Displaying Special Characters

Note: If your browser is having trouble displaying the uppercase cursive (‘script’) characters that we have started to use in some technical entries, please follow the instructions for installing Computer Modern Symbol font (cmsy10.ttf) from the CTAN TeX Archive site:

BaKoMa TTF fonts

Once you have reached the above page, all you need to do is search for ‘cmsy10.ttf’ and download/install that font.

Microsoft Windows 7 – 10; Mac OS X 10.6 – 10.12

At this time, there are no known issues when displaying our webpages in Windows 7 – 10, or on any of the following Mac systems: Mac OS X 10.6 (Snow Leopard), Mac OS X 10.7 (Lion), Mac OS X 10.8 (Mountain Lion), Mac OS X 10.9 (Mavericks), Mac OS X 10.10 (Yosemite), Mac OS X 10.11 (El Capitan), or macOS Sierra (10.12)

Microsoft Windows/Vista and Mac OS X/Leopard (10.5)

Windows/Vista. Though we have had limited opportunities to test our pages on Vista machines, the best results are obtained when using Firefox as the browser using its default font. We've had reports that Internet Explorer may lack certain special Unicode characters that we use. If you can't install Firefox, then try: Start → Settings → Control Panel; switch to the Classic View of the Control Panel; select Regional and Language → Languages and then check both “Install files for complex script” and “Install files for East Asian languages”. Then Restart your computer so the new fonts will get loaded.

Mac OS X/Leopard (10.5). The versions of Safari, Firefox, Camino, Mozilla, and OmniWeb that run under Mac OS X 10.5 have all been tested successfully. However, for the best results, you should set the font to Times or Lucida Grande, since these fonts seems to have the widest support for Unicode characters in Mac OS X. We've also tested Opera with pretty good success. See also Alan Wood's Unicode Resources: Unicode fonts for Macintosh OS X computers.

Linux, FreeBSD, Solaris, and other Unix OSes

Firefox, Chrome, and Opera all provide reasonably good support for the special characters used in SEP entries, assuming you use the default font. However, we haven't test our pages with these systems as widely as we have the Windows and Mac platforms. So we cannot supply more specific information about what works best, i.e., what browser/font combination supports the widest range of Unicode characters.

Microsoft Windows XP, NT, 2000, ME, and 98

Firefox gives the best results. If you are using IE 7 under Windows XP, or IE 6 under Windows XP, 2000, ME or 98, try setting your font to Lucida Sans Unicode, Arial, Times, Times New Roman or Courier New fonts, all of which are supposed to support the Unicode named character entities we use in our documents. It is important to remember that not all of these fonts will support all the Unicode characters, so you may need to try different fonts for entries which have obscure characters.

Some things to do if special characters aren't displayed:

We should also note the following for Windows XP users. Our pages, and all other web pages, will look better if you set the following: Control Panel → Display → Appearance → Effects → Use the following method to smooth edges of screen fonts → ClearType.

Apple Mac OS X/Tiger (Panther, etc.)

Mac OS X Tiger (Panther, etc.). Safari and Firefox work well. For Safari, set the font to either Time Roman or Lucida Grande. For Firefox, use the default font.

A Note About the Special Characters in our Entries

We have tried to format our entries in XHTML so that they display properly in a wide range of web browsers. We have developed a web page of special characters which display correctly in a variety of current browsers. See

Widely Supported HTML 4 and Unicode Characters

But many of our entries use special symbols, such as logical, mathematical, and other symbols, which are not widely supported. Here is a list of such symbols:

Special Symbols Not Widely Supported

In the past, we used many more of the "low-resolution" screen shots of these characters and displayed the resulting graphics in the entry as small images, as we have done on the page cited immediately above. But, recently, after being convinced that there was wide support for Unicode characters among web browsers and operating systems, we starting replacing the low-resolution graphics with widely supported font-based Unicode characters. We are slowly but surely making all of our older entries compatible with the newer XHTML standard in the process. Indeed, we have now configured our publishing system so that our entries must parse as valid XHTML (i.e., be in compliance with the international standards set by the authoritative W3C organization) before they are published on the web. (We determine validity by sending our entries, pre-publication, to <http://validator.w3.org/> and fixing any errors reported when this engine tries to determine whether our documents are valid.)

Invariably, our best intentions are sometimes defeated by the technologies involved. If your browser is not properly displaying the named character entities in an entry (e.g., logical symbols, mathematical symbols, etc.), then we hope the above suggestions prove useful.