Classical Logic

Typically, a logic consists of a formal or informal language together with a deductive system and/or a model-theoretic semantics. The language has components that correspond to a part of a natural language like English or Greek. The deductive system is to capture, codify, or simply record arguments that are valid for the given language, and the semantics is to capture, codify, or record the meanings, or truth-conditions for at least part of the language.

The following sections provide the basics of a typical logic, sometimes called “classical elementary logic” or “classical first-order logic”. Section 2 develops a formal language, with a rigorous syntax and grammar. The formal language is a recursively defined collection of strings on a fixed alphabet. As such, it has no meaning, or perhaps better, the meaning of its formulas is given by the deductive system and the semantics. Some of the symbols have counterparts in ordinary language. We define an argument to be a non-empty collection of sentences in the formal language, one of which is designated to be the conclusion. The other sentences (if any) in an argument are its premises. Section 3 sets up a deductive system for the language, in the spirit of natural deduction. An argument is derivable if there is a deduction from some or all of its premises to its conclusion. Section 4 provides a model-theoretic semantics. An argument is valid if there is no interpretation (in the semantics) in which its premises are all true and its conclusion false. This reflects the longstanding view that a valid argument is truth-preserving.

In Section 5, we turn to relationships between the deductive system and the semantics, and in particular, the relationship between derivability and validity. We show that an argument is derivable only if it is valid. This pleasant feature, called soundness, entails that no deduction takes one from true premises to a false conclusion. Thus, deductions preserve truth. Then we establish a converse, called completeness, that an argument is valid only if it is derivable. This establishes that the deductive system is rich enough to provide a deduction for every valid argument. So there are enough deductions: all and only valid arguments are derivable. We briefly indicate other features of the logic, some of which are corollaries to soundness and completeness.

The final section, Section 6, is devoted to the a brief examination of the philosophical position that classical logic is “the one right logic”.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Language
  • 2.1 Building blocks
  • 2.2 Atomic formulas
  • 2.3 Compound formulas
  • 2.4 Features of the syntax
• 3. Deduction
• 4. Semantics
• 5. Meta-theory
• 6. The One Right Logic?
• Bibliography
  • Further Reading
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction

Today, logic is a branch of mathematics and a branch of philosophy. In most large universities, both departments offer courses in logic, and there is usually a lot of overlap between them. Formal languages, deductive systems, and model-theoretic semantics are mathematical objects and, as such, the logician is interested in their mathematical properties and relations. Soundness, completeness, and most of the other results reported below are typical examples. Philosophically, logic is at least closely related to the study of correct reasoning. Reasoning is an epistemic, mental activity. So logic is at least closely allied with epistemology. Logic is also a central branch of computer science, due, in part, to interesting computational relations in logical systems, and, in part, to the close connection between formal deductive argumentation and reasoning (see the entries on recursive functions, computability and complexity, and philosophy of computer science).

This raises questions concerning the philosophical relevance of the various mathematical aspects of logic. How do deducibility and validity, as properties of formal languages--sets of strings on a fixed alphabet--relate to correct reasoning? What do the mathematical results reported below have to do with the original philosophical issues concerning valid reasoning? This is an instance of the philosophical problem of explaining how mathematics applies to non-mathematical reality.

Typically, ordinary deductive reasoning takes place in a natural language, or perhaps a natural language augmented with some mathematical symbols. So our question begins with the relationship between a natural language and a formal language. Without attempting to be comprehensive, it may help to sketch several options on this matter.

One view is that the formal languages accurately exhibit actual features of certain fragments of a natural language. Some philosophers claim that declarative sentences of natural language have underlying logical forms and that these forms are displayed by formulas of a formal language. Other writers hold that (successful) declarative sentences express propositions; and formulas of formal languages somehow display the forms of these propositions. On views like this, the components of a logic provide the underlying deep structure of correct reasoning. A chunk of reasoning in natural language is correct if the forms underlying the sentences constitute a valid or deducible argument. See for example, Montague [1974], Davidson [1984], Lycan [1984] (and the entry on logical form).

Another view, held at least in part by Gottlob Frege and Wilhelm Leibniz, is that because natural languages are fraught with vagueness and ambiguity, they should be replaced by formal languages. A similar view, held by W. V. O. Quine (e.g., [1960], [1986]), is that a natural language should be regimented, cleaned up for serious scientific and metaphysical work. One desideratum of the enterprise is that the logical structures in the regimented language should be transparent. It should be easy to “read off” the logical properties of each sentence. A regimented language is similar to a formal language regarding, for example, the explicitly presented rigor of its syntax and its truth conditions.

On a view like this, deducibility and validity represent idealizations of correct reasoning in natural language. A chunk of reasoning is correct to the extent that it corresponds to, or can be regimented by, a valid or deducible argument in a formal language.

When mathematicians and many philosophers engage in deductive reasoning, they occasionally invoke formulas in a formal language to help disambiguate, or otherwise clarify what they mean. In other words, sometimes formulas in a formal language are used in ordinary reasoning. This suggests that one might think of a formal language as an addendum to a natural language. Then our present question concerns the relationship between this addendum and the original language. What do deducibility and validity, as sharply defined on the addendum, tell us about correct deductive reasoning in general?

Another view is that a formal language is a mathematical model of a natural language in roughly the same sense as, say, a collection of point masses is a model of a system of physical objects, and the Bohr construction is a model of an atom. In other words, a formal language displays certain features of natural languages, or idealizations thereof, while ignoring or simplifying other features. The purpose of mathematical models is to shed light on what they are models of, without claiming that the model is accurate in all respects or that the model should replace what it is a model of. On a view like this, deducibility and validity represent mathematical models of (perhaps different aspects of) correct reasoning in natural languages. Correct chunks of deductive reasoning correspond, more or less, to valid or deducible arguments; incorrect chunks of reasoning roughly correspond to invalid or non-deducible arguments. See, for example, Corcoran [1973], Shapiro [1998], and Cook [2002].

There is no need to adjudicate this matter here. Perhaps the truth lies in a combination of the above options, or maybe some other option is the correct, or most illuminating one. We raise the matter only to lend some philosophical perspective to the formal treatment that follows.

2. Language

Here we develop the basics of a formal language, or to be precise, a class of formal languages. Again, a formal language is a recursively defined set of strings on a fixed alphabet. Some aspects of the formal languages correspond to, or have counterparts in, natural languages like English. Technically, this “counterpart relation” is not part of the formal development, but we will mention it from time to time, to motivate some of the features and results.

2.1 Building blocks

We begin with analogues of singular terms, linguistic items whose function is to denote a person or object. We call these terms. We assume a stock of individual constants. These are lower-case letters, near the beginning of the Roman alphabet, with or without numerical subscripts:

\[ a, a_1, b_{23}, c, d_{22}, \text{etc}. \]

We envisage a potential infinity of individual constants. In the present system each constant is a single character, and so individual constants do not have an internal syntax. Thus we have an infinite alphabet. This could be avoided by taking a constant like \(d_{22}\), for example, to consist of three characters, a lowercase “\(d\)” followed by a pair of subscript “2”s.

We also assume a stock of individual variables. These are lower-case letters, near the end of the alphabet, with or without numerical subscripts:

\[ w, x, y_{12}, z, z_4, \text{etc}. \]

In ordinary mathematical reasoning, there are two functions terms need to fulfill. We need to be able to denote specific, but unspecified (or arbitrary) objects, and sometimes we need to express generality. In our system, we use some constants in the role of unspecified reference and variables to express generality. Both uses are recapitulated in the formal treatment below. Some logicians employ different symbols for unspecified objects (sometimes called “individual parameters”) and variables used to express generality.

Constants and variables are the only terms in our formal language, so all of our terms are simple, corresponding to proper names and some uses of pronouns. We call a term closed if it contains no variables. In general, we use \(v\) to represent variables, and \(t\) to represent a closed term. Some authors also introduce function letters, which allow complex terms corresponding to: “\(7+4\)” and “the wife of Bill Clinton”, or complex terms containing variables, like “the father of \(x\)” and “\(x/y\)”. Logic books aimed at mathematicians are likely to contain function letters, probably due to the centrality of functions in mathematical discourse. Books aimed at a more general audience (or at philosophy students), may leave out function letters, since it simplifies the syntax and theory. We follow the latter route here. This is an instance of a general tradeoff between presenting a system with greater expressive resources, at the cost of making its formal treatment more complex.

For each natural number \(n\), we introduce a stock of \(n\)-place predicate letters. These are upper-case letters at the beginning or middle of the alphabet. A superscript indicates the number of places, and there may or may not be a subscript. For example,

\[ A^3, B^{3}_2, P^3, \text{etc}. \]

are three-place predicate letters. We often omit the superscript, when no confusion will result. We also add a special two-place predicate symbol “\(=\)” for identity.

Zero-place predicate letters are sometimes called “sentence letters”. They correspond to free-standing sentences whose internal structure does not matter. One-place predicate letters, called “monadic predicate letters”, correspond to linguistic items denoting properties, like “being a man”, “being red”, or “being a prime number”. Two-place predicate letters, called “binary predicate letters”, correspond to linguistic items denoting binary relations, like “is a parent of” or “is greater than”. Three-place predicate letters correspond to three-place relations, like “lies on a straight line between”. And so on.

The non-logical terminology of the language consists of its individual constants and predicate letters. The symbol “\(=\)”, for identity, is not a non-logical symbol. In taking identity to be logical, we provide explicit treatment for it in the deductive system and in the model-theoretic semantics. Most authors do the same, but there is some controversy over the issue (Quine [1986, Chapter 5]). If \(K\) is a set of constants and predicate letters, then we give the fundamentals of a language \(\LKe\) built on this set of non-logical terminology. It may be called the first-order language with identity on \(K\). A similar language that lacks the symbol for identity (or which takes identity to be non-logical) may be called \(\mathcal{L}1K\), the first-order language without identity on \(K\).

2.2 Atomic formulas

If \(V\) is an \(n\)-place predicate letter in \(K\), and \(t_1, \ldots,t_n\) are terms of \(K\), then \(Vt_1 \ldots t_n\) is an atomic formula of \(\LKe\). Notice that the terms \(t_1, \ldots,t_n\) need not be distinct. Examples of atomic formulas include:

\[ P^4 xaab, C^1 x, C^1 a, D^0, A^3 abc. \]

The last one is an analogue of a statement that a certain relation \((A)\) holds between three objects \((a, b, c)\). If \(t_1\) and \(t_2\) are terms, then \(t_1 =t_2\) is also an atomic formula of \(\LKe\). It corresponds to an assertion that \(t_1\) is identical to \(t_2\).

If an atomic formula has no variables, then it is called an atomic sentence. If it does have variables, it is called open. In the above list of examples, the first and second are open; the rest are sentences.

2.3 Compound formulas

We now introduce the final items of the lexicon:

\[ \neg, \amp, \vee, \rightarrow, \forall, \exists, (, ) \]

We give a recursive definition of a formula of \(\LKe\):

1. All atomic formulas of \(\LKe\) are formulas of \(\LKe\).
2. If \(\theta\) is a formula of \(\LKe\), then so is \(\neg \theta\).

A formula corresponding to \(\neg \theta\) thus says that it is not the case that \(\theta\). The symbol “\(\neg\)” is called “negation”, and is a unary connective.

3. If \(\theta\) and \(\psi\) are formulas of \(\LKe\), then so is \((\theta \amp \psi)\).

The ampersand “\(\amp\)” corresponds to the English “and” (when “and” is used to connect sentences). So \((\theta \amp \psi)\) can be read “\(\theta\) and \(\psi\)”. The formula \((\theta \amp \psi)\) is called the “conjunction” of \(\theta\) and \(\psi\).

4. If \(\theta\) and \(\psi\) are formulas of \(\LKe\), then so is \((\theta \vee \psi)\).

The wedge “\(\vee\)” corresponds to “either … or … or both”, so \((\theta \vee \psi)\) can be read “\(\theta\) or \(\psi\)”. The formula \((\theta \vee \psi)\) is called the “disjunction” of \(\theta\) and \(\psi\).

5. 5. If \(\theta\) and \(\psi\) are formulas of \(\LKe\), then so is \((\theta \rightarrow \psi)\).

The arrow “\(\rightarrow\)” roughly corresponds to “if … then … ”, so \((\theta \rightarrow \psi)\) can be read “if \(\theta\) then \(\psi\)” or “\(\theta\) only if \(\psi\)”.

The symbols “\(\amp\)”, “\(\vee\)”, and “\(\rightarrow\)” are called “binary connectives”, since they serve to “connect” two formulas into one. Some authors introduce \((\theta \leftrightarrow \psi)\) as an abbreviation of \(((\theta \rightarrow \psi) \amp(\psi \rightarrow \theta))\). The symbol “\(\leftrightarrow\)” is an analogue of the locution “if and only if”.

6. If \(\theta\) is a formula of \(\LKe\) and \(v\) is a variable, then \(\forall v \theta\) is a formula of \(\LKe\).

The symbol “\(\forall\)” is called a universal quantifier, and is an analogue of “for all”; so \(\forall v\theta\) can be read “for all \(v, \theta\)”.

7. If \(\theta\) is a formula of \(\LKe\) and \(v\) is a variable, then \(\exists v \theta\) is a formula of \(\LKe\).

The symbol “\(\exists\)” is called an existential quantifier, and is an analogue of “there exists” or “there is”; so \(\exists v \theta\) can be read “there is a \(v\) such that \(\theta\)”.

8. That’s all folks. That is, all formulas are constructed in accordance with rules (1)–(7).

Clause (8) allows us to do inductions on the complexity of formulas. If a certain property holds of the atomic formulas and is closed under the operations presented in clauses (2)–(7), then the property holds of all formulas. Here is a simple example:

We next define the notion of an occurrence of a variable being free or bound in a formula. A variable that immediately follows a quantifier (as in “\(\forall x\)” and “\(\exists y\)”) is neither free nor bound. We do not even think of those as occurrences of the variable. All variables that occur in an atomic formula are free. If a variable occurs free (or bound) in \(\theta\) or in \(\psi\), then that same occurrence is free (or bound) in \(\neg \theta, (\theta \amp \psi), (\theta \vee \psi)\), and \((\theta \rightarrow \psi)\). That is, the (unary and binary) connectives do not change the status of variables that occur in them. All occurrences of the variable \(v\) in \(\theta\) are bound in \(\forall v \theta\) and \(\exists v \theta\). Any free occurrences of \(v\) in \(\theta\) are bound by the initial quantifier. All other variables that occur in \(\theta\) are free or bound in \(\forall v \theta\) and \(\exists v \theta\), as they are in \(\theta\).

For example, in the formula \((\forall\)x(Axy \(\vee Bx) \amp Bx)\), the occurrences of “\(x\)” in Axy and in the first \(Bx\) are bound by the quantifier. The occurrence of “\(y\)” and last occurrence of “\(x\)” are free. In \(\forall x(Ax \rightarrow \exists\)xBx), the “\(x\)” in \(Ax\) is bound by the initial universal quantifier, while the other occurrence of \(x\) is bound by the existential quantifier. The above syntax allows this “double-binding”. Although it does not create any ambiguities (see below), we will avoid such formulas, as a matter of taste and clarity.

The syntax also allows so-called vacuous binding, as in \(\forall\)x\(Bc\). These, too, will be avoided in what follows. Some treatments of logic rule out vacuous binding and double binding as a matter of syntax. That simplifies some of the treatments below, and complicates others.

Free variables correspond to place-holders, while bound variables are used to express generality. If a formula has no free variables, then it is called a sentence. If a formula has free variables, it is called open.

2.4 Features of the syntax

Before turning to the deductive system and semantics, we mention a few features of the language, as developed so far. This helps draw the contrast between formal languages and natural languages like English.

We assume at the outset that all of the categories are disjoint. For example, no connective is also a quantifier or a variable, and the non-logical terms are not also parentheses or connectives. Also, the items within each category are distinct. For example, the sign for disjunction does not do double-duty as the negation symbol, and perhaps more significantly, no two-place predicate is also a one-place predicate.

One difference between natural languages like English and formal languages like \(\LKe\) is that the latter are not supposed to have any ambiguities. The policy that the different categories of symbols do not overlap, and that no symbol does double-duty, avoids the kind of ambiguity, sometimes called “equivocation”, that occurs when a single word has two meanings: “I’ll meet you at the bank.” But there are other kinds of ambiguity. Consider the English sentence:

John is married, and Mary is single, or Joe is crazy.

It can mean that John is married and either Mary is single or Joe is crazy, or else it can mean that either both John is married and Mary is single, or else Joe is crazy. An ambiguity like this, due to different ways to parse the same sentence, is sometimes called an “amphiboly”. If our formal language did not have the parentheses in it, it would have amphibolies. For example, there would be a “formula” \(A \amp B \vee\) C. Is this supposed to be \(((A \amp B) \vee C)\), or is it \((A \amp(B \vee C))\)? The parentheses resolve what would be an amphiboly.

Can we be sure that there are no other amphibolies in our language? That is, can we be sure that each formula of \(\LKe\) can be put together in only one way? Our next task is to answer this question.

Let us temporarily use the term “unary marker” for the negation symbol \((\neg)\) or a quantifier followed by a variable (e.g., \(\forall x, \exists z)\).

The proof proceeds by induction on the number of instances of (2)–(7) used to construct the formula, and we leave it as an exercise.

We are finally in position to show that there is no amphiboly in our language.

This result is sometimes called “unique readability”. It shows that each formula is produced from the atomic formulas via the various clauses in exactly one way. If \(\theta\) was produced by clause (2), then its main connective is the initial “\(\neg\)”. If \(\theta\) was produced by clauses (3), (4), or (5), then its main connective is the introduced “\(\amp\)”, “\(\vee\)”, or “\(\rightarrow\)”, respectively. If \(\theta\) was produced by clauses (6) or (7), then its main connective is the initial quantifier. We apologize for the tedious details. We included them to indicate the level of precision and rigor for the syntax.

3. Deduction

We now introduce a deductive system, \(D\), for our languages. As above, we define an argument to be a non-empty collection of sentences in the formal language, one of which is designated to be the conclusion. If there are any other sentences in the argument, they are its premises.^[1] By convention, we use “\(\Gamma\)”, “\(\Gamma'\)”, “\(\Gamma_1\)”, etc, to range over sets of formulas, and we use the letters “\(\phi\)”, “\(\psi\)”, “\(\theta\)”, uppercase or lowercase, with or without subscripts, to range over single formulas. We write “\(\Gamma, \Gamma'\)” for the union of \(\Gamma\) and \(\Gamma'\), and “\(\Gamma, \phi\)” for the union of \(\Gamma\) with \(\{\phi\}\).

We write an argument in the form \(\langle \Gamma, \phi \rangle\), where \(\Gamma\) is a set of sentences, the premises, and \(\phi\) is a single sentence, the conclusion. Remember that \(\Gamma\) may be empty. We write \(\Gamma \vdash \phi\) to indicate that \(\phi\) is deducible from \(\Gamma\), or, in other words, that the argument \(\langle \Gamma, \phi \rangle\) is deducible in \(D\). We may write \(\Gamma \vdash_D \phi\) to emphasize the deductive system \(D\). We write \(\vdash \phi\) or \(\vdash_D \phi\) to indicate that \(\phi\) can be deduced (in \(D)\) from the empty set of premises.

The rules in \(D\) are chosen to match logical relations concerning the English analogues of the logical terminology in the language. Again, we define the deducibility relation by recursion. We start with a rule of assumptions:

• (As) If \(\phi\) is a member of \(\Gamma\), then \(\Gamma \vdash \phi\).

We thus have that \(\{\phi \}\vdash \phi\); each premise follows from itself. We next present two clauses for each connective and quantifier. The clauses indicate how to “introduce” and “eliminate” sentences in which each symbol is the main connective.

First, recall that “\(\amp\)” is an analogue of the English connective “and”. Intuitively, one can deduce a sentence in the form \((\theta \amp \psi)\) if one has deduced \(\theta\) and one has deduced \(\psi\). Conversely, one can deduce \(\theta\) from \((\theta \amp \psi)\) and one can deduce \(\psi\) from \((\theta \amp \psi)\):

• \((\amp \mathrm{I})\) If \(\Gamma_1 \vdash \theta\) and \(\Gamma_2 \vdash \psi\), then \(\Gamma_1, \Gamma_2 \vdash(\theta \amp \psi)\).
• \((\amp \mathrm{E})\) If \(\Gamma \vdash(\theta \amp \psi)\) then \(\Gamma \vdash \theta\); and if \(\Gamma \vdash(\theta \amp \psi)\) then \(\Gamma \vdash \psi\).

The name “&I” stands for “&-introduction”; “&E” stands for “&-elimination”.

Since, the symbol “\(\vee\)” corresponds to the English “or”, \((\theta \vee \psi)\) should be deducible from \(\theta\), and \((\theta \vee \psi)\) should also be deducible from \(\psi\):

• \((\vee \mathrm{I})\) If \(\Gamma \vdash \theta\) then \(\Gamma \vdash(\theta \vee \psi)\); if \(\Gamma \vdash \psi\) then \(\Gamma \vdash(\theta \vee \psi)\).

The elimination rule is a bit more complicated. Suppose that “\(\theta\) or \(\psi\)” is true. Suppose also that \(\phi\) follows from \(\theta\) and that \(\phi\) follows from \(\psi\). One can reason that if \(\theta\) is true, then \(\phi\) is true. If instead \(\psi\) is true, we still have that \(\phi\) is true. So either way, \(\phi\) must be true.

• \((\vee \mathrm{E})\) If \(\Gamma_1 \vdash(\theta \vee \psi), \Gamma_2, \theta \vdash \phi\) and \(\Gamma_3, \psi \vdash \phi\), then \(\Gamma_1, \Gamma_2, \Gamma_3 \vdash \phi\).

For the next clauses, recall that the symbol, “\(\rightarrow\)”, is an analogue of the English “if … then … ” construction. If one knows, or assumes \((\theta \rightarrow \psi)\) and also knows, or assumes \(\theta\), then one can conclude \(\psi\). Conversely, if one deduces \(\psi\) from an assumption \(\theta\), then one can conclude that \((\theta \rightarrow \psi)\).

• \(({\rightarrow}\mathrm{I})\) If \(\Gamma, \theta \vdash \psi\), then \(\Gamma \vdash(\theta \rightarrow \psi)\).
• \(({\rightarrow}\mathrm{E})\) If \(\Gamma_1 \vdash(\theta \rightarrow \psi)\) and \(\Gamma_2 \vdash \theta\), then \(\Gamma_1, \Gamma_2 \vdash \psi\).

This elimination rule is sometimes called “modus ponens”. In some logic texts, the introduction rule is proved as a “deduction theorem”.

Our next clauses are for the negation sign, “\(\neg\)”. The underlying idea is that a sentence \(\psi\) is inconsistent with its negation \(\neg \psi\). They cannot both be true. We call a pair of sentences \(\psi, \neg \psi\) contradictory opposites. If one can deduce such a pair from an assumption \(\theta\), then one can conclude that \(\theta\) is false, or, in other words, one can conclude \(\neg \theta\).

• \((\neg \mathrm{I})\) If \(\Gamma_1, \theta \vdash \psi\) and \(\Gamma_2, \theta \vdash \neg \psi\), then \(\Gamma_1, \Gamma_2 \vdash \neg \theta\).

By (As), we have that \(\{A,\neg A\}\vdash A\) and \(\{\)A,\(\neg\)A\(\}\vdash \neg A\). So by \(\neg\)I we have that \(\{A\}\vdash \neg \neg A\). However, we do not have the converse yet. Intuitively, \(\neg \neg \theta\) corresponds to “it is not the case that it is not the case that” . One might think that this last is equivalent to \(\theta\), and we have a rule to that effect:

• (DNE) If \(\Gamma \vdash \neg \neg \theta\), then \(\Gamma \vdash \theta\).

The name DNE stands for “double-negation elimination”. There is some controversy over this inference. It is rejected by philosophers and mathematicians who do not hold that each meaningful sentence is either true or not true. Intuitionistic logic does not sanction the inference in question (see, for example Dummett [2000], or the entry on intuitionistic logic, or history of intuitionistic logic), but, again, classical logic does.

To illustrate the parts of the deductive system \(D\) presented thus far, we show that \(\vdash(A \vee \neg A)\):

1. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), A\}\vdash \neg(A \vee \neg A)\), by (As)
2. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), A\}\vdash A\), by (As).
3. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), A\}\vdash(A \vee \neg A)\), by \((\vee\)I), from (ii).
4. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A)\}\vdash \neg A\), by \((\neg\)I), from (i) and (iii).
5. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), \neg A\}\vdash \neg(A \vee \neg A)\), by (As)
6. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), \neg A\}\vdash \neg A\), by (As)
7. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A), \neg A\}\vdash(A \vee \neg A)\), by \((\vee\)I), from (vi).
8. \(\{\neg(A \vee \neg A)\}\vdash \neg \neg A\), by \((\neg\)I), from (v) and (vii).
9. \(\vdash \neg \neg(A \vee \neg A)\), by \((\neg\)I), from (iv) and (viii).
10. \(\vdash(A \vee \neg A)\), by (DNE), from (ix).

The principle \((\theta \vee \neg \theta)\) is sometimes called the law of excluded middle. It is not valid in intuitionistic logic.

Let \(\theta, \neg \theta\) be a pair of contradictory opposites, and let \(\psi\) be any sentence at all. By (As) we have \(\{\theta, \neg \theta, \neg \psi \}\vdash \theta\) and \(\{\theta, \neg \theta, \neg \psi \}\vdash \neg \theta\). So by \((\neg\)I), \(\{\theta, \neg \theta \}\vdash \neg \neg \psi\). So, by (DNE) we have \(\{\theta , \neg \theta \}\vdash \psi\) . That is, anything at all follows from a pair of contradictory opposites. Some logicians introduce a rule to codify a similar inference:

If \(\Gamma_1 \vdash \theta\) and \(\Gamma_2 \vdash \neg \theta\), then for any sentence \(\psi, \Gamma_1, \Gamma_2 \vdash \psi\)

The inference is sometimes called ex falso quodlibet or, more colorfully, explosion. Some call it “\(\neg\)-elimination”, but perhaps this stretches the notion of “elimination” a bit. We do not officially include ex falso quodlibet as a separate rule in \(D\), but as will be shown below (Theorem 10), each instance of it is derivable in our system \(D\).

Some logicians object to ex falso quodlibet, on the ground that the sentence \(\psi\) may be irrelevant to any of the premises in \(\Gamma\). Suppose, for example, that one starts with some premises \(\Gamma\) about human nature and facts about certain people, and then deduces both the sentence “Clinton had extra-marital sexual relations” and “Clinton did not have extra-marital sexual relations”. One can perhaps conclude that there is something wrong with the premises \(\Gamma\). But should we be allowed to then deduce anything at all from \(\Gamma\)? Should we be allowed to deduce “The economy is sound”?

A small minority of logicians, called dialetheists, hold that some contradictions are actually true. For them, ex falso quodlibet is not truth-preserving.

Deductive systems that demur from ex falso quodlibet are called paraconsistent. Most relevant logics are paraconsistent. See the entries on relevance logic, paraconsistent logic, and dialetheism. Or see Anderson and Belnap [1975], Anderson, Belnap, and Dunn [1992], and Tennant [1997] for fuller overviews of relevant logic; and Priest [2006],[2006a] for dialetheism. Deep philosophical issues concerning the nature of logical consequence are involved. Far be it for an article in a philosophy encyclopedia to avoid philosophical issues, but space considerations preclude a fuller treatment of this issue here. Suffice it to note that the inference ex falso quodlibet is sanctioned in systems of classical logic, the subject of this article. It is essential to establishing the balance between the deductive system and the semantics (see §5 below).

The next pieces of \(D\) are the clauses for the quantifiers. Let \(\theta\) be a formula, \(v\) a variable, and \(t\) a term (i.e., a variable or a constant). Then define \(\theta(v|t)\) to be the result of substituting \(t\) for each free occurrence of \(v\) in \(\theta\). So, if \(\theta\) is \((Qx \amp \exists\)xPxy), then \(\theta(x|c)\) is \((Qc \amp \exists\)xPxy). The last occurrence of \(x\) is not free.

A sentence in the form \(\forall v \theta\) is an analogue of the English “for every \(v, \theta\) holds”. So one should be able to infer \(\theta(v|t)\) from \(\forall v \theta\) for any closed term \(t\). Recall that the only closed terms in our system are constants.

• \((\forall \mathrm{E})\) If \(\Gamma \vdash \forall v \theta\), then \(\Gamma \vdash \theta(v|t)\), for any closed term \(t\).

The idea here is that if \(\forall v \theta\) is true, then \(\theta\) should hold of \(t\), no matter what \(t\) is.

The introduction clause for the universal quantifier is a bit more complicated. Suppose that a sentence \(\theta\) contains a closed term \(t\), and that \(\theta\) has been deduced from a set of premises \(\Gamma\). If the closed term \(t\) does not occur in any member of \(\Gamma\), then \(\theta\) will hold no matter which object \(t\) may denote. That is, \(\forall v \theta\) follows.

• \((\forall \mathrm{I})\) For any closed term \(t\), if \(\Gamma\vdash\theta (v|t)\), then \(\Gamma\vdash\forall v\theta\) provided that \(t\) is not in \(\Gamma\) or \(\theta\).

This rule \((\forall \mathbf{I})\) corresponds to a common inference in mathematics. Suppose that a mathematician says “let \(n\) be a natural number” and goes on to show that \(n\) has a certain property \(P\), without assuming anything about \(n\) (except that it is a natural number). She then reminds the reader that \(n\) is “arbitrary”, and concludes that \(P\) holds for all natural numbers. The condition that the term \(t\) not occur in any premise is what guarantees that it is indeed “arbitrary”. It could be any object, and so anything we conclude about it holds for all objects.

The existential quantifier is an analogue of the English expression “there exists”, or perhaps just “there is”. If we have established (or assumed) that a given object \(t\) has a given property, then it follows that there is something that has that property.

• \((\exists \mathrm{I})\) For any closed term \(t\), if \(\Gamma\vdash\theta (v|t)\) then \(\Gamma\vdash\exists v\theta\).

The elimination rule for \(\exists\) is not quite as simple:

• \((\exists \mathrm{E})\) For any closed term \(t\), if \(\Gamma_1\vdash\exists v\theta\) and \(\Gamma_2, \theta(v|t)\vdash\phi\), then \(\Gamma_1 ,\Gamma_2\vdash\phi\), provided that \(t\) does not occur in \(\phi\), \(\Gamma_2\) or \(\theta\).

This elimination rule also corresponds to a common inference. Suppose that a mathematician assumes or somehow concludes that there is a natural number with a given property \(P\). She then says “let \(n\) be such a natural number, so that \(Pn\)”, and goes on to establish a sentence \(\phi\), which does not mention the number \(n\). If the derivation of \(\phi\) does not invoke anything about \(n\) (other than the assumption that it has the given property \(P)\), then \(n\) could have been any number that has the property \(P\). That is, \(n\) is an arbitrary number with property \(P\) (this is where we invoke constants which “denote” arbitrary objects). It does not matter which number \(n\) is. Since \(\phi\) does not mention \(n\), it follows from the assertion that something has property \(P\). The provisions added to \((\exists\)E) are to guarantee that \(t\) is “arbitrary”.

The final items are the rules for the identity sign “=”. The introduction rule is about a simple as can be:

• \(({=}\mathrm{I})\) \(\Gamma \vdash t=t\), where \(t\) is any closed term.

This “inference” corresponds to the truism that everything is identical to itself. The elimination rule corresponds to a principle that if \(a\) is identical to \(b\), then anything true of \(a\) is also true of \(b\).

• \(({=}\mathrm{E})\) For any closed terms \(t_1\) and \(t_2\), if \(\Gamma_1 \vdash t_1 =t_2\) and \(\Gamma_2 \vdash \theta\), then \(\Gamma_1, \Gamma_2 \vdash \theta'\), where \(\theta'\) is obtained from \(\theta\) by replacing one or more occurances of \(t_1\) with \(t_2\).

The rule \(({=}\mathrm{E})\) indicates a certain restriction in the expressive resources of our language. Suppose, for example, that Harry is identical to Donald (since his mischievous parents gave him two names). According to most people’s intuitions, it would not follow from this and “Dick knows that Harry is wicked” that “Dick knows that Donald is wicked”, for the reason that Dick might not know that Harry is identical to Donald. Contexts like this, in which identicals cannot safely be substituted for each other, are called “opaque”. We assume that our language \(\LKe\) has no opaque contexts.

One final clause completes the description of the deductive system \(D\):

• (*) That’s all folks. \(\Gamma \vdash \theta\) only if \(\theta\) follows from members of \(\Gamma\) by the above rules.

Again, this clause allows proofs by induction on the rules used to establish an argument. If a property of arguments holds of all instances of (As) and \(({=}\mathrm{I})\), and if the other rules preserve the property, then every argument that is deducible in \(D\) enjoys the property in question.

Before moving on to the model theory for \(\LKe\), we pause to note a few features of the deductive system. To illustrate the level of rigor, we begin with a lemma that if a sentence does not contain a particular closed term, we can make small changes to the set of sentences we prove it from without problems. We allow ourselves the liberty here of extending some previous notation: for any terms \(t\) and \(t'\), and any formula \(\theta\), we say that \(\theta(t|t')\) is the result of replacing all free occurrences of \(t\) in \(\theta\) with \(t'\).

Theorem 8 allows us to add on premises at will. It follows that \(\Gamma \vdash \phi\) if and only if there is a subset \(\Gamma'\subseteq \Gamma\) such that \(\Gamma'\vdash \phi\). Some systems of relevant logic do not have weakening, nor does substructural logic (See the entries on relevance logic, substructural logics, and linear logic).

By clause (*), all derivations are established in a finite number of steps. So we have

Theorem 11 allows us to chain together inferences. This fits the practice of establishing theorems and lemmas and then using those theorems and lemmas later, at will. The cut principle is, some think, essential to reasoning. In some logical systems, the cut principle is a deep theorem; in others it is invalid. The system here was designed, in part, to make the proof of Theorem 11 straightforward.

If \(\Gamma \vdash_D \theta\), then we say that the sentence \(\theta\) is a deductive consequence of the set of sentences \(\Gamma\), and that the argument \(\langle \Gamma,\theta \rangle\) is deductively valid. A sentence \(\theta\) is a logical theorem, or a deductive logical truth, if \(\vdash_D \theta\). That is, \(\theta\) is a logical theorem if it is a deductive consequence of the empty set. A set \(\Gamma\) of sentences is consistent if there is no sentence \(\theta\) such that \(\Gamma \vdash_D \theta\) and \(\Gamma \vdash_D \neg \theta\). That is, a set is consistent if it does not entail a pair of contradictory opposite sentencess.

Define a set \(\Gamma\) of sentences of the language \(\LKe\) to be maximally consistent if \(\Gamma\) is consistent and for every sentence \(\theta\) of \(\LKe\), if \(\theta\) is not in \(\Gamma\), then \(\Gamma,\theta\) is inconsistent. In other words, \(\Gamma\) is maximally consistent if \(\Gamma\) is consistent, and adding any sentence in the language not already in \(\Gamma\) renders it inconsistent. Notice that if \(\Gamma\) is maximally consistent then \(\Gamma \vdash \theta\) if and only if \(\theta\) is in \(\Gamma\).

Notice that this proof uses a principle corresponding to the law of excluded middle. In the construction of \(\Gamma'\), we assumed that, at each stage, either \(\Gamma_n\) is consistent or it is not. Intuitionists, who demur from excluded middle, do not accept the Lindenbaum lemma.

4. Semantics

Let \(K\) be a set of non-logical terminology. An interpretation for the language \(\LKe\) is a structure \(M = \langle d,I\rangle\), where \(d\) is a non-empty set, called the domain-of-discourse, or simply the domain, of the interpretation, and \(I\) is an interpretation function. Informally, the domain is what we interpret the language \(\LKe\) to be about. It is what the variables range over. The interpretation function assigns appropriate extensions to the non-logical terms. In particular,

If \(c\) is a constant in \(K\), then \(I(c)\) is a member of the domain \(d\).

Thus we assume that every constant denotes something. Systems where this is not assumed are called free logics (see the entry on free logic). Continuing,

Define \(s\) to be a variable-assignment, or simply an assignment, on an interpretation \(M\), if \(s\) is a function from the variables to the domain \(d\) of \(M\). The role of variable-assignments is to assign denotations to the free variables of open formulas. (In a sense, the quantifiers determine the “meaning” of the bound variables.)

Let \(t\) be a term of \(\LKe\). We define the denotation of \(t\) in \(M\) under \(s\), in terms of the interpretation function and variable-assignment:

If \(t\) is a constant, then \(D_{M,s}(t)\) is \(I(t)\), and if \(t\) is a variable, then \(D_{M,s}(t)\) is \(s(t)\).

That is, the interpretation \(M\) assigns denotations to the constants, while the variable-assignment assigns denotations to the (free) variables. If the language contained function symbols, the denotation function would be defined by recursion.

We now define a relation of satisfaction between interpretations, variable-assignments, and formulas of \(\LKe\). If \(\phi\) is a formula of \(\LKe, M\) is an interpretation for \(\LKe\), and \(s\) is a variable-assignment on \(M\), then we write \(M,s\vDash \phi\) for \(M\) satisfies \(\phi\) under the assignment \(s\). The idea is that \(M,s\vDash \phi\) is an analogue of “\(\phi\) comes out true when interpreted as in \(M\) via \(s\)”.

We proceed by recursion on the complexity of the formulas of \(\LKe\).

If \(t_1\) and \(t_2\) are terms, then \(M,s\vDash t_1 =t_2\) if and only if \(D_{M,s}(t_1)\) is the same as \(D_{M,s}(t_2)\).

This is about as straightforward as it gets. An identity \(t_1 =t_2\) comes out true if and only if the terms \(t_1\) and \(t_2\) denote the same thing.

If \(P^0\) is a zero-place predicate letter in \(K\), then \(M,s\vDash P\) if and only if \(I(P)\) is truth.

If S\(^n\) is an \(n\)-place predicate letter in \(K\) and \(t_1, \ldots,t_n\) are terms, then \(M,s\vDash St_1 \ldots t_n\) if and only if the \(n\)-tuple \(\langle D_{M,s}(t_1), \ldots,D_{M,s}(t_n)\rangle\) is in \(I(S)\).

This takes care of the atomic formulas. We now proceed to the compound formulas of the language, more or less following the meanings of the English counterparts of the logical terminology.

The idea here is that \(\forall v\theta\) comes out true if and only if \(\theta\) comes out true no matter what is assigned to the variable \(v\). The final clause is similar.

\(M,s\vDash \exists v\theta\) if and only if \(M,s'\vDash \theta\), for some assignment \(s'\) that agrees with \(s\) except possibly at the variable \(v\).

So \(\exists v\theta\) comes out true if there is an assignment to \(v\) that makes \(\theta\) true.

Theorem 6, unique readability, assures us that this definition is coherent. At each stage in breaking down a formula, there is exactly one clause to be applied, and so we never get contradictory verdicts concerning satisfaction.

As indicated, the role of variable-assignments is to give denotations to the free variables. We now show that variable-assignments play no other role.

By Theorem 14, if \(\theta\) is a sentence, and \(s_1, s_2\), are any two variable-assignments, then \(M,s_1 \vDash \theta\) if and only if \(M,s_2 \vDash \theta\). So we can just write \(M\vDash \theta\) if \(M,s\vDash \theta\) for some, or all, variable-assignments \(s\). So we define

\(M\vDash \theta\) where \(\theta\) is a sentence just in case \(M,s\vDash\theta\) for all variable assignments \(s\).

In this case, we call \(M\) a model of \(\theta\).

Suppose that \(K'\subseteq K\) are two sets of non-logical terms. If \(M = \langle d,I\rangle\) is an interpretation of \(\LKe\), then we define the restriction of \(M\) to \(\mathcal{L}1K'\) be the interpretation \(M'=\langle d,I'\rangle\) such that \(I'\) is the restriction of \(I\) to \(K'\). That is, \(M\) and \(M'\) have the same domain and agree on the non-logical terminology in \(K'\). A straightforward induction establishes the following:

In short, the satisfaction of a sentence \(\theta\) only depends on the domain of discourse and the interpretation of the non-logical terminology in \(\theta\).

We say that an argument \(\langle \Gamma,\theta \rangle\) is semantically valid, or just valid, written \(\Gamma \vDash \theta\), if for every interpretation \(M\) of the language, if \(M\vDash\psi\), for every member \(\psi\) of \(\Gamma\), then \(M\vDash\theta\). If \(\Gamma \vDash \theta\), we also say that \(\theta\) is a logical consequence, or semantic consequence, or model-theoretic consequence of \(\Gamma\). The definition corresponds to the informal idea that an argument is valid if it is not possible for its premises to all be true and its conclusion false. Our definition of logical consequence also sanctions the common thesis that a valid argument is truth-preserving--to the extent that satisfaction represents truth. Officially, an argument in \(\LKe\) is valid if its conclusion comes out true under every interpretation of the language in which the premises are true. Validity is the model-theoretic counterpart to deducibility.

A sentence \(\theta\) is logically true, or valid, if \(M\vDash \theta\), for every interpretation \(M\). A sentence is logically true if and only if it is a consequence of the empty set. If \(\theta\) is logically true, then for any set \(\Gamma\) of sentences, \(\Gamma \vDash \theta\). Logical truth is the model-theoretic counterpart of theoremhood.

A sentence \(\theta\) is satisfiable if there is an interpretation \(M\) such that \(M\vDash \theta\). That is, \(\theta\) is satisfiable if there is an interpretation that satisfies it. A set \(\Gamma\) of sentences is satisfiable if there is an interpretation \(M\) such that \(M\vDash\theta\), for every sentence \(\theta\) in \(\Gamma\). If \(\Gamma\) is a set of sentences and if \(M\vDash \theta\) for each sentence \(\theta\) in \(\Gamma\), then we say that \(M\) is a model of \(\Gamma\). So a set of sentences is satisfiable if it has a model. Satisfiability is the model-theoretic counterpart to consistency.

Notice that \(\Gamma \vDash \theta\) if and only if the set \(\Gamma,\neg \theta\) is not satisfiable. It follows that if a set \(\Gamma\) is not satisfiable, then if \(\theta\) is any sentence, \(\Gamma \vDash \theta\). This is a model-theoretic counterpart to ex falso quodlibet (see Theorem 10). We have the following, as an analogue to Theorem 12:

5. Meta-theory

We now present some results that relate the deductive notions to their model-theoretic counterparts. The first one is probably the most straightforward. We motivated both the various rules of the deductive system \(D\) and the various clauses in the definition of satisfaction in terms of the meaning of the English counterparts to the logical terminology (more or less, with the same simplifications in both cases). So one would expect that an argument is deducible, or deductively valid, only if it is semantically valid.

Even though the deductive system \(D\) and the model-theoretic semantics were developed with the meanings of the logical terminology in mind, one should not automatically expect the converse to soundness (or Corollary 19) to hold. For all we know so far, we may not have included enough rules of inference to deduce every valid argument. The converses to soundness and Corollary 19 are among the most important and influential results in mathematical logic. We begin with the latter.

A converse to Soundness (Theorem 18) is a straightforward corollary:

Our next item is a corollary of Theorem 9, Soundness (Theorem 18), and Completeness:

Soundness and completeness together entail that an argument is deducible if and only if it is valid, and a set of sentences is consistent if and only if it is satisfiable. So we can go back and forth between model-theoretic and proof-theoretic notions, transferring properties of one to the other. Compactness holds in the model theory because all derivations use only a finite number of premises.

Recall that in the proof of Completeness (Theorem 20), we made the simplifying assumption that the set \(K\) of non-logical constants is either finite or denumerably infinite. The interpretation we produced was itself either finite or denumerably infinite. Thus, we have the following:

Corollary 23. Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem. Let \(\Gamma\) be a satisfiable set of sentences of the language \(\LKe\). If \(\Gamma\) is either finite or denumerably infinite, then \(\Gamma\) has a model whose domain is either finite or denumerably infinite.

In general, let \(\Gamma\) be a satisfiable set of sentences of \(\LKe\), and let \(\kappa\) be the larger of the size of \(\Gamma\) and denumerably infinite. Then \(\Gamma\) has a model whose domain is at most size \(\kappa\).

There is a stronger version of Corollary 23. Let \(M_1 =\langle d_1,I_1\rangle\) and \(M_2 =\langle d_2,I_2\rangle\) be interpretations of the language \(\LKe\). Define \(M_1\) to be a submodel of \(M_2\) if \(d_1 \subseteq d_2, I_1 (c) = I_2 (c)\) for each constant \(c\), and \(I_1\) is the restriction of \(I_2\) to \(d_1\). For example, if \(R\) is a binary relation letter in \(K\), then for all \(a,b\) in \(d_1\), the pair \(\langle a,b\rangle\) is in \(I_1 (R)\) if and only if \(\langle a,b\rangle\) is in \(I_2 (R)\). If we had included function letters among the non-logical terminology, we would also require that \(d_1\) be closed under their interpretations in \(M_2\). Notice that if \(M_1\) is a submodel of \(M_2\), then any variable-assignment on \(M_1\) is also a variable-assignment on \(M_2\).

Say that two interpretations \(M_1 =\langle d_1,I_1\rangle, M_2 =\langle d_2,I_2\rangle\) are equivalent if one of them is a submodel of the other, and for any formula of the language and any variable-assignment \(s\) on the submodel, \(M_1,s\vDash \theta\) if and only if \(M_2,s\vDash \theta\). Notice that if two interpretations are equivalent, then they satisfy the same sentences.

Another corollary to Compactness (Corollary 22) is the opposite of the Löwenheim-Skolem theorem:

Combined, the proofs of the downward and upward Löwenheim-Skolem theorems show that for any satisfiable set \(\Gamma\) of sentences, if there is no finite bound on the models of \(\Gamma\), then for any infinite cardinal \(\kappa\), there is a model of \(\Gamma\) whose domain has size exactly \(\kappa\). Moreover, if \(M\) is any interpretation whose domain is infinite, then for any infinite cardinal \(\kappa\), there is an interpretation \(M'\) whose domain has size exactly \(\kappa\) such that \(M\) and \(M'\) are equivalent.

These results indicate a weakness in the expressive resources of first-order languages like \(\LKe\). No satisfiable set of sentences can guarantee that its models are all denumerably infinite, nor can any satisfiable set of sentences guarantee that its models are uncountable. So in a sense, first-order languages cannot express the notion of “denumerably infinite”, at least not in the model theory. (See the entry on second-order and higher-order logic.)

Let \(A\) be any set of sentences in a first-order language \(\LKe\), where \(K\) includes terminology for arithmetic, and assume that every member of \(A\) is true of the natural numbers. We can even let \(A\) be the set of all sentences in \(\LKe\) that are true of the natural numbers. Then \(A\) has uncountable models, indeed models of any infinite cardinality. Such interpretations are among those that are sometimes called unintended, or non-standard models of arithmetic. Let \(B\) be any set of first-order sentences that are true of the real numbers, and let \(C\) be any first-order axiomatization of set theory. Then if \(B\) and \(C\) are satisfiable (in infinite interpretations), then each of them has denumerably infinite models. That is, any first-order, satisfiable set theory or theory of the real numbers, has (unintended) models the size of the natural numbers. This is despite the fact that a sentence (seemingly) stating that the universe is uncountable is provable in most set-theories. This situation, known as the Skolem paradox, has generated much discussion, but we must refer the reader elsewhere for a sample of it (see the entry on Skolem’s paradox and Shapiro 1996).

6. The One Right Logic?

Logic and reasoning go hand in hand. We say that someone has reasoned poorly about something if they have not reasoned logically, or that an argument is bad because it is not logically valid. To date, research has been devoted to exactly just what types of logical systems are appropriate for guiding our reasoning. Traditionally, classical logic has been the logic suggested as the ideal for guiding reasoning (for example, see Quine [1986], Resnik [1996] or Rumfitt [2015]). For this reason, classical logic has often been called “the one right logic”. See Priest [2006a] for a description of how being the best reasoning-guiding logic could make a logic the one right logic.

That classical logic has been given as the answer to which logic ought to guide reasoning is not unexpected. It has rules which are more or less intuitive, and is surprisingly simple for how strong it is. Plus, it is both sound and complete, which is an added bonus. There are some issues, though. As indicated in Section 5, there are certain expressive limitations to classical logic. Thus, much literature has been written challenging this status quo. This literature in general stems from three positions. The first is that classical logic is not reason-guiding because some other single logic is. Examples of this type of argument can be found in Brouwer [1949], Heyting [1956] and Dummett [2000] who argue that intuitionistic logic is correct, and Anderson and Belnap [1975], who argue relevance logic is correct, among many others. Further, some people propose that an extension of classical logic which can express the notion of “denumerably infinite” (see Shapiro [1991]). The second objection to the claim that classical logic is the one right logic comes from a different perspective: logical pluralists claim that classical logic is not the (single) one right logic, because more than one logic is right. See Beall and Restall [2006] and Shapiro [2014] for examples of this type of view (see also the entry on logical pluralism). Finally, the last objection to the claim that classical logic is the one right logic is that logic(s) is not reasoning-guiding, and so there is no one right logic.

Suffice it to say that, though classical logic has traditionally been thought of as “the one right logic”, this is not accepted by everyone. An interesting feature of these debates, though, is that they demonstrate clearly the strengths and weaknesses of various logics (including classical logic) when it comes to capturing reasoning.

Bibliography

• Anderson, A. and N. Belnap [1975], Entailment: The logic of relevance and necessity I, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Anderson, A. and N. Belnap, and M. Dunn [1992], Entailment: The logic of relevance and necessity II, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Beall, Jc and G. Restall [2006], Logical Pluralism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Brouwer, L.E.J. [1949], “Consciousness, Philosophy and Mathematics”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 14(2): 132–133.
• Cook, R. [2002], “Vagueness and mathematical precision”, Mind, 111: 227–247.
• Corcoran, J. [1973], “Gaps between logical theory and mathematical practice”, The methodological unity of science, ed. by M. Bunge, Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 23–50.
• Davidson, D. [1984], Inquiries into truth and interpretation, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Dummett, M. [2000], Elements of intuitionism, second edition, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Gödel, K. [1930], “Die Vollständigkeit der Axiome des logischen Funktionenkalkuls”, Montatshefte für Mathematik und Physik 37, 349–360; translated as “The completeness of the axioms of the functional calculus of logic”, in van Heijenoort [1967], 582–591.
• Heyting, A. [1956], Intuitionism, Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing.
• Lycan, W. [1984], Logical form in natural language, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
• Montague, R. [1974], Formal philosophy, ed. by R. Thomason, New Haven: Yale University Press.
• Priest, G. [2006], In contradiction, a study of the transconsistent, second, revised edition, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• ––– [2006a], Doubt truth to be a liar, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Quine, W. V. O. [1960], Word and object, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
• ––– [1986], Philosophy of logic, second edition, Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
• Resnik, M. [1996], “Ought there to be but one true logic”, in Logic and Reality: Essays on the Legacy of Arthur Prior, J. Copeland (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 489-517.
• Rumfitt, I. [2015], The Boundary Stones of Thought: An Essay in the Philosophy of Logic, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Shapiro, S. [1991], Foundations without Foundationalism, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• ––– [1996], The limits of logic: Second-order logic and the Skolem paradox, The international research library of philosophy, Dartmouth Publishing Company, 1996. (An anthology containing many of the significant later papers on the Skolem paradox.)
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• Van Heijenoort, J [1967], From Frege to Gödel, Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press. An anthology containing many of the major historical papers on mathematical logic in the early decades of the twentieth century.

Further Reading

There are many fine textbooks on mathematical logic. A sample follows.

• Boolos, G., J. P. Burgess, and R. Jeffrey [2007], Computability and logic, fifth edition, Cambridge, England: Cambridge University Press. Elementary and intermediate level.
• Bergmann, M., J. Moor and J. Nelson [2013], The logic book, sixth edition, New York: McGraw-Hill. Elementary and intermediate level.
• Church, A. [1956], Introduction to mathematical logic, Princeton: Princeton University Press. Classic textbook.
• Enderton, H. [1972], A mathematical introduction to logic, New York: Academic Press. Textbook in mathematical logic, aimed at a mathematical audience.
• Forbes, G. [1994], Modern Logic, Oxford: Oxford University Press. Elementary textbook.
• Mendelson, E. [1987], Introduction to mathematical logic, third edition, Princeton: van Nostrand. Intermediate.

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Related Entries

logic: free | logic: infinitary | logic: intuitionistic | logic: linear | logic: modal | logic: paraconsistent | logic: relevance | logic: second-order and higher-order | logic: substructural | logic: temporal | logical consequence | logical form | logical truth | model theory | model theory: first-order | paradox: Skolem’s | proof theory: development of