Notes to Realism and Theory Change in Science

1. For more on the Bankruptcy of Science debate, see Paul (1968).

2. For a more detailed account of Duhem’s theory of theory-change see Guegeun and Psillos (2017).

3. For a detailed analysis of Poincaré’s relationism see Psillos (2014).

4. For more on the arguments against atomism and the role of Perrin’s work in the widespread acceptance of the atomic theory of matter see Psillos (2011).

5. For a detailed discussion and further literature see Psillos (2012).

6. For more on this see George Smith (2010).

7. The divide et impera strategy has generated considerable discussion. For some recent takes on it see Cordero (2011); Vickers (2013) and Peters (2014).

8. For a critical discussion of Worrall’s view see Ladyman (1998) and Lyons (2016a).

9. For more on this see Demopoulos (2003), and Ainsworth (2009). Partly because of the failures of the standard (so-called ‘epistemic’) version of structural realism and partly because of independent reasons, an ‘ontic’ version of structuralism has acquired popularity. For an overview and recent developments see Ladyman & Ross (2007)and French (2014).

10. The realism-without-reference approach is developed in more detail in Cruse (2005); Cruse & Papineau (2002). For a cogent criticism, see Mark Newman (2005).

11. For similar thoughts, see Magnus & Callender (2004).

12. Greg Frost-Arnold (2014) has argued that PI is not credible because it yields an unacceptable semantics for current theories; that is, it entails the currently discredited semantic anti-realism.

13. For a detailed discussion of Stanford’s views, see Chakravartty (2008); Devitt (2011); Ruttkamp-Bloem (2013) and Saatsi (2019).

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Stathis Psillos <psillos@phs.uoa.gr>

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