness of most of our language as it stands. (He returns to this point at 183a–b.) The ontology of the flux theory distinguishes kinds of “process” (kinêsis), i.e., of flux, in two ways: as fast or slow, and as active or passive. Hence there are four such processes. On these the flux theory’s account of perception rests.

At 157c–160c Socrates states a first objection to the flux theory. This asks how the flux theorist is to distinguish false (deceptive) appearances such as dreams from the true (undeceptive) appearances of the waking world. The flux theorist’s answer is that such appearances should not be described as ‘true’ and ‘false’ appearances to the same person. Rather they should be described as different appearances to different people. According to the flux theorist, we have the same person if and only if we have the same combination of a perception and a perceiving (159c–d). So there is no need to call any appearances false. Thus we preserve the claim that all appearances are true—a claim which must be true if knowledge is perception in the sense that Socrates has taken that definition.

160b–d summarises the whole of 151–160. Socrates shows how the exploration of Theaetetus’ identification of knowledge with perception has led us to develop a whole battery of views: in particular, a Protagorean doctrine of the incorrigibility of perception, and a Heracleitean account of what perception is. Thus “perception has one of the two marks of knowledge, infallibility” (Cornford 1935, 58); “and, if we can accept Protagoras’ identification of what appears to me with what is, ignoring the addition ‘for me’ and the distinction between being and becoming, the case will be complete.”

6.3 The Refutation of the Thesis that Knowledge is Perception: 160e5–186e12

160e marks the transition from the statement and exposition of the definition of knowledge as perception (D1), to the presentation of criticism and refutation of that definition.

Scholars have divided about the overall purpose of 160e–186e. Mostly they have divided along the lines described in section 3, taking either a Revisionist or a Unitarian view of Part One of the Theaetetus.

If some form of Unitarianism is correct, an examination of 160–186 should show that Plato’s strategy in the critique of D1 highlights two distinctions:

  1. A distinction between the claim that the objects of perception are in flux, and the claim that everything is in flux.
  2. A distinction between bare sensory awareness, and judgement on the basis of such awareness.

One vital passage for distinction (1) is 181b–183b. If Unitarianism is right, this passage should be an attack on the Heracleitean thesis that everything is in flux, but not an attack on the Heracleitean thesis that the objects of perception are in flux. According to Unitarians, the thesis that the objects of perception are in flux is a Platonic thesis too. Readers should ask themselves whether this is the right way to read 181b –183b. Anyway, this is an important and likely plausible point; after all, if Plato had not seriously considered the flux of all things, his refutation of Protagoras’ position would be difficult to sustain. Ultimately, the refutation of Protagoras’ doctrine of flux is not merely intended to exclude the reduction of knowledge to mere perception; it also aims to demonstrate that authentic knowledge presupposes a well-defined stability, which flux, by its nature, cannot provide. This, however, does not mean that no form of knowledge of the sensible world is possible; it only means that this knowledge will not be epistēmē, that is, absolute and incontrovertible knowledge.

Distinction (2) seems to be explicitly stated at 179c. There also seems to be clear evidence of distinction (2) in the final argument against D1, at 184–187. Distinction (2) is also at work, apparently, in the discussion of some of the nine objections addressed to the Protagorean theory. Some of these objections can plausibly be read as points about the unattractive consequences of failing to distinguish the Protagorean claim that bare sense-awareness is incorrigible (as the Unitarian Plato agrees) from the further Protagorean claim that judgements about sense-awareness are incorrigible (which the Unitarian Plato denies).

The criticism of D1 breaks down into twelve separate arguments, interrupted by the Digression (172c–177c: translated and discussed separately in section 6.4 below). There is no space here to comment in detail on every one of these arguments, some of which, as noted above, have often been thought frivolous or comically intended (cp. 152e1–153d5). Some brief notes on the earlier objections will show what the serious point of each might be.

The first objection to Protagoras (160e–161d) observes that if all perceptions are true, then there is no reason to think that animal perceptions are inferior to human ones: a situation which Socrates finds absurd.

This distinction between arguments against a Protagorean view about perception and a Protagorean view about judgement about perception is relevant to the second objection too (161d–162a). This objection (cp. Cratylus 386c) makes the point that Protagoras’ theory implies that no one is wiser than anyone else. Notably, the argument does not attack the idea that perception is infallible. Rather, it attacks the idea that the opinion or judgement that anyone forms on the basis of perception is infallible (161d3). (This is an important piece of support for Unitarianism: cp. distinction (2) above.)

A third objection to Protagoras’ thesis is very quickly stated in Socrates’ two rhetorical questions at 162c2–6. Since Protagoras’ thesis implies that all perceptions are true, it not only has the allegedly absurd consequence that animals’ perceptions are not inferior to humans. It also has the consequence that humans’ perceptions are not inferior to the gods’. This consequence too is now said to be absurd.

As with the first two objections, so here. If we consider divinities and humans just as perceivers, there is no automatic reason to prefer divine perceptions, and hence no absurdity. Plato may well want us to infer that the Greek gods are not different just in respect of being perceivers from humans. But they are different in their powers of judgement about perceptions.

The next four arguments (163a–168c) present counter-examples to the alleged equivalence of knowledge and perception. The fourth observes that, if perception = knowledge, then anyone who perceives an utterance in a given language should have knowledge of that utterance, i.e., understand it—which plainly doesn’t happen. The fifth raises a similar problem about memory and perception: remembering things is knowing them, but not perceiving them. The sixth (the “covered eye”) objection contrasts not perceiving an object (in one sensory modality) with not knowing it. If perception = knowledge, seeing an object with one eye and not seeing it with the other would appear to be a case of the contradictory state of both knowing it and not knowing it. The seventh points out that one can perceive dimly or faintly, clearly or unclearly, but that these adverbial distinctions do not apply to ways of knowing—as they must if knowing is perceiving.

In 165e4–168c5, Socrates sketches Protagoras’s response to these seven objections (this section is usually called the Apology of Protagoras). Protagoras makes two main points. First, he can meet some of the objections by distinguishing types and occasions of perception. Second, teaching as he understands it is not a matter of getting the pupil to have true rather than false beliefs. Since there are no false beliefs, the change that a teacher can effect is not a change from false belief to true belief or knowledge. Rather, Protagoras’ model of teaching is a therapeutic model. What a good teacher does, according to him, is use arguments (or discourses: logoi) as a good doctor uses drugs, to replace the state of the soul in which “bad things are and appear” with one in which “good things are and appear.” While all beliefs are true, not all beliefs are beneficial. Protagoras’s discourse is a makros logos, a lengthy and elaborate speech typical of the Sophists. Although the issue is highly controversial, it is reasonable to believe that what Plato has Protagoras express in this section of the dialogue is not entirely incompatible with the sophist’s own thought. Nevertheless, it must be remembered that it is still Plato who writes the so-called Apology of Protagoras: the philosopher has every interest in distinguishing himself from the sophist, especially in differentiating the realm of truth from that of utility. Protagoras explains how the doctrine of homo mensura should be interpreted: it should not be considered in epistemological terms. The point is that Protagoras is less concerned with truth or falsity than with goodness and utility. The sophist (166d–e) does not deny the existence of wisdom and the figure of the wise person; rather, like the good rhetorician, the wise person is one who can transform (metaballôn) what appears and is bad into what appears and is good. This principle also holds in the political realm, which is of particular interest to the Sophists: rhetoricians are capable of making the good, rather than the bad, appear just to cities (167c). Plato’s stance could not be more opposed: he is interested in truth, which has nothing to do with the realm of appearances. What is politically just, in short, must not merely appear just but must be just in reality.

A difficulty for Protagoras’ position here is that, if all beliefs are true, then all beliefs about which beliefs are beneficial must be true. But surely, some beliefs about which beliefs are beneficial contradict other beliefs about which beliefs are beneficial; especially if some people are better than others at bringing about beneficial beliefs. (For example, no doubt Plato’s and Protagoras’ beliefs conflict at this point.) This means that Protagoras’ view entails a contradiction of the same sort as the next objection–the famous peritropê, on which see Castagnoli 2010 and Trabattoni 2020—seems to be meant to bring out.

The peritropê (“table-turning”) objection (171a–b) is this. Suppose I believe, as Protagoras does, that “All beliefs are true,” but also admit that “There is a belief that ‘Not all beliefs are true’.” If all beliefs are true, the belief that “Not all beliefs are true” must be true too. But if that belief is true, then by disquotation, not all beliefs are true. So I refute myself by contradicting myself; and the same holds for Protagoras.

The validity of the objection has been much disputed. Burnyeat, Denyer and Sedley all offer reconstructions of the objection that make it come out valid. McDowell and Bostock suggest that although the objection does not prove what it is meant to prove (self-contradiction), it does prove a different point (about self-defeat) which is equally worth making.

Socrates’ ninth objection presents Protagoras’ theory with a dilemma. If the theory is completely general in its application, then it must say that not only what counts as justice in cities, but also what benefits cities, is a relative matter. As Protagoras has already admitted (167a3), it is implausible to say that benefit is a relative notion. But the alternative, which Protagoras apparently prefers, is a conceptual divorce between the notions of justice and benefit, which restrict the application of Protagoras’ theory to the notion of justice. Socrates obviously finds this conceptual divorce unattractive, though he does not, directly, say why. Instead, he offers us the Digression.

6.4 The Digression: 172c1–177b7

An obvious question: What is the Digression for? One answer (defended in Chappell 2005, ad loc.) would be that it is a critique of the society that produces the conceptual divorce between justice and benefit that has just emerged. Socrates draws an extended parallel between two types of character, the philosophical man and the man of rhetoric, to show that it is better to be the philosophical type.

The Digression (on which see above all Bénatouïl 2020 and Spinelli 2002) is “philosophically quite pointless,” according to Ryle 1966, 158. Less dismissively, McDowell 1976, 174 suggests that the Digression serves “a purpose which, in a modern book, might be served by footnotes or an appendix.” Similarly, Cornford 1935, 83 suggests that Plato aims to give the reader some references for anti-relativist arguments that he presents elsewhere: “To argue explicitly against it would perhaps take him too far from the original topic of perception. Instead, he inserts [the Digression], which contains allusions to such arguments in other works of his.” If the Digression were merely an appendix or a footnote, it would be difficult to understand Plato’s interest in the themes addressed in this text. As has been noted (Polansky 1992, 134), the Digression contains Socrates’ defense of philosophy (for this reason, it is a crucial text). It is highly significant that Plato chose to include this defense of philosophy specifically within a dialogue dedicated to epistēmē. This clearly shows that, for Plato, any theoretical discussion is always intertwined with ethics and, above all, with practical and political action. One possible meaning of the Digression is precisely the defense of philosophy and the figure of the philosopher, who is only seemingly useless to the city in which he resides. In this text, one can clearly sense the echo of Socrates’ trial and death; indeed, the Digression can be regarded, after the Apology of Socrates and the Crito, as one of Plato’s most significant responses to the image of Socrates—and more broadly, of the philosopher—portrayed by Aristophanes, especially in the Clouds (see Giannopoulou 2013, 1–12).

The Digression (173c) also includes an almost hyperbolic description of the “pure” philosopher, who lives in the city only bodily, while his soul is dedicated to understanding the depths of the earth, measuring its surface, and ascending to the heavens to contemplate the stars—much like Thales, who, having fallen into a well while gazing at the stars, was ridiculed by the Thracian maidservant. This portrayal of the philosopher in his essence, though exaggerated, is not entirely a caricature. It serves Plato’s purpose of illustrating that, precisely because the philosopher seems the most awkward and ill-suited, he is in fact the most beneficial to political life. This is because only the philosopher—not the rhetorician—strives to know reality in itself. This deeply Socratic aspiration for knowledge makes the Digression a perfectly coherent section within the broader themes of the Theaetetus.

The Digression is an essential text in the history of Platonism because it presents the famous doctrine of assimilation to god (homoiôsis theoi), which gained immense influence not only within Platonism (see Giardina 2022) but also in the philosophies of the Hellenistic period (see Erler 2002 and Reydams-Schils 2017). However, it is crucial to note that the doctrine of assimilation to god is preceded by a statement that Polansky (1992, 141) rightly deemed the most important and central in the entire dialogue. Socrates dramatically observes that evil cannot perish because there must always be something opposed to good; furthermore, evil does not reside among the gods but roams the earth. For this reason, the philosopher must strive, as far as possible (kata to dynaton—a critical phrase), not to identify with god (which is impossible) but to assimilate to god. From a certain perspective, this suggests a form of escape; yet Plato immediately clarifies that assimilating to god involves attaining justice and holiness through wisdom (phronêsis). This notion emphasizes that only god is absolutely just, holy, and wise, and thus, contrary to Protagoras’ position, it is not humanity but god who is the measure of all things. To assimilate to god means to become as just as possible, but this ideal can only be realized on earth. In this way, Plato justifies the philosopher’s responsibility for moral and political action in concrete terms.

Plato (176c) further states that knowledge (gnôsis) of this truth (i.e., that god is absolutely just and that the man who assimilates his nature to the divine becomes as just as possible) constitutes true (alethinê) wisdom (sophia) and virtue (aretê), whereas ignorance (agnoia) represents unawareness (amathia) and wickedness (kakia). This reveals the pivotal significance of the Digression: it not only defends the dignity of the philosophical life against that of rhetoricians, who are accustomed to operating within the constraints of courtrooms and delivering speeches restricted by definite time limits (unlike philosophical discourse, which is not bound by time), but also legitimizes the moral and political engagement of the philosopher in the world. Ultimately, it concludes that true knowledge lies in the assimilation to god. From this perspective, the Theaetetus, as a dialogue on epistēmē which, according to Plato, has to be identified with sophia, is not aporetic.

Another common question about the Digression is: does it introduce or mention the Platonic Forms? Certainly the Digression uses phrases that are indisputably part of the Middle-Period language for the Forms. If Plato uses the language of the theory of Forms in a passage which is admitted on all sides to allude to the themes of the Republic, it strains credulity to imagine that Plato is not intentionally referring to the Forms in that passage.

On the other hand, as the Revisionist will point out, the Theaetetus does not seem to do much with the Forms that are thus allegedly introduced. But perhaps it would undermine the Unitarian reading of the Theaetetus if the Forms were present in the Digression in the role of paradigm objects of knowledge. For the Unitarian reading, at least on the version that seems to us as most plausible, says that the aim of the Theaetetus is to show that, in the end, we cannot construct a theory of knowledge without the Forms—a claim which is to be proved by trying and failing, three times, to do so. So if the Forms were there in the Digression, perhaps that would be a case of “giving the game away.”

6.5 Last Objection to Protagoras: 177c6–179b5

After the Digression Socrates returns to criticising Protagoras’ relativism. His last objection is that there is no coherent way of applying Protagoras’ relativism to judgements about the future.

How might Protagoras counter this objection? Protagoras has already suggested that the past may now be no more than whatever I now remember it to have been (166b). Perhaps he can also suggest that the future is now no more than I now believe it will be. No prediction is ever proved wrong, just as no memory is ever inaccurate. All that happens is it seems to one self at one time that something will be true (or has been true), and seems to another self at another time that something different is true.

6.6 Last Objection to Heracleitus: 179c1–183c2

Socrates argues that if Heracleitus’ doctrine of flux is true, then no assertion whatever can properly be made. Therefore (a) Heracleitus’ theory of flux no more helps to prove that knowledge is perception than that knowledge is not perception, and (b) Heracleiteans cannot coherently say anything at all, not even to state their own doctrine.

There are two variants of the argument. On the first of these variants, evident in 181c2–e10, Socrates distinguishes just two kinds of flux or process, namely qualitative alteration and spatial motion, and insists that the Heracleiteans are committed to saying that both are continual. On the second variant, evident perhaps at 182a1, 182e4–5, Socrates distinguishes indefinitely many kinds of flux or process, not just qualitative alteration and motion through space, and insists that the Heracleiteans are committed to saying that every kind of flux is continual.

Now the view that everything is always changing in every way might seem a rather foolish view to take about everyday objects. But, as 182a2–b8 shows, the present argument is not about everyday objects anyway. Plato does not apply his distinction between kinds of change to every sort of object whatever, including everyday objects. He applies it specifically to the objects (if that is the word) of Heracleitean metaphysics. These items are supposed by the Heracleitean to be the reality underlying all talk of everyday objects. It is at the level of these Heracleitean perceivings and perceivers that Plato’s argument against Heracleitus is pitched. And it is not obviously silly to suppose that Heracleitean perceivings and perceivers are constantly changing in every way.

The argument that Socrates presents on the Heracleiteans’ behalf infers from “Everything is always changing in every way” that “No description of anything is excluded.” How does this follow? McDowell 1976, 181–182 finds the missing link in the impossibility of identifications. We cannot (says McDowell) identify a moving sample of whiteness, or of seeing, any longer once it has changed into some other colour, or perception.

But this only excludes reidentifications: presumably I can identify the moving whiteness or the moving seeing until it changes, even if this only gives me an instant in which to identify it. This point renders McDowell’s version, as it stands, an invalid argument. If it is on his account possible to identify the moving whiteness until it changes, then it is on his account possible to identify the moving whiteness. But if that is possible, then his argument contradicts itself: for it goes on to deny this possibility.

6.7 The Final Refutation of D1: 183c4–187a8

Socrates completes his refutation of the thesis that knowledge is perception by bringing a twelfth and final objection, directed against D1 itself rather than its Protagorean or Heracleitean interpretations. This objection says that the mind makes use of a range of concepts which it could not have acquired, and which do not operate, through the senses: e.g., “existence,” “sameness,” “difference.” So there is a part of thought, and hence of knowledge, which has nothing to do with perception. Therefore knowledge is not perception.

These concepts are the koina, or common notions/properties. The introduction of the koina is absolutely crucial for the continuation of the dialogue, as it raises the decisive issue of the propositional character of knowledge (see Ferrari 2002 and Ioppolo 2007). As noted, Plato (182d ff.) has already addressed language, concluding that universal flux negates the possibility of language (see Giovannetti 2022, Part 2), whose truth lies in anchoring things through names (in fact, beyond names, Plato—183a-b—also rejects the ability to say “thus”/houtô or “not thus”/ouch houtô). Socrates now delves further into this issue. Much debate has arisen regarding the nature of the koina and, in particular, their identification with Platonic Forms. It is worth noting that the relationship between the koina and the Forms is not explicitly drawn in the text. Here, it is merely suggested that these properties cannot have an empirical origin, as being, equality, inequality, identity, otherness, similarity, or dissimilarity are not properties we directly perceive. Rather, they are notions the soul can discern on its own. Importantly, among the koina, Plato also mentions non-being (185d: to mê einai), suggesting that these are unlikely to be Forms, since a Form of non-being does not exist. Nonetheless, this argument is not conclusive, given that, aside from non-being, Plato affirms the existence of the other koina. If these koina did not exist within the soul to some degree, not only would judgment (and therefore any true or false opinion/proposition) be impossible, but we would also lack a basis for understanding that perception itself does not grasp similarity directly but perceives that one thing resembles another, just as it does not apprehend “green” in itself but rather a thing that is green. As noted (Trabattoni 2018, XCVII–C), considered in this way, the koina are not Platonic Forms but universal concepts expressible in a judgment. Moreover, the doctrine of the koina illustrates that knowledge cannot be mere perception, as perception alone does not judge and is therefore incapable of producing a judgment. This leads to the introduction of the soul. Through the koina, Socrates appears to conclude that if one relies solely on the sensory and empirical realm, knowledge in any form becomes impossible. In short, sensory perception alone cannot yield knowledge of the sensible; rather, the propositional knowledge of the sensible requires certain universal concepts (such as being), whose origin lies in the soul and not in the sensory realm. From this perspective, the function of the koina is not so distant from that of the Platonic Forms.

Unitarians and Revisionists will read this last argument against D1 in line with their general orientations. Unitarians will suggest that Socrates’ range of concepts common to the senses is a list of Forms. They will point to the similarities between the image of the senses as soldiers in a wooden horse that Socrates offers at 184d1 ff. (this image plays a crucial role for Socrates in presenting the concept of the soul, which is also viewed as capable of organizing and processing perceptual information), and the picture of a Heracleitean self, existing only in its awareness of particular perceptions, that he drew at 156–160.

Revisionists will retort that there are important differences between the Heracleitean self and the wooden-horse self, differences that show that Heracleiteanism is no longer in force in 184–187. They will insist that the view of perception in play in 184–187 is Plato’s own non-Heracleitean view of perception. Thus Burnyeat 1990: 55–56 argues that, since Heracleiteanism has been refuted by 184, “the organs and subjects dealt with [in the Wooden Horse passage] are the ordinary stable kind which continue in being from one moment to the next.” On the other hand, notice that Plato’s equivalent for Burnyeat’s “organs and subjects” is the single word aisthêseis (184d2). On its own, the word can mean either “senses” or “sensings”; but it seems significant that it was the word Plato used at 156b1 for one of the two sorts of Heracleitean “offspring.” Plato speaks of the aisthêseis concealed “as if within a Wooden Horse” as pollai tines (184d1), “indefinitely many.” But while there are indefinitely many Heracleitean sensings, there are not, of course, indefinitely many senses. Indeed even the claim that we have many senses (pollai), rather than several (enioi, tines), does not sound quite right, either in English or in Greek. This is perhaps why most translators, assuming that aisthêseis means “senses,” put “a number of senses” for pollai tines aisthêseis. Perhaps this is a mistake, and what aisthêseis means here is “Heracleitean sensings.” If so, this explains how the aisthêseis inside any given Wooden Horse can be pollai tines.

If the aisthêseis in the Wooden Horse are Heracleitean sensings, not ordinary, un-Heracleitean senses, this supports the Unitarian idea that 184–187 is contrasting Heracleitean perceiving of particulars with Platonic knowing of the Forms (or knowing of particulars via, and in terms of, the Forms).

Another piece of evidence pointing in the same direction is the similarity between Plato’s list of the “common notions” at Theaetetus 186a and closely contemporary lists that he gives of the Forms, such as the list of Forms (likeness, multitude, rest and their opposites) given at Parmenides 129d, with ethical additions at Parmenides 130b. There are also the megista genê (“greatest kinds”) of Sophist 254b–258e (being, sameness, otherness, rest and change); though whether these genê are Forms is controversial.

7. Second Definition (D2): “Knowledge is True Judgement”: 187b–201c

151–187 has considered and rejected the proposal that knowledge is perception. Sometimes in 151–187 “perception” seems to mean “immediate sensory awareness”; at other times it seems to mean “judgements made about immediate sensory awareness.” The fact remains that the second response/definition of scientific knowledge (epistēmē), that is, true judgment or opinion (alēthēs doxa), introduces the role of the soul (see Dixsaut 2002, Brancacci 2019 and Robinson 2020) and, especially, the problem of the propositional or, at least, linguistic nature of knowledge, as already anticipated by the koina (the so-called common notions). The relationship between perception and opinion is clearly addressed in other parts of the Platonic corpus (see, for example, Sophist 264a-b and Timaeus 28a and c; also cf. Aristotle, De Anima II.2, 413b). However, in the context of the Theaetetus, this relationship is not one of identity. Perception primarily indicates a kind of awareness of the perceptual act, which does not automatically translate into a cognitive judgment. Here, it is precisely the propositional nature of knowledge that becomes the focus of this part of the dialogue. A bit further on, in the famous passage where Socrates explains what it means to think (dianoeisthai, 189e)—that is, a discourse (logos) that the soul holds with itself—it is stated with great clarity that forming an opinion (to doxazein) is a kind of speaking (legein), and that an opinion (doxa) is an uttered discourse (logos eirêmenos). The proposal that “Knowledge is immediate sensory awareness” is rejected as incoherent: “Knowledge is not to be found in our bodily experiences, but in our reasonings about those experiences” (186d2). The proposal that “Knowledge is judgement about immediate sensory awareness” raises the question how judgements, or beliefs, can emerge from immediate sensory awareness. Answering this question is the main aim in 187–201.

Empiricists claim that perception, which in itself has no cognitive content, is the source of all beliefs, which essentially have cognitive content—which are by their very nature candidates for truth or falsity. So unless we can explain how beliefs can be true or false, we cannot explain how there can be beliefs at all. Hence Plato’s interest in the question of false belief. This is an important point that must be emphasized, given its somewhat paradoxical nature. Any opinion can be true or false in itself; it should be noted that in the section of the dialogue devoted to perception, the issue of the truth or falsity of the perceptual act was not addressed with the same theoretical depth seen in this part. This is because truth and falsity belong primarily to judgment. At this point, if knowledge is true opinion, then one must also justify the possibility of false opinion: in a somewhat paradoxical manner, it is not knowledge but rather the possibility of falsity that becomes the main theme of this part of the dialogue. The impossibility of justifying falsity will render even the second definition of knowledge aporetic.

What Plato wants to show in 187–201 is that there is no way for the empiricist to construct contentful belief from contentless sensory awareness alone. The corollary is, of course, that we need something else besides sensory awareness to explain belief. In modern terms, we need irreducible semantic properties. In Plato’s terms, we need the Forms.

In pursuit of this strategy of argument in 187–201, Plato rejects in turn five possible empiricist explanations of how there can be false belief. In the First Puzzle (188a–c) he proposes a basic difficulty for any empiricist. Then he argues that no move available to the empiricist circumvents this basic difficulty, however much complexity it may introduce (the other four Puzzles: 188d–201b). The Fifth Puzzle collapses back into the Third Puzzle, and the Third Puzzle collapses back into the First. The proposal that gives us the Fourth Puzzle is disproved by the counter-examples that make the Fifth Puzzle necessary. As for the Second Puzzle, Plato deploys this to show how empiricism has the disabling drawback that it turns an outrageous sophistical argument into a valid disproof of the possibility of at least some sorts of false belief.

Thus 187–201 continues the critique of perception-based accounts of knowledge that 151–187 began. Contrary to what some—for instance Cornford—have thought, it is no digression from the main path of the Theaetetus. On the contrary, the discussion of false belief is the most obvious way forward.

As Plato stresses throughout the dialogue, it is Theaetetus who is caught in this problem about false belief. It is not Socrates, nor Plato. There is clear evidence at Philebus 38c ff. that false belief (at least of some sorts) was no problem at all to Plato himself (at least at some points in his career). Plato’s question is not “How on earth can there be false judgement?” Rather it is “What sort of background assumptions about knowledge must Theaetetus be making, given that he is puzzled by the question how there can be false judgement?”

Is it only false judgements of identity that are at issue in 187–201, or is it any false judgement? One interpretation of 187–201 says that it is only about false judgements of misidentification. Call this view misidentificationism. The main alternative interpretation of 187–201 says that it is about any and every false judgement. Call this view anti-misidentificationism. The present discussion assumes the truth of anti-misidentificationism; see Chappell 2005: 154–157 for the arguments.

I turn to the detail of the five proposals about how to explain false belief that occupy Stephanus pages 187 to 200 of the dialogue. In the section we will analyze below, the two fundamental epistemological models are presented: the Wax Tablet and the Aviary.

7.1 The Puzzle of Misidentification: 187e5–188c8

The first proposal about how to explain the possibility of false belief is the proposal that false belief occurs when someone misidentifies one thing as another. To believe or judge falsely is to judge, for some two objects O1 and O2, that O1 is O2.

I cannot mistake X for Y unless I am able to formulate thoughts about X and Y. But I will not be able to formulate thoughts about X and Y unless I am acquainted with X and Y. Being acquainted with X and Y means knowing X and Y; and anyone who knows X and Y will not mistake them for each other.

Why think this a genuine puzzle? There seem to be plenty of everyday cases where knowing some thing in no way prevents us from sometimes mistaking that thing for something else. One example in the dialogue itself is at 191b (cp. 144c5). It is perfectly possible for someone who knows Socrates to see Theaetetus in the distance, and wrongly think that Theaetetus is Socrates. The First Puzzle does not even get off the ground, unless we can see why our knowledge of X and Y should guarantee us against mistakes about X and Y. Who is the puzzle of 188a–c supposed to be a puzzle for?

If (as is suggested in e.g. Chappell 2005, ad loc.) 187–201 is an indirect demonstration that false belief cannot be explained by empiricism (whether this means a developed philosophical theory, or the instinctive empiricism of some people’s common sense), then it is likely that the First Puzzle states the basic difficulty for empiricism, to which the other four Puzzles look for alternative solutions. The nature of this basic difficulty is not fully, or indeed at all, explained by the First Puzzle. We have to read on and watch the development of the argument of 187–201 to see exactly what the problem is that gives the First Puzzle its bite.

7.2 Second Puzzle About False Belief: “Believing What is Not”: 188c10–189b9

The second proposal says that false judgement is believing or judging ta mê onta, “things that are not” or “what is not.” Socrates observes that if “what is not” is understood as it often was by Greek thinkers, as meaning “nothing,” then this proposal leads us straight into the sophistical absurdity that false beliefs are the same thing as beliefs about nothing (i.e., contentless beliefs). But there can be no beliefs about nothing; and there are false beliefs; so false belief isn’t the same thing as believing what is not.

Some think the Second Puzzle a mere sophistry. Bostock 1988: 165 distinguishes two versions of the sophistry: “On one version, to believe falsely is… to believe what is not ‘just by itself’; on the other version, it is to believe what is not ‘about one of the things which are’”. The argument of the first version, according to Bostock, “is just that there is no such thing as what is not (the case); it is a mere nonentity. But just as you cannot perceive a nonentity, so equally you cannot believe one either.” Bostock proposes the following solution to this problem: “We may find it natural to reply to this argument by distinguishing… propositions [from] facts, situations, states of affairs, and so on. Then we shall say that the things that are believed are propositions, not facts… so a false belief is not directed at a non-existent.”

7.3 Third Puzzle About False Belief: Allodoxia: 189b10–190e4

Literally translated, the third proposal about how to explain the possibility of false belief says that false belief occurs “when someone exchanges (antallaxamenos) in his understanding one of the things that are with another of the things that are, and says is” (189b12–c2; on the allodoxia see at least Crivelli 1998).

Perhaps the best way to read this very unclear statement is as meaning that the distinctive addition in the third proposal is the notion of inadvertency. The point of Socrates’ argument is that this addition does not help us to obtain an adequate account of false belief because thought (dianoia) has to be understood as an inner process, with objects that we are always fully and explicitly conscious of. If we are fully and explicitly conscious of all the objects of our thoughts, and if the objects of our thoughts are as simple as empiricism takes them to be, there is simply no room for inadvertency. But without inadvertency, the third proposal simply collapses back into the first proposal, which has already been refuted.

In the discussion of the Fourth and Fifth Puzzles, Socrates and Theaetetus together work out the detail of two empiricist attempts to explain just this. It then becomes clearer why Plato does not think that the empiricist can explain the difference between fully explicit and not-fully-explicit speech or thought. Although this is not explicitly stated in the text, it is likely that Plato thinks that, to explain this, we have to abandon altogether the empiricist conception of thought as the concatenation (somehow) of semantically inert simple mental images. Instead, we have to understand thought as the syntactic concatenation of the genuine semantic entities, the Forms. Mistakes in thought will then be comprehensible as mistakes either about the logical interrelations of the Forms, or about the correct application of the Forms to the sensory phenomena (see Fronterotta 2022).

7.4 Fourth Puzzle About False Belief: the Wax Tablet: 190e5–196c5

The Wax Tablet passage offers us a more explicit account of the nature of thought, and its relationship with perception (see Aronadio 2022). The story now on offer says explicitly that perception relates to thought roughly as Humean “impressions” relate to Humean “ideas” (191d; compare Hume, First Enquiry II). The objects of perception, as before, are a succession of constantly-changing immediate awarenesses. The objects of thought, it is now added, are those objects of perception to which we have chosen to give a measure of stability by imprinting them on the wax tablets in our minds. (The image of memory as writing in the mind had currency in Greek thought well before Plato’s time: see e.g. Aeschylus, Eumenides 275.) The Wax Tablet is closely connected to memory—it is, in fact, a divine gift from Mnemosyne (191d; see Cambiano 2007)—and the impressions present on it legitimize the very possibility of remembering, following a general framework later adopted by both Aristotle (see, e.g., De Memoria 450a29–34; De Anima II.12, 424a17–21, III.4, 429b31–430a2, and III.12, 435a1–10) and the Stoics (see, e.g., the Sextus Empiricus passages collected in Stoicorum Veterum Fragmenta I 484 von Arnim). These impressions pertain not only to aisthêseis (perceptions) but also to ennoiai (concepts/notions); in short, such “molds” have both perceptual and intellectual content. The term Socrates uses to indicate the impression of perceptions and thoughts/notions is apotypousthai, a verb containing the noun typos, which specifically denotes the “cast” or the imprint left on the Wax Tablet. Plato (191c-d) is careful to emphasize that the quality of the wax is not uniform but can vary in purity and hardness; the quality of the wax determines the quality of the impressions and, consequently, the greater or lesser ability for them to be retained in memory.

This new spelling-out of the empiricist account of thought seems to offer new resources for explaining the possibility of false belief. The new explanation can say that false belief occurs when there is a mismatch, not between two objects of thought, nor between two objects of perception, but between one object of each type.

This proposal faces a simple and decisive objection. No one disputes that there are false beliefs that cannot be explained as mismatches of thought and perception: e.g., false beliefs about arithmetic. The Wax Tablet does not explain how such false beliefs happen; indeed it entails that they can’t happen. Such mistakes are confusions of two objects of thought, and the Wax Tablet model does not dispute the earlier finding that there can be no such confusions. So the Wax Tablet model fails.

7.5 Fifth Puzzle About False Belief: The Aviary: 196d1–200d4

If we had a solution to the very basic problem about how the empiricist can get any content at all out of perception, then the fourth proposal might show how the empiricist could explain false belief involving perception. The fifth and last proposal about how to explain the possibility of false belief attempts to remedy the fourth proposal’s incapacity—which Plato says refutes it, 196c5–7—to deal with cases of false belief involving no perception, such as false arithmetical beliefs.

It attempts this by deploying a distinction between knowledge that someone merely has (latent knowledge; the Greek verb is kektêsthai) and knowledge that he is actually using (active knowledge; the Greek verb is echein; on this difference see too Aristotle, De Anima II.1). (Perhaps Plato is now exploring “the intermediate stages between knowing and not knowing” mentioned at 188a2–3.) The suggestion is that false belief occurs when someone wants to use some item of latent knowledge in his active thought, but makes a wrong selection from among the items that he knows latently.

If this proposal worked it would cover false arithmetical belief. But the proposal does not work, because it is regressive. If there is a problem about the very possibility of confusing two things, it is no answer to this problem to suppose that for each thing there is a corresponding item of knowledge, and that what happens when two things are confused is really that the two corresponding items of knowledge are confused (200a–b).

The Aviary rightly tries to explain false belief by complicating our picture of belief (see Araújo 2020 and Maffi 2022). But it complicates in the wrong way and the wrong place. It is no help to complicate the story by throwing in further objects of the same sort as the objects that created the difficulty about false belief in the first place. What is needed is a different sort of object for thought: a kind of object that can be thought of under different aspects (say, as “the sum of 5 and 7,” or as “the integer 12”). There are no such aspects to the “items of knowledge” that the Aviary deals in. As with the conception of the objects of thought and knowledge that we found in the Wax Tablet, it is this lack of aspects that dooms the Aviary’s conception of the objects of knowledge too. Like the Wax Tablet, the Aviary founders on its own inability to accommodate the point that thought cannot consist merely in the presentation of a series of inert “objects of thought.” Whether these objects of thought are mental images drawn from perception or something else, the thinking is not so much in the objects of thought as in what is done with those objects (186d2–4).

We may illustrate this by asking: When the dunce who supposes that 5 + 7 = 11 decides to activate some item of knowledge to be the answer to “What is the sum of 5 and 7?,” which item of knowledge does he thus decide to activate? At first only two answers seem possible: either he decides to activate 12, or he decides to activate 11. If he decides to activate 12, then we cannot explain the fact that what he actually does is activate 11, except by saying that he mistakes the item of knowledge which is 11 for the item of knowledge which is 12. But this mistake is the very mistake ruled out as impossible right at the beginning of the inquiry into false belief (188a–c). Alternatively, if he decides to activate 11, then we have to ask why he decides to do this. The most plausible answer to that question is: “Because he believes falsely that 5 + 7 = 11.” But as noted above, if he has already formed this false belief, within the account that is supposed to explain false belief, then a regress looms.

In fact, the correct answer to the question “Which item of knowledge does the dunce decide to activate?” is neither “12” nor “11.” It is “that number which is the sum of 5 and 7.” But this answer does not save the Aviary theorist from the dilemma just pointed out; for it is not available to him. To be able to give this answer, the Aviary theorist would have to be able to distinguish “that number which is the sum of 5 and 7” from “12.” But since “12” is “that number which is the sum of 5 and 7,” this distinction cannot be made by anyone who takes the objects of thought to be simple in the way that the Aviary theorist seems to.

To conclude. The two epistemological models are not identical: the first appears as a more passive model compared to the second. In the latter, there is greater dynamism due to the increased involvement of the knowing subject, who must grasp the correct “bird” (i.e., the correct piece of knowledge). In any case, both models fail because neither is able to account for the possibility of error or, in Platonic terms, allodoxia: how, indeed, is it possible to confuse one piece of knowledge with another if both are forms of knowledge? If the models do not legitimize the possibility of error, they do not truly explain what knowledge is, even though they implicitly presuppose it. The most challenging issue is to understand why these models fail. The essential point is that if we assume that the knowledge in question is epistēmē (equivalent to sophia), or absolute knowledge, and that the Wax Tablet and the Aviary contain absolute forms of knowledge, then it is evident that error would be impossible. Yet, in the concrete reality of things, error does occur (see 195c ff. and 199b ff.), though it is philosophically impossible to justify if the knowledge represented by the wax block and aviary models is absolute. If the subject receives or grasps knowledge, they cannot, in any case, fall into error. Consequently, not only knowledge but also error are difficult to explain (see Fronterotta 2022, Trabattoni 2024 and Zucca 2024).

At 199e1 ff. Theaetetus suggests an amendment to the Aviary. This is that we might have items of ignorance in our heads as well as items of knowledge. As Socrates remarks, these ignorance-birds can be confused with knowledge-birds in just the same way as knowledge-birds can be confused with each other. So the addition does not help. The addition made by Theaetetus, although paradoxical, is significant as it demonstrates that Socrates’ young interlocutor has fully understood the reason for the failure of the two epistemological models. According to Theaetetus, error can be justified if, within the aviary—within our soul—not only knowledge but also forms of non-knowledge (anepistêmosynai) are “flying about.” From this perspective, error occurs when the subject grasps a piece of non-knowledge instead of knowledge. This brings us back, to some extent, to the previous problem, as it remains difficult to explain why the subject would mistake non-knowledge for knowledge. However, aside from this issue, Theaetetus has grasped that the reason error cannot be justified lies precisely in the fact that only knowledge is present in the Wax Tablet and the Aviary. Thus, the only way (though still problematic, given the recurring issue of allodoxia) to legitimize error is to place non-knowledge within the soul. But for Socrates, this is absurd, because the one who grasps a piece of non-knowledge will think they have actually grasped knowledge.

7.6 The Final Refutation of D2: 200d5–201c7

At 200d–201c Socrates argues more directly against D2. He offers a counter-example to the thesis that knowledge is true belief. A skilled lawyer can bring jurymen into a state of true belief without bringing them into a state of knowledge; so knowledge and true belief are different states.

The jury argument seems to be a counter-example not only to D2 but also to D3, the thesis that knowledge is true belief with an account (provided we allow that the jury “have an account”).

A third problem about the jury argument is that Plato seems to offer two incompatible explanations of why the jury don’t know: first that they have only a limited time to hear the arguments (201b3, 172e1); and second that their judgement is second-hand (201b9).

8. Third Definition (D3): “Knowledge is True Judgement With an Account”: 201d–210a

Theaetetus’ third proposal about how to knowledge is (D3) that it is true belief with an account (meta logou alêthê doxan).

D3 apparently does nothing at all to solve the main problems that D2 faced. Besides the jurymen counter-example just noted, 187–201 showed that we could not define knowledge as true belief unless we had an account of false belief. This problem has not just evaporated in 201–210. It will remain as long as we propose to define knowledge as true belief plus anything. Significantly, this does not seem to bother Plato—as we might expect if Plato is not even trying to offer an acceptable definition of knowledge, but is rather undermining unacceptable definitions.

One crucial question about Theaetetus 201–210 is the question whether the argument is concerned with objectual or propositional knowledge. This is a basic and central division among interpretations of the whole passage 201–210, but it is hard to discuss it properly without getting into the detail of the Dream Theory: see section 8.1.

A second question, which arises often elsewhere in the Theaetetus, is whether the argument’s appearance of aporia reflects genuine uncertainty on Plato’s part, or is rather a kind of literary device. Is Plato thinking aloud, trying to clarify his own view about the nature of knowledge, as Revisionists suspect? Or is he using an aporetic argument only to smoke out his opponents, as Unitarians think?

The evidence favours the latter reading. There are a significant number of other passages where something very like Theaetetus’ claim (D3) that knowledge is “true belief with an account” is not only discussed, but actually defended (as will be discussed in the Conclusion, this is a crucial element that cannot be overlooked for understanding the philosophical meaning of the entire dialogue): for instance, Meno 98a2, Phaedo 76b5–6, 97d–99d2, Symposium 202a5–9, Republic 534b3–7, and Timaeus 51e5. So it appears that, in the Theaetetus, Plato cannot be genuinely puzzled about what knowledge can be. Nor can he genuinely doubt his own former confidence in one version of D3. If he does have a genuine doubt or puzzle of this sort, it is simply incredible that he should say what he does say in 201–210 without also expressing it.

What Plato does in 201–210 is: present a picture (Socrates’ Dream) of how things may be if D3 is true (201c–202c); raise objections to the Dream theory which are said (206b12) to be decisive (202c–206c); and present and reject three further suggestions about the meaning of logos, and so three more versions of D3 (206c–210a). But none of these four interpretations of D3 is Plato’s own earlier version of D3, which says that knowledge = true belief with an account of the reason why the true belief is true. If what Plato wants to tell us in Theaetetus 201–210 is that he no longer accepts any version of D3, not even his own version, then it is extraordinary that he does not even mention his own version, concentrating instead on versions of D3 so different from Plato’s version as to be obviously irrelevant to its refutation.

8.1 The Dream of Socrates: 201d8–202d7

Rather as Socrates offered to develop D1 in all sorts of surprising directions, so now he offers to develop D3 into a sophisticated theory of knowledge. This theory, usually known as the “Dream of Socrates” or the “Dream Theory,” posits two kinds of existents, complexes and simples, and proposes that “an account” means “an account of the complexes that analyses them into their simple components.” Thus “knowledge of x” turns out to mean “true belief about x with an account of x that analyses x into its simple components” (see the studies collected by Mazzara-Napoli 2010 and Tian 2013).

Taken as a general account of knowledge, the Dream Theory implies that knowledge is only of complexes, and that there can be no knowledge of simples. Socrates attacks this implication. It is far from unlikely that Plato’s dream doctrine was developed not solely but also as a response to Antisthenes, particularly his doctrine of the oikeios logos (the “proper discourse”). The Socratic philosopher Antisthenes was a staunch opponent of Plato, and one of his most explicitly anti-Platonic works is the Sathōn (cf. Diogenes Laertius III 35 = Socratis et Socraticorum Reliquiae V A 148 Giannantoni). Antisthenes was especially critical of the Platonic Form, which he understood as a universal entirely non-existent in concrete reality, perceiving it instead as merely a mental construct. Famously, Antisthenes argued against Plato by saying that he could see a horse but not “horseness” (cf. the texts collected in Socratis et Socraticorum Reliquiae V A 149 Giannantoni). Antisthenes maintained that not qualities but quale—that is, concrete, qualified individuals—possess actual existence. In this regard, it is noteworthy that in the Theaetetus (182a-b), Plato not only likely introduces the term poiotês (quality) into philosophical language but also distinguishes it from poion ti (“a certain quale”; cf. Brancacci 1990: 175–182). This focus on the determinacy of the quale (the concretely qualified/determined individual) forms the foundation of Antisthenes’s linguistic analysis of names, which plays a central role in his philosophy (cfr. Brancacci 1990: 227–262). According to Antisthenes, the Form (understood Platonically as essence) cannot be defined (the oikeios logos cannot apply to it) because something absolutely unitary, like the Platonic Form, cannot be captured by a discourse necessarily composed of multiple names. Definitional discourse, by contrast, pertains not to the unity of essence (which is indefinable) but to the quale. For example, one cannot define what silver is (that is, its essence) but can only describe what kind of thing it is, such as saying that it is like tin (cf. Ps.-Alexander In Aristot. Metaph. p. 554 20-22 = Socratis et Socraticorum Reliquiae V A 150 Giannantoni).

The so-called dream doctrine concerns precisely the problem of the nameability/definability of elements and their compounds, and it is highly likely that Plato had Antisthenes’s doctrine of definition in mind when formulating this theory.

A common question about the Dream Theory is whether it is concerned with objectual or propositional knowledge. Those who take the Dream Theory to be concerned with propositional knowledge include Ryle 1990: 27–30: “from 201 onwards Plato concentrates on ‘know’ (connaître): [Socrates’ Dream] is a logician’s theory, a theory about the composition of truths and falsehoods.” Those who take the Dream Theory to be concerned with objectual knowledge include White 1976: 177, and Crombie 1963: II: 41–42; also Bostock 1988. A third way of taking the Dream Theory, which may well be the most promising interpretation, is to take it as a Logical Atomism: as a theory which founds an account of propositional structure on an account of the concatenation of simple objects of experience or acquaintance such as “sense data.”

If this is the point of the Dream Theory, then the best answer to the question “Whose is the Dream Theory?” is “It belongs to the empiricist whom Plato is attacking,” without thereby excluding the more than reasonable historical possibility that Plato is responding to Antisthenes’s philosophy, particularly his doctrine of definition (see Mársico 2020).

8.2 Critique of the Dream Theory: 202d8–206c2

The Dream Theory says that knowledge of O is true belief about O plus an account of O’s composition. If O is not composite, O cannot be known, but only “perceived” (202b6).

Socrates’ main strategy in 202d8–206c2 is to attack the Dream’s claim that complexes and elements are distinguishable in respect of knowability. To this end he deploys a dilemma. A complex, say a syllable, is either (a) no more than its elements (its letters), or (b) something over and above those elements (this point inevitably recalls a famous passage at the end of Book Z of the Metaphysics (17, 1041b11 ff.), where Aristotle himself uses the example of syllables and letters.).

202d8–203e1 shows that unacceptable consequences follow from alternative (a), that a complex is no more than its elements. If I am to know a syllable SO, and that syllable is no more than its elements, then I cannot know the syllable SO without also knowing its elements S and O. Indeed, it seems that coming to know the parts S and O is both necessary and sufficient for coming to know the syllable SO. But if that is right, and if the letter/syllable relation models the element/complex relation, then if any complex is knowable, its elements will be knowable too; and if any complex’s elements are unknowable, then the complex will be unknowable too. This result contradicts the Dream Theory.

203e2–205e8 shows that unacceptable consequences follow from alternative (b), that a complex is something over and above its elements. In that case, to know the syllable is to know something for which knowledge of the elements is not sufficient. The syllable turns out to be “a single Form that comes to be out of the fitted-together elements” (204a1–2). But then the syllable does not have the elements as parts: if it did, that would compromise its singularity. And if the elements are not the parts of the syllable, nothing else can be. So the syllable has no parts, which makes it as simple as an element. Thus if the element is unknowable, the syllable must be unknowable too. This result contradicts the Dream Theory too.

Finally, in 206a1–c2, Plato makes a further, very simple, point against the Dream Theory. Our own experience of learning letters and syllables shows that it is both more basic and more important to know elements than complexes, not vice versa as the Dream Theory implies. The thesis that the complexes are knowable, the elements unknowable, is false to our experience, in which “knowledge of the elements is primary” (Burnyeat 1990, 192).

8.3 Three Attempts to Understand Logos: 206c2–210a9

The refutation of the Dream Theory’s attempt to spell out what it might be like for D3 to be true is followed by three attempts to give an account of what a logos is. The first attempt to give an account of “account” takes logos just to mean “speech” or “statement.” This is deemed obviously insufficient (206c1–206e3).

A second attempted explanation of “logos of O” takes it as “enumeration of the elements of O.” The logos is a statement of the elements of the object of knowledge. You have knowledge of something when, in addition to your true belief about it, you are able also to “go through the elements” of that thing.

Plato’s objection to this proposal (208b) is that it leaves open the possibility that someone could count as having knowledge of the name “Theaetetus” even if they could do no more than write out the letters of the name “Theaetetus” in the right order. Since such a person can enumerate the elements of the complex, i.e., the letters of the name (207c8–d1), he has an account. Since he can arrange those letters in their correct order (208a9–10), he also has true belief. For all that, insists Plato, he does not have knowledge of the name “Theaetetus.”

Why not, we might ask? To see the answer we should bring in what Plato says about syllables at 207d8–208a3. Suppose someone could enumerate the letters of “Theaetetus,” and could give their correct order, and yet knew nothing about syllables. This person wouldn’t count as knowing “Theaetetus” because he would have no understanding of the principles that get us from ordered letters to names. Those principles are principles about how letters form syllables, and how syllables form names. A person who can state only the letters of “Theaetetus” and their order has no awareness of these principles.

Knowledge of such bridging principles can reasonably be called knowledge of why the letters of “Theaetetus” are what they are. So it is plausible to suggest that the moral of the argument is to point us to the need for an account in the sense of an explanation “Why?,” and so to the version of D3 that Plato himself accepts.

The third proposed account of logos says that to give the logos of O is to cite the sêmeion or diaphora of O. In the Wax Tablet passage, sêmeion meant ‘imprint’; in the present passage, it means the ‘sign’ or diagnostic feature wherein x differs from everything else, or everything else of O’s own kind (For the revival of this concept in the Academic tradition, cf. Cic., Lucull. 33–34). So, presumably, knowledge of (say) Theaetetus consists in true belief about Theaetetus plus an account of what differentiates Theaetetus from every other human.

Socrates offers two objections to this proposal. First, if knowledge of Theaetetus requires a mention of his sêmeion, so does true belief about Theaetetus. Second, to possess “an account of Theaetetus’ sêmeion” must mean either (a) having true belief about that sêmeion, or else (b) having knowledge of it. But it has already been pointed out that any true belief, if it is to qualify as being about Theaetetus at all, must already be true belief about his sêmeion. So interpretation (a) has the result that knowledge of Theaetetus = true belief about Theaetetus’ sêmeion + true belief about Theaetetus’ sêmeion. As for (b): if we want to know what knowledge is, it is no help to be told that knowledge of O = something else + knowledge of the sêmeion of O. We still need to know what knowledge of the sêmeion of O is. Nor will it help us to be launched on a vicious regress: as we will be if we are told that knowledge of the sêmeion of O = something else + knowledge of the sêmeion of the sêmeion of O.

This is where the argument ends, and Socrates leaves to meet his accusers.

9. Conclusion

The Theaetetus is an extended attack on certain assumptions and intuitions about knowledge that the intelligent man-in-the-street—Theaetetus, for instance—might find initially attractive, and which some philosophers known to Plato—Protagoras and Heracleitus, for instance—had worked up into complex and sophisticated philosophical theories. Basic to all these assumptions and intuitions, which here have been grouped together under the name “empiricism,” is the idea that knowledge is constructed out of perception and perception alone.

The first part of the Theaetetus attacks the idea that knowledge could be simply identified with perception. Perceptions alone have no semantic/propositional structure. So if this thesis was true, it would be impossible to state it.

The second part attacks the suggestion that knowledge can be defined as true belief, where beliefs are supposed to be semantically-structured concatenations of sensory impressions. Against this Plato argues that, unless something can be said to explain how impressions can be concatenated so as to give them semantic structure, there is no reason to grant that the distinction between true and false applies to such beliefs any more than it does to perceptions. This necessitates the introduction of the soul, given that perception alone is not capable of verbally expressing a cognitive judgment.

Finally, in the third part of the Theaetetus, an attempt is made to meet this challenge, and present some explanation of how semantic structures can arise out of mere perceptions or impressions. The proposed explanation is the Dream Theory, a theory interestingly comparable to Russellian Logical Atomism, which takes both propositions and objects to be complexes “logically constructed” out of simple sensory impressions. On this conception, knowledge will come about when someone is capable not only of using such logical constructions in thought, but of understanding how they arise from perception.

Socrates’ basic objection to this theory is that it still gives no proper explanation of how this logical construction takes place. Without such an explanation, there is no good reason to treat the complexes that are thus logically constructed as anything other than simples in their own right. We need to know how it can be that, merely by conjoining perceptions in the right way, we manage to achieve a degree of semantic structure that (for instance) makes it possible to refer to things in the world, such as Theaetetus. But this is not explained simply by listing all the simple perceptions that are so conjoined. Nor—and this is where we reach the third proposal of 208b11–210a9—is it explained by fixing on any of those perceptions in particular, and taking it to be the special mark of Theaetetus whereby reference to Theaetetus is fixed.

The third proposal about how to understand logos faces the difficulty that, if it adds anything at all to differentiate knowledge of O from true belief about O, then what it adds is a diagnostic quality of O. If there is a problem about how to identify O, there is a problem about how to identify the diagnostic quality too. This launches a vicious regress.

The official conclusion of the Theaetetus is that we still do not know how to define knowledge. Even on the most sceptical reading, this is not to say that we have not learned anything about what knowledge is like. As Theaetetus says (210b6), he has given birth to far more than he had in him. And as many interpreters have seen, there may be much more to the ending than that. It may even be that, in the last two pages of the Theaetetus, we have seen hints of Plato’s own answer to the puzzle. Perhaps understanding has emerged from the last discussion, as wisdom did from 145d–e, as the key ingredient without which no true beliefs alone can even begin to look like they might count as knowledge. Perhaps it is only when we, the readers, understand this point—that epistemological success in the last resort depends on having epistemological virtue—that we begin not only to have true beliefs about what knowledge is, but to understand knowledge. In any case, although Socrates (210d) advises Theodorus to reconvene the following morning to continue the discussion, there remains an element that does not directly concern the aporetic nature of the dialogue. The final definition of knowledge is, ultimately, true opinion. Certainly, this definition does not coincide with the epistēmē being sought (hence, the aporetic nature of the Theaetetus). Nevertheless, it is undeniable that, from a certain perspective, this definition is superior to the one that equated epistēmē with mere perception. Knowledge is not true opinion, yet it must be acknowledged that if epistēmē equates to the direct contact the disembodied soul has with the Forms, the embodied soul can at best achieve true opinion (see Maffi 2013, 223–300). This confirms that, so to speak, we cannot escape the realm of logoi, and the highest degree that we, as embodied souls, can reach relative to absolute knowledge is, in any case, a logos—true opinion, which is neither perception nor a lower-level (i.e., unfounded) opinion. Perhaps this is the somewhat positive conclusion Plato reaches in the Theaetetus, suggesting that absolute knowledge requires a metaphysical framework that even the best and truest logoi can only approximate. Ultimately, this is the same reason why our relationship with god (a central theme in the Theaetetus that is by no means aporetic) can only be one of resemblance (homoiôsis) and not of identification.

Bibliography

The bibliography also includes works not directly cited in the entry but useful for the study of the Theaetetetus.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The authors and SEP editors would like to thank Branden Kosch for noticing a point of Greek grammar in need of correction.

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