Mysticism

First published Thu Nov 11, 2004; substantive revision Tue Jul 31, 2018

Under the influence of William James’ The Varieties of Religious Experience, philosophical interest in mysticism has been heavy in distinctive, allegedly knowledge-granting “mystical experiences.” Philosophers have focused on such topics as the classification of mystical experiences, their nature in different religions and mystical traditions, to what extent mystical experiences are conditioned by a mystic’s language and culture, and whether mystical experiences furnish evidence for the truth of their contents. Some philosophers have questioned the emphasis on experience in favor of examining the entire mystical complex (See Jantzen, 1994 and 1995, and section 9 below, and Turner, 1996). Sarah Coakley has argued for replacing the datum for investigation from individual experiential episodes to ongoing contemplative practices. (Coakley 2009, and see Section 9). Typically, mystics, theistic or not, see their mystical experience as part of a larger undertaking aimed at human transformation (See, for example, Teresa of Avila, Life, Chapter 19) and not as the terminus of their efforts. ‘Mysticism’ is best thought of as a constellation of distinctive practices, discourses, texts, institutions, traditions, and experiences aimed at human transformation, variously defined. This entry reports on mysticism and philosophy so will concentrate chiefly on the topics philosophers have discussed concerning mystical experience.

1. Mystical Experience

Because of its variable meanings, a definition of ‘mystical experience’ must be partly stipulative. Two, related, senses of ‘mystical experience’ will be presented, one a wide definition reflecting a more general usage, and the second a narrow definition suiting more specialized treatments of mysticism in philosophy.

1.1 The Wide Sense of ‘Mystical Experience’

In the wide sense, let us say that a ‘mystical experience,’ is:

A (purportedly) super sense-perceptual or sub sense-perceptual experience granting acquaintance of realities or states of affairs that are of a kind not accessible by way of sense perception, somatosensory modalities, or standard introspection.

We can further define the terms used in the definition, as follows:

  1. The inclusion of ‘purportedly’ is to allow the definition to be accepted without acknowledging that mystics ever really do experience realities or states of affairs in the way described.

  2. A ‘super sense-perceptual experience’ includes perception-like content of a kind not appropriate to sense perception, somatosensory modalities (including the means for sensing pain and body temperature, and internally sensing body, limb, organ, and visceral positions and states), or standard introspection. Some mystics have referred to a “spiritual” sense, corresponding to the perceptual senses, appropriate to a non-physical realm. A super sense-perceptual mode of experience may accompany sense perception (see on “extrovertive” experience, Section 2.1). For example, a person can have a super sense-perceptual experience while watching a setting sun. The inclusion of the supersensory mode is what makes the experience mystical.

  3. A ‘sub sense-perceptual experience’ is either devoid of phenomenological content altogether, or nearly so (see the notion of “pure conscious events,” in Sections 5 and 6), or consists of phenomenological content appropriate to sense perception, but lacking in the conceptualization typical of attentive sense perception (see below on “unconstructed experiences”).

  4. ‘Acquaintance’ of realities means the subject is aware (putatively) of the presence of (one or more) realities.

  5. ‘States of affairs’ includes, for example, the impermanence of all reality and that God is the ground of the self. ‘Acquaintance’ of states of affairs can come in two forms. In one, a subject is aware of the presence of (one or more) realities on which (one or more) states of affairs supervene. An example would be an awareness of God (a reality) affording an awareness of one’s utter dependence on God (a state of affairs). In its second form, ‘acquaintance’ of states of affairs involves an insight directly, without supervening on acquaintance, of any reality. An example would be coming to “see” the impermanence of all that exists following an experience that eliminates all phenomenological content.

It is not necessary that at the time of the experience the subject could tell herself, as it were, what realities or state of affairs were then being disclosed to her. The realization may arise following the experience.

Mystical experience is alleged to be “noetic,” involving knowledge of what a subject apprehends (see James, 1958). To what extent this knowledge is alleged to come from the experience alone will be discussed below (Section 8.5).

Generally, philosophers have excluded purely para-sensual experiences such as religious visions and auditions from the mystical. The definition also excludes anomalous experiences such as out of body experiences, telepathy, precognition, and clairvoyance. All of these are acquaintance with objects or qualities of a kind accessible to the senses or to ordinary introspection, such as human thoughts and future physical events. (A degree of vagueness enters the definition of mystical experience here because of what is to count as a “kind” of thing accessible to non-mystical experience.)

In the wide sense, mystical experiences occur within the religious traditions of at least Judaism, Christianity, Islam, Indian religions, Buddhism, and primal religions. In some of these traditions, the experiences are allegedly of a supersensory reality, such as God or Brahman (or, in a few Buddhist traditions, Nirvana, as a reality (See Takeuchi, 1983, pp. 8–9). Many Buddhist traditions, however, make no claim for an experience of a supersensory reality. Some cultivate instead an experience of “unconstructed awareness,” involving an awareness of the world on an absolutely or relatively non-conceptual level (see Griffiths, 1993). The unconstructed experience is thought to grant insight, such as into the impermanent nature of all things. Buddhists refer to an experience of tathata or the “thisness” of reality, accessible only by the absence of ordinary sense-perceptual cognition. These Buddhist experiences are sub sense-perceptual, and mystical, since thisness is claimed to be inaccessible to ordinary sense perception and the awareness of it to provide knowledge about the true nature of reality. Some Buddhist experiences, however, including some Zen experiences, would not count as mystical by our definition, involving no alleged acquaintance with either a reality or a state of affairs (see Suzuki, 1970).

1.2 The Narrow Sense of ‘Mystical Experience’

In the narrow sense, more common among philosophers, ‘mystical experience’ refers to a sub-class of mystical experience in the wide sense. Specifically it refers to:

A (purportedly) super sense-perceptual or sub sense-perceptual unitive experience granting acquaintance of realities or states of affairs that are of a kind not accessible by way of sense-perception, somatosensory modalities, or standard introspection.

A unitive experience involves a phenomenological de-emphasis, blurring, or eradication of multiplicity, where the cognitive significance of the experience is deemed to lie precisely in that phenomenological feature. Examples are experiences of the oneness of all of nature, “union” with God, as in Christian mysticism, (see section 2.2.1), the Hindu experience that Atman is Brahman (that the self/soul is identical with the eternal, absolute being), the Buddhist unconstructed experience, devoid of all multiplicity. (On “unitive” experiences see Smart 1958 and 1978, and Wainwright, 1981, Chapter One.) Excluded from the narrow definition, though present in the wide one, are, for example, a dualistic experience of God, where subject and God remain strictly distinct, without any blurring of the boundaries, a Jewish kabbalistic experience of a single supernal sefirah, and shamanistic experiences of spirits. These are not mystical in the narrow sense, because not unitive experiences in any degree.

Hereafter, ‘mystical experience’ will be used in the narrow sense, unless otherwise noted. Correspondingly, the term ‘mysticism’ will refer to practices, discourse, texts, institutions, and traditions associated with unitive experiences.

Care should be taken not to confuse mystical experience with “religious experience.” The latter refers to any experience having content or significance appropriate to a religious context or that has a “religious” flavor. This would include much of mystical experience, but also religious visions and auditions, non-mystical Zen experiences, and various religious feelings, such as religious awe and sublimity. Also included is what Friedrich Schleiermacher identified as the fundamental religious experience: the feeling of “absolute dependence” (Schleiermacher, 1963).

We can call a numinous (from “numen” meaning divine or spirit) experience, a non-unitive experience.Your garden-variety sense of God’s (mere) “presence” would count as a numinous experience. Numinous experiences contrast with religious experiences that involve, for example, feelings but no alleged acquaintance with non-sensory realities or states of affairs.

Rudolf Otto reserved the term “numinous experience” for experiences allegedly of a reality perceived of as “wholly other” than the subject, producing a reaction of dread and fascination before an incomprehensible mystery (Otto, 1957). In the sense used here, Otto’s “numinous” experience is but one kind of numinous experience.

2. Categories of Mystical Experiences

Mystical and religious experiences can be classified in various ways, in addition to the built-in difference between mystical super sense-perceptual and sub sense-perceptual experiences. This section notes some common classifications.

2.1 Extrovertive and Introvertive

When any experience includes sense-perceptual, somatosensory, or introspective content, we may say it is an extrovertive experience. There are, then, mystical extrovertive experiences, as in one’s mystical consciousness of the unity of nature overlaid onto one’s sense perception of the world, as well as non-unitive numinous extrovertive experiences, as when experiencing God’s presence when gazing at a snowflake. When not extrovertive, we may say an experience is introvertive. An experience of “nothingness” or “emptiness,” in some mystical traditions, and an experience of God resulting from a disengagement from sense experience, would be examples of introvertive experiences (For further elaboration see section 4).

2.2 Dualistic and monistic

A favorite distinction of Western philosophers is between dualistic and monistic experiences. A dualistic experience maintains a distinction, however tenuous, between the subject and what is disclosed. Thus, theistic experiences are ordinarily dualistic, retaining, at some level, a distinction between God and the mystic. Monistic experiences are the extreme of unitive experiences, in that they dissolve all duality. They are either experiences of the absolute ontological oneness of everything, so that in a deep sense the distinctions are illusory, or are pure conscious experiences.

2.2.1 Union with God

“Union” with God signifies a rich family of experiences rather than a single experience. “Union” involves a falling away of the separation between a person and God, short of identity. Christian mystics have variously described union with the Divine. This includes Bernard of Clairvaux (1090–1153) describing unification as “mutuality of love,” Henry Suso (1295–1366) likening union with God to a drop of water falling into wine, taking on the taste and color of the wine (Suso, 1953, p. 185), and Jan van Ruysbroeck (1293–1381) describing union as “iron within the fire and the fire within the iron” (see Pike, 1992, Chapter 2, and Mommaers, 2009). Generally, medieval Christian mysticism had at least three stages, variously described, in the union-consciousness: quiet, essentially a prelude to the union with God, full union, and rapture, the latter involving a feeling of being “carried away” beyond oneself (see Pike, 1992, Chapter 1).

2.2.2 Identity with God

Theistic mystics sometimes speak as though they have a consciousness of being fully absorbed into or even identical with God. Examples are the Islamic Sufi mystic al-Husayn al-Hallaj (858–922) proclaiming, “I am God” (see Schimmel, 1975, Chapter 2), and the Jewish kabbalist, Isaac of Acre (b. 1291?), who wrote of the soul being absorbed into God “as a jug of water into a running well.” (see Idel, 1988, p. 67.) Also, the Hasidic master, R. Shneur Zalman of Liady (1745–1812) wrote of a person as a drop of water in the ocean of the Infinite with an illusory sense of individual “dropness.” And, the (heretical) Christian mystic, Meister Eckhart (c. 1260–1327/8) made what looked very much like identity-declarations (see McGinn, 2001 and Smith, 1997). It is still controversial, however, as to when such declarations are to be taken as identity assertions, with pantheistic or acosmic intentions, and when they are perhaps hyperbolic variations on descriptions of union-type experiences.

2.3 Theurgic vs. Non-Theurgic Mysticism

In theurgic (from the Greek theourgia) mysticism a mystic intends to activate the divine in the mystical experience. (See Shaw, 1995, p. 4.) Thus, a Christian mystic who intends to activate God’s grace, is involved in theurgy. Nonetheless, while typically theistic mystics claim experience of God’s activity, many do not claim this to result from their own endeavors, while others refrain from declaring the activation of the divine as the purpose of their mystical life. So they are not involved in theurgic activity. The Jewish Kabbalah is the most prominent form of theurgic mysticism. In it, the mystic aims to bring about a modification in the inner life of the Godhead (see Idel, 1988).

2.4 Apophatic vs. Kataphatic

Apophatic mysticism (from the Greek, “apophasis,” meaning negation or “saying away”) is contrasted with kataphatic mysticism (from the Greek, “kataphasis,” meaning affirmation or “saying with”). Apophatic mysticism, put roughly, claims that nothing positive can be said about objects or states of affairs which the mystic experiences. These are absolutely indescribable, or “ineffable.” The next section deals with the topic of ineffability. So, apophatic theology typically will be negative theology, that we can say only what God is not. Kataphatic mysticism does make claims about what the mystic experiences. Pertaining to God, this means that God can be described by positive terms. Analytic philosophers of mysticism have been working largely with kataphatic conceptions. (But for an exception see Alston 2005 in the Other Internet Resources.)

An example of apophatic mysticism is in the classical Tao text, Tao Te Ching, attributed to Lao Tsu (6th century B.C.E.), which begins with the words, “Even the finest teaching is not the Tao itself. Even the finest name is insufficient to define it. Without words, the Tao can be experienced, and without a name, it can be known.” (Lao Tsu, 1984). Applied to God, apophatic mysticism maintains that the experience of God can be described only by saying what God is not. Pertaining to God, kataphatic mysticism says that God can be described by positive terms. The two need not be exclusive but represent two stages, respectively, in mystical contemplation.

3. The Attributes of Mystical Experience

3.1 Ineffability

William James, (James, 1958, 292–93) deemed “ineffability” or indescribability an essential mark of the mystical. It is not always clear, however, whether it is the experience or its alleged object, or both, that are to be ineffable. A logical problem with ineffability was noted long ago by Augustine, “God should not be said to be ineffable, for when this is said something is said. And a contradiction in terms is created, since if that is ineffable which cannot be spoken, then that is not ineffable which is called ineffable” (Augustine, 1958, pp. 10–11). To say that X is ineffable is to say something about X, which contravenes ineffability. This problem has been raised anew by Alvin Plantinga (Plantinga, 1980, 23–25) and Keith Yandell (Yandell, 1975).

Several responses to this problem are possible for the mystic. One is to avoid speech altogether and remain silent about what is revealed in experience. Mystics, however, have not been very good at this. A second possibility is to say that an ineffable object has no phenomenological properties but has non-phenomenological properties (Jones, 2016). A third is to distinguish first-order from second-order attributions, where “ineffability” is a second-order term solely about first-order terms. To say, then, that something is “ineffable” would be to assert that it could not be described by any first-order terms, “ineffability” not being one of them. A third possibility is to say that “X is ineffable” is really a statement about the term ‘X,’ saying about it that it fails to refer to any describable entity. A fourth possibility lies in the ongoing negation of whatever is said about X, ad infinitum, in an infinite “unsaying” or taking back of what has been said (See Sells, 1994, Chapter 1).

An example of unsaying can be found in the endless negations in some Madyamika and Zen Buddhist meditative consciousness. Since the truth about reality – as it is – lies outside of our conceptualizations of it, we cannot say that truth, only experience it. Hence, when we say, “Reality is not reality,” that is, that reality as it is differs from what we take it to be conceptually, we must also say that “Reality is not - not reality.” Otherwise we will have been caught in conceptualizing about reality (saying about it that it is not what our conceptualizations say it is). We must then immediately negate the latter saying by saying that reality is neither not-reality nor not not-reality. And so on. (See Thich Nhat Hanh, 1994, Chapter 5.) A second, theistic, example of this approach is in the negative theology of (Pseudo) Dionysius (c.500) for whom God was “a most incomprehensible absolute mystery,” about which we can only say what it is not. Such continuing negation points beyond discourse to experience.

A fifth possibility is William Alston’s observation that when mystics talk about ‘indescribability’ they refer to the difficulty of describing in literal terms, rather than by metaphor, analogy, and symbols.(Alston, 1991)

The sixth solution to ineffability would come from Richard Gale (1960) and Ninian Smart (1958, 69) each of whom have argued that ‘ineffability’ is (merely) an honorific title marking the value and intensity of an experience for a mystic. Similarly, Wayne Proudfoot argues that the ineffability-claim is not describing but prescribing that no language system shall be applicable to it, and so serves to create and maintain a protective sense of mystery (Proudfoot, 1985, 125–27). However, experiences of things ineffable exist in art and music (see Gallope 2017), as well as in everyday experience. Think of the impossibility of describing the taste of coffee to someone who has never tasted it. (King, 1988). This diminishes the argument that ascriptions of ineffability are aimed at protective strategies.

Some philosophers think that a stress on ineffability signifies an attempt to consign mysticism to the “irrational,” thus excluding it from more sensible human pursuits. Grace Jantzen has advanced a critique of the emphasis on ineffability as an attempt to remove mystical experiences from the realm of rational discourse, placing them instead into the realm of the emotions (Jantzen, 1995, p. 344). Others have staunchly defended the “rationality” of mysticism against charges of irrationalism (Staal, 1975). The issue of ineffability is thus tied into questions of the epistemic value of mystical experiences, to be discussed below in section 8.

3.2 Paradoxicality

Scholars of mysticism sometimes stress the “paradoxical” nature of mystical experiences. We can discern four relevant senses of ‘paradoxical’: (1) According to its etymology, ‘paradoxical’ refers to what is surprising or “contrary to expectation.” (2) Language can be intentionally ‘paradoxical’ in using a logically improper form of words to convey what is not intended to be logically absurd. This may be for rhetorical effect or because of difficulty in conveying a thought without resort to linguistic tricks. (3) As in philosophy, a ‘paradox’ can involve an unexpected logical contradiction, as in the “Liar Paradox.” (4) Walter Stace sees paradoxality as a universal feature of mystical experiences, equating ‘paradoxality’ with an intended logical contradiction (Stace, 1961, 212. See section 4 below).

Insofar as mystical experience is out of the ordinary, and the unitive quality strange (for ordinary folk, at least), reports of them may very well be surprising or contrary to expectation. (Mystics, though, might in time find their experiences to be expected.) Hence, they may( be paradoxical in sense (1). Reports of mystical experiences may be paradoxical also in sense (2), because at times mystical language does assume logically offensive forms, when actual absurdity may not be intended. However, paradox in this sense occurs less frequently in first-hand reports of mystical experiences and more in second-order mystical systems of thought (Moore, 1973, and Staal, 1975).

There is no good reason for thinking that reports of mystical experience must imply logical absurdity, as in (3) or (4). As we have seen above, while there do occur forms of expression that are contradictory, the contradiction is often removed by the device of “unsaying” or canceling out, which propels the discourse into a non-discursive realm.

The attempt to designate mystical experiences as paradoxical in senses (3) and (4) may result from being too eager to take logically deviant language at its most literal. For example, Zen Buddhism speaks of reaching a state of mind beyond both thought and “no-thought.” However, rather than referring to a middle state, neither thought nor no-thought, often the intention is to point to a state of mind in which striving is absent, and labeling of mental activities ceases. The mind of “no effort” strives neither for thought nor for no-thought. No logical absurdity infects this description. In a different direction, Frits Staal has argued that paradoxical mystical language has been used systematically to make logically respectable claims (Staal, 1975). While mystics use much literal language in describing their experiences (see Alston, 1992, 80–102), the literality need not extend to paradox in senses (3) or (4).

Philosophers have differed over the nature of mystical experiences regarding what extent mystical content is putatively “given” to the mystic or rather constructed by the mystic in accordance with the social-mystical tradition in which he or she is embedded. The next three sections present this debate among philosophers of mysticism.

4. Perennialism

Various philosophers, sometimes dubbed “perennialists,” have attempted to identify common mystical experiences across cultures and traditions (see Huxley, 1945 and Schuon, 1975). Such a position has occurred in psychological studies as well (Taves and Asprem, 2017). Walter Stace’s perennialism has generated much discussion (Stace, 1960, 1961). Stace proposes two mystical experiences found “in all cultures, religions, periods, and social conditions.” He identifies a universal extrovertive experience that “looks outward through the senses” to apprehend the One or the Oneness of all in or through the multiplicity of the world, apprehending the “One” as an inner life or consciousness of the world. The Oneness is experienced as a sacred objective reality, in a feeling of “bliss” and “joy.” Stace’s universal extrovertive experience (or the experienced reality, it is not always clear which) is paradoxical, and possibly ineffable (Stace, 1961, 79).

Secondly, Stace identifies a universal, “monistic,” introvertive experience that “looks inward into the mind,” to achieve “pure consciousness,” that is, an experience phenomenologically not of anything (Stace, 1961, 86). Stace calls this a “unitary consciousness.” Some have called this a “Pure Conscious Event” or “PCE” (Forman, 1993b and 1999. See section 6 below). A PCE consists of an “emptying out” by a subject of all experiential content and phenomenological qualities, including concepts, thoughts, sense perception, and sensuous images. The subject allegedly remains with “pure” wakeful consciousness. Like his extrovertive experience, Stace’s universal introvertive experience involves a blissful sense of sacred objectivity, and is paradoxical and possibly ineffable. Stace considers the universal introvertive experience to be a ripening of mystical awareness beyond the halfway house of the universal extrovertive consciousness. Jones (2018) argues for extrovertive experiences not being merely stunted introvertive ones, but full experiences in their own right. Marshall (2005) has developed a detailed phenomenology of extrovertive experiences.

Stace assimilates theistic mystical experiences to his universal introvertive experience by distinguishing between experience and interpretation. The introvertive experience, says Stace, is the same across cultures. Only interpretations differ. Theistic mystics are pressured by their surroundings, says Stace, to put a theistic interpretation on their introvertive experiences. Ninian Smart also maintained the universality of the monistic experience, arguing that descriptions of theistic mystical experiences reflect an interpretive overlay upon an experiential base common to both theistic and non-theistic experiences (Smart, 1965). The psychologist, Ralph Hood, has argued extensively that psychometric studies provide “strong empirical support” for “the common core thesis” of mystical experience (Hood, 2006).

Stace has been strongly criticized for simplifying or distorting mystical reports (For a summary, see Moore, 1973,) and for failing to properly describe the difference between extrovertive and introvertive experiences (for example, Almond, 1982, chapter 4). For example, Pike criticizes the Stace-Smart position because in Christian mysticism union with God is divided into discernible phases, which find no basis in Christian theology. These phases, therefore, plausibly reflect experience and not forced interpretation (Pike, 1992, Chapter 5).

In contrast to Stace, R. C. Zaehner identified three types of mystical consciousness: (1) a “panenhenic” extrovertive experience, an experience of oneness of nature, one’s self included, (2) a “monistic” experience of an undifferentiated unity transcending space and time, and (3) theistic experience where there is a duality between subject and the object of the experience (Zaehner, 1961). Zaehner thought that theistic experience was an advance over the monistic, since the latter, he thought, expressed a self-centered interest of the mystic to be included in the ultimate.

William Wainwright has described four modes of mystical extrovertive experience: a sense of the unity of nature, of nature as a living presence, a sense that everything transpiring in nature is in an eternal present, and the Buddhist unconstructed experience. Wainwright, like Zaehner, distinguishes two mystical introvertive experiences, one of pure empty consciousness, and theistic experience marked by an awareness of an object in “mutual love” (Wainwright, 1981, Chapter 1).

5. Pure Conscious Events (PCEs)

5.1 The Defenders of Pure Conscious Events

Much philosophical disagreement has taken place over questions concerning PCEs, allegedly an “emptying out” by a subject of all experiential content and phenomenological qualities, including concepts, thoughts, sense perception, and sensuous images. Do such events ever really occur, and if they do, how significant are they in mysticism? Defenders of PCEs depend on alleged references to pure consciousness in the mystical literature. One striking example is the Buddhist philosopher, Paramaartha (499–569), who stated explicitly that all of our cognitions were “conditioned” by our concepts save for the non-sensory “unconditioned” Buddhist experience of emptiness (see Forman, 1989). Another example cited is from the writings of the Christian mystic Meister Eckhart that describe a “forgetting” that abandons concepts and sense experience to sink into a mystical “oblivion” (Forman, 1993a). In addition, Robert Forman has testified to a PCE he himself endured, describing it as an empty consciousness from which one “need not awake” (Forman, 1993b).

5.2 Criticism of the Defense of Pure Conscious Events

Here is a sampling of important criticisms of the defense of Pure Conscious Events (PCEs): (1) Reports of PCEs found in the literature may not be decisive in establishing the occurrence of PCEs. We should suspect the phenomenon of “idealization” in these reports. Idealization occurs when an ideal goal is presented as achieved, when it wasn’t. Whether or not pure consciousness ever occurs, we should suspect it might be presented as though it did because strived for by the mystic. (2) The PCE defenders exaggerate the centrality of complete emptying out in mysticism. It is questionable if it is central in the mainstream of Christian mysticism, for example, where typically the mystic forgets all else only to better contemplate God. Typical is the Christian mystic Jan Ruysbroeck who wrote that emptying oneself is but a prelude to the mystical life of contemplating God through an act of Divine grace (Zaehner, 1961, 170–71). Likewise, the “shedding of corporeality” in early Hasidism was meant, for example, to enable the mystic to contemplate the unified supernal structure of the divine sefirot. And the Zen master, Dogen (1200–1253), wrote about “wrongly thinking that the nature of things will appear when the whole world we perceive is obliterated” (Dogen, 1986, 39). (3) Accordingly, reports of “emptying out” and “forgetting” may refer only to an emptying of ordinary experiential content, making room for an extraordinary content. This accords well with the conception of ayin (nothingness) in Jewish mysticism, which is positively saturated with divine reality (Matt, 1997). Some have claimed that even for Meister Eckhart “emptying out” is having one’s mind on no object other than God, rather than an absolute emptiness of content (Matt, 1997). (4) The Islamic Sufi fana experience (“passing away”) is sometimes described as an unconscious state, and the Sufi might become purely unconscious upon finding God, in wajd (Schimmel, 1975, 178–79). Therefore, an emptying out might sometimes simply be pure unconsciousness. (5) Even if a subject honestly reports on a pure conscious episode, there may have been conceptual events the subject either repressed or experienced in a nebulous way (see Wainwright, 1981, 117–119). These latter simply do not remain for memory.

6. Constructivism

Constructivism stands against perennialism. ‘Constructivism’ underscores the conceptual “construction” of mystical experience. Let us call ‘soft constructivism’ the view that there is no mystical experience without at least some concepts, provided by one’s cultural conditioning, concepts being what “construct” an experience. Let us call ‘hard constructivism’ the view that a mystic’s specific cultural background massively constructs — determines, shapes, or influences — the nature of mystical experiences (See Hollenback, 1996, Jones, 1909, Introduction, and Katz, 1978 and 1983). On the assumption that mystical traditions are widely divergent, hard constructivism entails the denial of perennialism. Soft constructivism is strictly consistent with perennialism, however, since consistent with there being some trans-cultural mystical experience involving concepts common across mystical traditions. Both hard and soft constructivist arguments have been mobilized against the existence of PCEs.

6.1 Soft Constructivist arguments Against PCE Defenders

Here is a sampling of soft constructivist arguments against PCE defenders: (1) PCEs are impossible because of the “kind of beings” that we are (Katz, 1978, 59). It is a fact about humans that we can experience only with the aid of memory, language, expectations, and conceptualizations. Therefore, we cannot have a “pure” awareness, empty of all content. (2) PCEs cannot be “experiences” (see Proudfoot, 1985, Chapter 4, and Bagger, 1999, Chapter 4). We must distinguish, the claim goes, between an “event” and an “experience.” That X has “an experience” E entails that X conceptualizes E. Hence, even if pure conscious events happen to occur, they do not count as “experiences” until the subject conceptualizes them. At that moment, they cease to be “pure consciousness.” (3) A survey of mystical literature shows that typical mystical experiences are conceptual in nature and not empty of concepts. (4) An epistemological objection: Subjects could not know they had endured a PCE. They could not know this during a PCE, because it is supposed to be empty of all conceptual content (Bagger, 1999, 102–3). A subject could not know this by remembering the PCE, since there is supposed to be nothing to observe while it is going on, and hence nothing to remember. Neither could a subject surmise that a PCE had transpired by remembering a “before” and an “after,” with an unaccounted for middle. This would fail to distinguish a PCE from plain unconsciousness. Indeed, it seems to matter little whether a subject who emerges with mystical insights underwent a PCE or was simply unconscious. (5) A second epistemological objection: Suppose a PCE has occurred and that a subject knows that, somehow. Still, there is a problem of the relationship of a PCE to the subsequent claims to knowledge, such as when Eckhart purportedly grounds knowledge of the soul and God as one, in a PCE (see Forman, 1993a). If in a PCE subjects were empty of all experiential content, they could not claim to have had acquaintance of anything (Bagger, 1999, 102–3).

6.2 Criticism of Soft Constructivism

Several objections can be raised against the Soft Constructivist Position:

  1. While our cultural sets shape our ordinary experience, there is no good reason why we could not enjoy experiences on a pre-conceptual level of awareness, especially through a regimen of training. Steven Katz, the author of this argument, notes our “most brutish, infantile, and sensate levels” of experience when we were infants (Katz, 1988, 755). It is hard to see why in principle we could not retrieve such an unconceptualized level of experience.

  2. It makes little difference whether a PCE is called an “experience” or an “event.” A PCE occurs within a wider experience of the subject, including the subject’s coming out of the PCE and assigning it meaning. Let this wider experience be the “experience” under discussion, rather than the PCE alone.

  3. Neuropsychological studies of mystical experience point to the possibility of events of pure consciousness. A theory by Eugene d’Aquili and Andrew Newberg (d’Aquili and Newberg, 1993 and 1999) claims to account for PCEs by reference to occurrences in the brain that cut off ordinary brain activity from consciousness. This theory, if upheld, would provide physiological support for episodes of pure consciousness (for more on this theory see section 8.7.1.)

  4. There need be no problem about mystics knowing they had PCEs. If we accept a reliabilist account of knowledge, a belief is knowledge if produced by a reliable cognitive mechanism (perhaps with some further conditions). In order to have knowledge, a person does not have to be aware of and judge evidence, nor be cognizant of the reliability of the mechanism that produces the knowledge. Hence, “awakening” from (what is in fact) a PCE, if it produces the belief that one has “awakened” from a PCE, could be a reliable cognitive mechanism sufficient for knowing one had had a PCE. If we stick to an evidentialist conception of knowledge, mystics might be able to have evidence they had endured a PCE, though not at the precise time of its occurrence. Here’s how: (a) By hypothesis, a PCE is an event of conscious awareness. (b) A conscious event can have elements one does not note at the time, but recalls afterward. This is especially possible when the recall immediately follows the event. (c) Therefore, it should be possible for a mystic who endures a PCE to recall immediately afterward the very awareness that was present in the PCE, even though that awareness was not an object of consciousness at the time of the PCE. Since the recall takes place just following a PCE, the entire complex becomes enfolded into one recognizable “experience” of the mystic, for which the mystic has evidence.

  5. Defenders of PCEs can champion their epistemological significance, although PCEs are not of anything. Recall that the noetic quality of a mystical experience can come from an acquaintance of states of affairs involving an insight directly, without supervening on acquaintance of any reality (see Section 1.1, clause (5)). In addition, an experience is mystical as long as it allegedly grants such an acquaintance. Neither need the insight be exactly simultaneous with what makes the experience mystical. Hence, a person could undergo a PCE, which then granted acquaintance of states of affairs by a direct insight. The PCE plus the insight would constitute a complex mystical experience that afforded awareness of a state of affairs not otherwise accessible.

6.3 Hard Constructivism against Perennialism

Hard Constructivism’s main argument against any perennialism, not only against defenders of PCEs, may be presented as follows (Katz, 1978):

Premise (A): The conceptual scheme a mystic possesses massively determines, shapes, or influences the nature of the mystical experience.

Premise (B): Mystics of different mystical traditions possess pervasively different conceptual schemes.

Conclusion: Therefore, there cannot be a common experience across cultural traditions. That is, perennialism is false.

The hard constructivist denies the distinction between experience and interpretation, since our conceptual apparatus massively shapes our very experience. Regarding Premise (B), Katz has edited a massive volume with the aim of displaying the stark differences between mystical experiences of different traditions, due to linguistic,cultural, religious, and sociological factors (Katz, 2013).

First cousin to this objection is the objection that theistic experiences in particular are theory-laden, their interpretation as theistic a result of being embedded in a propensity to think theistically. That is why, allegedly, such experiences are rarely reported by those not already theists or in theistic communities. Such experiences, then, are “polluted”by theory (Oppy, 2006,p. 350).

6.4 Criticism of Hard Constructivism

This section summarizes objections against hard constructivism that are not objections to soft constructivism as well.

  1. It seems quite possible for subjects in the first instance to apply “thin” descriptions to experiences, involving only a small part of their conceptual schemes. Only on second thought, perhaps, will they elaborate on their experience in terms of the richness of their home culture. This would be like a physician with a headache, who experiences pain in the first instance just like ordinary folk and only subsequently applies medical terminology to the headache (Compare King, 1988). If so, there is a possibility of common first-instance mystical experiences across cultures, contrary to Premise A.

  2. Premise A is thrown into further doubt by expressions of surprise by mystics-in-training about what they experience (see Gellman, 1997, 145–46 and Barnard, 1997, 127–130), as well as by heretical types of experience occurring with mystics acculturated in orthodox teachings, such as Meister Eckhart and Jacob Boehme (See Stoeber, 1992, 112–113). These illustrate the possibility of getting out from under one’s mystical background to have new experiences. Likewise, hard constructivism’s inherently conservative take on mysticism will struggle to explain transformations within mystical traditions, and cannot easily account for innovative geniuses within mystical traditions. George Wall has replied regarding religious experience by pointing out how individualistic such experiences can be. A person might have a Jesus experience at one time and a Buddhist one at another time (Wall, 1995, p. 302).

  3. Two people walk together down the street and see an approaching dog. One experiences the dog as “Jones’s favorite black terrier that came in second in last year’s competition,” while the other experiences it as “a stray mutt that the dog-catchers should take away.” Because of the excessive conceptual differences in their experiencing, the constructivist would have to insist that there was no worthwhile sense in which both dog-sighters had the same experience. However, there is an interesting sense in which they are having the same experience: seeing that black dog at that place, at that time. Similarly, there might exist an interesting commonality of experiences across mystical traditions, most plausibly theistic ones, despite conceptual disparity. The conceptual differences might not be sufficient to deny this important commonality (see Wainwright, 1981, 25).

  4. Specific cultural conditioning does not influence everyone to the same degree and in the same way. Individuals have rich and varied personal histories that influence their experiential lives in widely differing ways. Some accept cultural restraints gladly; others rebel against them; still others are blessed with a creative spirit, etc. A “fat people must drive fat cows” approach to mysticism fails to mirror the complex human phenomenon of acculturation.

  5. Mystical traditions characteristically involve disciplines aimed at loosening the hold of one’s conceptual scheme on subsequent experience. Techniques practiced for years promote a pronounced inhibition of ordinary cognitive processes, sometimes called “deautomization” (Deikman, 1980). This plausibly restricts the influence of one’s cultural background on one’s mystical experiences, in turn making possible identical experiences across mystical traditions.

  6. The hard constructivist over-emphasizes the influence of pre-mystical religious teaching on the mystic’s experience. Mystical experiences can circle around and reinvent meaning for the doctrines. An example is the Jewish Kabbalistic transformation of the notion of mitzvah (“commandment”) to that of “joining” or “connection” with God. Starting with commandment, the mystic ends up with devekut, “clinging” to God.

  7. Hard Constructivism fails to account well for widely differing mystical understandings of the same religious text. For example, the Hindu text, The Brahma Sutra, is monistic for Shankara (788–820), a “qualified dualism” for Ramanuja (c. 1055–1137), and yet again a strict dualism, for Madhva (1199–1278) (see Radhakrishnan, Introduction, 1968). Likewise, the teaching of emptiness in the Buddhist text the Prajnaparamita Hrydaya Sutra (The Heart Sutra), receives quite disparate unpacking in different streams of Buddhism. It’s plausible to conclude that distinct experiences were responsible, at least in part, for these differences.

On the one hand, talk about mystical experiences “the same” across all mystical traditions should be taken with a tablespoon of salt, if scholars claim to have discovered them solely from isolated descriptions of experiences. It is difficult to assess the nature of an experience without attending to how it “radiates” out into the structure of the local mystical theory and life of which it is a part (See Idel, 1997). Nevertheless, it does seem possible to generalize about experiences “similar enough” to be philosophically interesting.

7. Inherentists vs. Attributionists

“Inherentists” believe that there are experiences inherently religious or mystical. These experiences come with their religious or mystical content built in as would redness be built in to a sense experience. Attributionists believe that there are no inherently religious or mystical experiences. There are only deemed religious by the subject or a group. Among their ranks is to be counted William James. A leading attributionist, Ann Taves, contends that first people or groups will have experiences of what strikes them as being “special.” Only then, depending on various factors will they attribute a religious or mystical meaning to them. (Taves, 2009) Some neuropsychological studies seem to support this position. (Azari, et al, 2001). Taves is thus as much an anti-constructivist as she is anti-inherentist. The constructivist sees religious or mystical experiences to be constituted from the very start by cultural conditioning. The attributionist denies this, in favor of a tiered or “block-building” approach from experiencing something “special” to a religious or mystical conclusion. William Forgie has argued, as would an attributionist, that there could not be an experience “of God,” if we understand experience “of X” to mean that it is phenomenologically given that the experience is of X (Forgie, 1984, 1994). Forgie argues that phenomenological content can consist of general features only, and not features specifically identifying God as the object of experience. He compares this to your seeing one of two identical twins. Which one of the two you perceive cannot be a phenomenological given. Likewise, that you experience precisely God and not something else cannot be a phenomenological datum. Nelson Pike argues, against Forgie, that the individuation of an object can be a component of the phenomenological content of an experience, drawing on examples from sense perception (Pike 1992, Chapter 7).

Both philosophers restrict experiences of God to phenomenal content somehow analogous to sense perception. This might be a mistake. Consider, for example, that God could appear to a person mystically, and at the same time transmit, telepathy-like, the thought that this was God appearing. Imagine further that this thought had the flavor of being conveyed to one from the outside, rather than as originating in the subject. The thought that “This is God appearing” would be part of the phenomenological content of the subject’s present (complex) experience (though not part of the mystical mode of the experience as defined in section 1.1), and yet not be the product of an interpretation by the subject.

8. Epistemology: The Doxastic Practice Approach and the Argument from Experience

In his celebrated, The Varieties of Religious Experience (London 1925, p. 415), Williams James, asked, “Do mystical states establish the truth of those theological affections in which the saintly life has its roots?” This question can be divided into two: (Q1) Is a person warranted in thinking that his or her experiences are veridical or have evidential value? And (Q2) Are “we,” who do not enjoy mystical experiences, upon examining the evidence of such experiences, warranted in thinking them veridical or endowed with evidential value? While related, these questions can be treated separately.

The major philosophical reply in the affirmative to (Q1) may be called the “Doxastic Practice Approach.” The major defense of an affirmative reply to (Q2) may be called the “Argument from Experience.”

8.1 The Doxastic Practice Approach

William Alston has defended beliefs a person forms based on mystical and numinous (in the terminology of this entry) experience, specifically of a theistic kind (Alston, 1991, 100). Alston defines a ‘doxastic practice’ as consisting of socially established ways of forming and epistemically evaluating beliefs (the “output”) from a certain kind of content from various inputs, such as cognitive and perceptual ones (Alston, 1991, 100, Alston 2005, chapters 9–11). The practice is beholden to an “over-rider system” which is a background system of beliefs against which beliefs supported by the practice are checked for possible over-riders. The practice of forming physical-object beliefs based on sense perception is an example of a ‘doxastic practice’ and the practice of drawing deductive conclusions from premises is another. Now, Alston argues that the justification of every doxastic practice is “epistemically circular,” that is, its reliability cannot be established in any way independent of the practice itself (see Alston, 1993). This includes the “sense-perception practice.” However, we cannot avoid engaging in doxastic practices. Therefore, Alston contends, it is a matter of practical rationality to engage in the doxastic practices we do engage in providing there is no good reason to think they are unreliable.

Now, there are doxastic practices consisting of forming beliefs about God, God’s purposes for us, and the like, grounded on religious and mystical experiences such as “God is now appearing to me.” Such, for example, is the “Christian Doxastic Practice.” This practice has an over-rider system consisting of scriptures and Christian dogma. The over-rider system also includes guidelines resulting from the past history of the mystical Christian Doxastic Practice. It follows from Alston’s argument that it is rational for a person in such a practice to take its belief outputs as true unless the practice is shown to be unreliable. Thus we have an affirmative answer to question (Q1).

Most objections to Alston are equally objections to the Argument from Experience (to be presented below) or come from general epistemological complaints. The latter will not occupy us here. Objections that apply to Alston only, include Jonathan Kvanvig’s faulting of Alston for a loose employment of “rationality.” Kvanvig argues that no one meaning of that term can do the work Alston does with it (Kvanvig, 1994). Another objection is that Alston moves from “It is practically rational to engage in a Christian doxastic practice” to: “It is rational for me to believe the Christian doxastic practice is reliable.” However, it is quite possible to be practically rational to engage in a doxastic practice while failing to believe it is reliable. This was David Hume’s attitude to sense perception. Hume could not help engaging in the sense-perception practice, and thought it was practically rational to do so. But it was not the case that Hume thought the sense-perception practice reliable (Matthias Steup, 1997).

Others argue that there is a problem with the construction of the over-rider system of the Christian mystical practice. This is because the guidelines gleaned from the history of the practice, so it is argued, were compromised by androcentric bias and outdated scientific beliefs. These detract from the practice’s epistemic legitimacy (Gellman, 2011). (See Section 9 below.) It is also a question whether the Christian doxastic practice approach is able to justify conversion experiences. In such experiences the subject is not yet Christian and cannot employ the Christian over-rider system when becoming convinced to accept the Christian practice and its over-rider system.

8.2 The Argument from Experience

Various philosophers have defended the evidential value, to one degree or another, of some religious and mystical experiences, principally with regard to experiences of God (see Baillie, 1939, Broad, 1953, Davis, 1989, Gellman, 1997 and 2001a, Gutting, 1982, Swinburne, 1991 and 1996, Wainwright, 1981, and Yandell, 1993). These philosophers have stressed the “perceptual” nature of experiences of God. We can summarize the approach as follows:

  1. Experiences of God have a subject-object structure, with a phenomenological content allegedly representing the object of the experience. Also, subjects are moved to make truth claims based on such experiences. Furthermore, there are mystical procedures for getting into position for a mystical experience of God (see Underhill, 90–94), and others can take up a suitable mystical path to try to check on the subject’s claims (see Bergson 1935, 210). In all these ways, experiences of God are perceptual in nature.

  2. Such experiences count as (at least some) evidence in favor of their own validity. That a person seems to experience some object is some reason to think he or she really does have experiential contact with it. So, experiences of God count as (at least some) evidence in favor of their own validity.

  3. Agreement between experiences of people in different places, times, and traditions, enhances the evidence in favor of their validity (see Broad, 1953). Hence, agreement about experiences of God in diverse circumstances enhances the evidence in their favor.

  4. Further enhancement of the validity of a religious or mystical experience can come from appropriate consequences in the life of the person who had the experience, such as increased saintliness (See Wainwright, 1981, 83–88).

  5. (1)–(4) yield initial evidence in favor of the validity of (some) experiences of God.

Kai-Man Kwan has developed this type of argument further by specifying theistic experience, in particular, as a “well-established type of experience.” The tokens of such a type of experience occur to many people and on repeated occasions, have a common ontology, and are communicable in a coherent conceptual framework. This strengthens an argument from experience for theistic experience (Kwan, 2012, p. 511).

Whether any experiences of God are veridical in the final reckoning will depend on the strength of the initial evidential case, on other favorable evidence, and on the power of counter-considerations against validity. Defenders of the Argument from Experience differ over the strength of the initial evidential case and have defended the staying power of the Argument against counter-evidence to varying degrees. All agree, however in advancing a positive answer to question (Q2).

8.3 A Critique: Disanalogies to Sense Experience

Several philosophers have argued against either the doxastic practice approach or the Argument from Experience, or both (see Bagger 1999, Fales, 1996a, 1996b, and 2001, Gale, 1991, 1994, and 1995, C.B. Martin, 1955, Michael Martin, 1990, Proudfoot, 1985, and Rowe, 1982). Here the focus will be on objections related specifically to mystical and numinous experience, rather than to general epistemological complaints,

Philosophers have disputed the Argument from Experience on the grounds of alleged disanalogies between experiences of God and sense perception. Two issues must be examined: (a) whether the disanalogies exist, and (b) if they do exist, whether they are epistemologically significant.

8.3.1 Lack of Checkability

The analogy allegedly breaks down over the lack of appropriate crosschecking procedures for experiences of God. With sense perception, we can crosscheck by employing inductive methods to determine causally relevant antecedent conditions; can “triangulate” an event by correlating it with other effects of the same purported cause; and can discover causal mechanisms connecting a cause to its effects. These are not available for checking on experiences of God. Evan Fales argues that “crosscheckability” is an integral part of any successful perceptual epistemic practice. Therefore, the perceptual epistemic practice in which mystical experiences of God are embedded is severely defective (Fales, 200) In addition, Richard Gale (1991), argues that in experiences of God there is missing agreement between perceivers as well as the possibility of checking whether the perceiver was in the “right” position and psychological and physiological state for a veridical experience. For similar reasons, C.B. Martin concludes that claims to have experienced God are “very close” to subjective claims like “I seem to see a piece of paper” rather than to objective claims like “I see a piece of paper” (C.B. Martin, 1955).

William Rowe observes that God may choose to be revealed to one person and not to another. Therefore, unlike with sense perception, the failure of others to have an experience of God under conditions similar to those in which one person did, does not impugn the validity of the experience. Therefore, we have no way of determining when an experience of God is delusory. If so, neither can we credit an experience as authentic (Rowe, 1982).

8.3.2 God’s Lack of Space-Time Coordinates

Some philosophers have argued that there could never be evidence for thinking a person had perceived God (Gale, 1994 and 1995, and Byrne, 2001). For there to be evidence that a person experienced an object O, and did not have just an “O-ish-impression,” it would have to be possible for there to be evidence that O was the common object of different perceptions (not necessarily simultaneous with one another). This, in turn, would be possible only if it were possible to distinguish perceptions of O, specifically, from possible perceptions of other objects that might be perceptually similar to O. This latter requirement is possible only if O exists in both space and time. Space-time coordinates make it possible to distinguish O from objects of similar appearance existing in other space-time coordinates. God, however, does not exist in both space and time. Therefore, there could never be evidence that a person had experienced God.

8.4 Evaluation of the Disanalogy arguments

Although Alston defends the perceptual character of mystical experiences of God for his doxastic practice approach, there is no restriction to the perceptual on the inputs of a doxastic practice. Any cognitive input will do. Hence, disanalogies between experiences of God and sense perception, even if great, would not be directly harmful to this approach (Alston, 1994).

Regarding the bearing of the alleged disanalogies on the Argument from Experience, the disanalogists take the evidential credentials of sense perception as paradigmatic for epistemology. They equate confirming and disconfirming evidence with evidence strongly analogous to the kind available for sensory perception. However, the evidential requirement should be only “confirming empirical evidence,” be what it may. If God-sightings have confirming evidence, even if different from the kind available for sense perception, they will then be evidentially strengthened. If God-sightings do not have much confirming empirical evidence, be it what it may, they will remain unjustified for that reason, and not because they lack crosschecks appropriate to sense perception.

Perhaps the disanalogy proponents believe that justification of physical object claims should be our evidential standard, because only where crosschecks of the physical object kind are available do we get sufficient justification. However, our ordinary physical object beliefs are far over-supported by confirming evidence. We have extremely luxurious constellations of confirming networks there. Hence, it does not follow that were mystical claims justified to a lesser degree than that, or not by similar procedures, that they would be unjustified.

A problem with the argument from God’s lack of dimensionality is that the practice of identifying physical objects proceeds by way of an interplay between qualitative features and relative positions to determine both location and identity. The judgments we make reflect a holistic practice of making identifications of place and identity together. There is no obvious reason why the identification of God cannot take place within its own holistic practice, with its own criteria of identification, not beholden to the holistic practice involved in identifying physical objects (See Gellman, 2001a, Chapter 3, for a sketch of such a holistic practice). We should be suspicious of taking the practice of identifying physical objects as paradigmatic for all epistemology.

8.5 The Argument from Experience as Dependent on the Doxastic Practice Approach

In the end, the Argument from Experience might have to yield to the Doxastic Practice Approach. One reason is that it is doubtful if many experiencers of God make truth claims solely on the basis of their mystical experiences, rather than within a doxastic practice. For example, as Rowan Williams has commented concerning Teresa of Avila, she would never have imagined that her experiences alone were sufficient evidence for any truth. The criterion of authenticity for her experiences was how they related to subsequent concrete behavior, as judged by and within her religious practice. Mystical experience as such was given no special authority. Nelson Pike writes similarly about John of the Cross that John thought that, “The private experiences of individual mystics have no value whatsoever as sources of information”, and that “To treat them as such is to risk a variety of pitfalls of considerable threat to the spiritual life” (Pike, 1986, p. 16).

A second reason why the Argument from Experience might have to yield to the Doxastic Practice Approach is that if, as noted in section 8.4, identification of God takes place in an holistic practice, then quite plausibly this is a social practice in which one judges one’s mystical experiences to be of God. Turning again to the example of Teresa, her experiences in themselves did not always give her assurance that she was not experiencing the Devil rather than God. She adjudicated the issue from within the teachings of the Church. Finally, it is an open question to what extent alleged God-experiences are sufficiently detailed to provide grounds to the subject that they are of God. Hence, a subject’s judgment that a particular encounter is with God might well be the fruit of assimilating the present event into a larger social practice. Recently, Gellman has argued that the Argument from Experience might just collapse into the doxastic practice approach (Gellman, 2008).

8.6 A Critique: Religious Diversity

A critique of the Argument from Experience for the epistemic value of theistic experiences comes from the facts of religious diversity. This critique applies to non-theistic experiences as well. In the history of religions, we find innumerable gods, with different characteristics. Shall we say they all exist? Can belief in all of them be rational? (Hick, 1989, 234–5) In addition, there are experiences of non-personal ultimate realities, such as the Nirguna Brahman of Indian religions. Nirguna Brahman cannot be an ultimate reality if God is (Hick, 1984, 234–5). The Argument from Experience cannot work for both, so works for neither. Furthermore, different theistic faiths claim experience of the one and only God, ostensibly justifying beliefs that are in contradiction with one another (see Flew, 1966, 126). If the Argument from Experience leads to such contradictory results, it cannot provide evidence in favor of the validity of experiences of God.

In reply to this objection, straight away we can discount experiences of polytheistic gods because of their being embedded in bizarre, fantastic settings, and because of the relative paucity of reports of actual experiences of such beings. Regarding clashing experiences within theistic settings, Richard Swinburne has proposed an ascent to generality as a harmonizing mechanism. Swinburne believes that conflicting descriptions of objects of religious experience pose a challenge only to detailed claims, not to general claims of having experienced a supernal being (Swinburne, 1991, 266).

John Hick has proposed a “pluralistic hypothesis” to deal with the problem of religious diversity (Hick, 1984, Chapter 14). According to the pluralistic hypothesis, the great world faiths embody different perceptions and conceptions of one reality that Hick christens “the Real.” The Real itself is never experienced directly, but has “masks” or “faces” which are experienced, depending on how a particular culture or religion thinks of the Real. The Real itself is, therefore, neither personal nor impersonal, these categories being imposed upon the Real by different cultural contexts. Hence, the typical experiences of the major faiths are to be taken as validly of the Real, through mediation by the local face of the Real.

Hick has been criticized for infidelity to the world’s religious traditions. However, we should understand Hick to be providing a theory about religions rather than an exposition of religions themselves would endorse (for criticism of Hick see Gavin d’Costa, 1987). Some propose harmonizing some conflicting experiences by reference to God’s “inexhaustible fullness” (Gellman, 1997, Chapter 4). In at least some mystical experiences of God, a subject experiences what is presented as proceeding from an intimation of infinite plenitude. Given this feature, a claim to experience a personal ultimate, for example, can be squared with an experience of an impersonal ultimate: one “object,” identified as God or Nirguna Brahman, can be experienced in its personal attributes or in its impersonal attributes, from out of its inexhaustible plenitude.

Whether any of these solutions succeed, the body of experiential data is too large for us to simply scrap on the grounds of contradictory claims. We should endeavor to retain as much of the conflicting data as possible by seeking some means of conciliation.

8.7 A Critique: Naturalistic explanations

Bertrand Russell once quipped that “We can make no distinction between the man who eats little and sees heaven and the man who drinks much and sees snakes. Each is in an abnormal physical condition, and therefore has abnormal perceptions” (Russell, 1935, 188). C.D. Broad wrote, to the contrary, “One might need to be slightly ‘cracked’ in order to have some peep-holes into the super-sensible world” (Broad, 1939, 164). Thus is the issue engaged whether we can explain away religious and mystical experiences by reference to naturalistic causes.

Wainwright has argued that a naturalistic explanation is compatible with the validity of an experience since God could bring about an experience through a naturalistic medium (Wainwright, 1981, Chapter 2). However, we should take into account that there might be naturalistic explanations that would make it implausible that God would appear in just those ways (this is elaborated in section 8.7.2).

Various psychological naturalistic explanations of religious and mystical experience have been offered, including pathological conditions such as: hypersuggestibility, severe deprivation, severe sexual frustration, intense fear of death, infantile regression, pronounced maladjustment, and mental illness, as well as non-pathological conditions, including the inordinate influence of a religious psychological “set” (see Davis, 1989, Chapter 8, and Wulff, 2000). In addition, some have advanced a sociological explanation for some mysticism, in terms of the socio-political power available to an accomplished mystic (Fales, 1996a, 1996b).

Naturalistic proposals of these kinds exaggerate the scope and influence of the cited factors, sometimes choosing to highlight the bizarre and eye-catching at the expense of the more common occurrences. Secondly, some of the proposals, at least, are perfectly compatible with the validity of experiences of God. For example, a person’s having a religious psychological set can just as well be a condition for enjoying and being capable of recognizing an experience of God, as it can be a cause of delusion.

8.7.1 Neuropsychological Explanations

Neuropsychological research has been conducted to look for unique brain processes involved in religious and mystical experiences, resulting in a number of competing theories (see Wulff, 2000). The “explaining away” enters when one claims that “It’s all in the head.” d’Aquili and Newberg (d’Aquili and Newberg 1993 and 1999), propose the prefrontal area of the brain as the locus of special brain activity during mystical episodes. Through “deafferentiation,” or cutting off of neural input to that area of the brain, they claim, an event of pure consciousness occurs. The patterns set up in the brain create an overwhelming experience of “absolute unitary being.” If reinforcement of a certain hypothalamic discharge then occurs, this will prolong the feeling of elation, and will be interpreted as an experience of God. Otherwise, there will arise a deep peacefulness due to the dominance of specified hypothalamic structures. This gets interpreted as an experience of an impersonal, absolute ground of being. The theory associates numinous experiences with variations in deafferentiation in various structures of the nervous system, and lesser religious experiences with mild to moderate stimulation of circuits in the lateral hypothalamus. The latter generate religious awe: a complex of fear and exaltation (see d’Aquili and Newberg, 1993, 195). The brain functions in related ways in aesthetic experience as well (d’Aquili and Newberg, 2000).

The authors themselves do not say their theory shows there to be nothing objective to mystical or religious experience. However, they do recommend explaining away objective differences between, for example, theistic and non-theistic experiences. And their theory could be utilized in a “It’s all in the head” strategy.

Batson, Schoenrade and Ventis (1993) maintain (comparing religious experiences to creative problem solving) that a person who has a religious experience faces an existential crisis, and attempts to solve it within fixed cognitive structures, which are embedded in the brain’s left-hemisphere. This yields no solution. The person may then undergo a transforming religious experience, in which the brain temporarily switches from left-hemisphere to right-hemisphere dominance, from verbal/conceptual thinking to non-verbal insight “beyond” the person’s dominant conceptual structure. The switch then reverberates back to restructure the left-hemisphere conceptual network, now made apt for dealing with the existential crisis. The right-hemisphere switch can account for the sense of ‘ineffability,’ since the right hemisphere is not analytic or verbal (See Fenwick 1996 and Michael Persinger et al. 1994). Because the shift involves “transcending” the cognitive, it may explain the conviction of having contact with a “transcendent realm.” If offered as a naturalistic “explaining away,” this theory would imply that what a person thinks is an experience of God, say, is really an experience of temporary right-hemisphere dominance. The theory has the drawback, however, of applying only to conversion experiences, and not to other religious and mystical episodes.

Other theories that have attracted attention include one focusing on anomalous features of the temporal lobes of the brain, the locus for epileptic conditions (Persinger, et al 1987). One study even claims to have discovered a correlation between temporal lobe epilepsy and sudden conversion experiences (Dewhurst and Beard, 1970). James Austin, a neurologist and himself a Zen practitioner, has developed a theory of brain transformations for prolonged Zen meditative practice (Austin, 1998). The theory is based on gradual, complex changes in the brain, leading to a blocking of our higher associative processes. Austin believes that the Zen kensho experience, according to Austin an experience of reality “as it is in itself,” is an experience with (relatively) shut down neural activity. McNamara advances that the amygdala creates religious experience, including mystical experience, and implicates the prefrontal cortex where religious excitement can be stimulated. (McNamara,2009, 93 and 109) Other theories exist as well. For a review and good explanation of this topic see (Schjoedt, 2009, esp. 325–327)

8.7.2 Evaluation of Neuropsychological Explanations

The variety of neuropsychological theories shows that the entire project is in its infancy. The great variety counts against accepting any one theory at this time. (Jones, 2016). In addition, methods involved in deriving Neuropsychological explanations have been attacked as inadequate. This is especially true of the theories, respectively, of Persinger and of d’Aquili and Newberg (See Jones, 2016, 149–151; Sloan, 2006). Also, we must be careful to determine what the researcher’s conception is of mystical experience.

A neuropsychological theory can do no more than relate what happens in the brain when a mystical or religious experience occurs. It cannot tell us that the ultimate cause for a theory’s favored brain-events was altogether internal to the organism. On the other hand, such a theory could help rule out cases of suspected deception and block the identification of mystical experiences with mere emotion. True, there may not be out-of-brain “God-receptors” in the body, analogous to those for sensory perception, which might reinforce a suspicion that it’s all in the head. However, out-of-brain receptors are neither to be expected nor required with non-physical stimuli, as in mystical experiences. God, for example, does not exist at a physical distance from the brain. Furthermore, God could act directly upon the brain to bring about the relevant processes for a subject to perceive God.

On the other hand, a neuropsychological theory would put pressure on claims to veridical experiences, if it could point to brain processes implausibly grounding a veridical experience. The implausibility would flow from a being of God’s nature wanting to make itself known by just that way. Suppose, for (an outlandish) example, researchers convinced us that all and only alleged experiencers of God had a brain-defect caused only by a certain type of blow to the shoulder to people with a genetic propensity to psoriasis, and that the area of the defect was activated in the experiences. This might not prove that experiences of God were delusory, but would raise serious doubts. It is too early in the research, however, to say that implausible brain conditions have been found for experiences of God.

8.7.3 The Claimed Superiority of Naturalistic Explanation

Some philosophers have argued that because the “modern inquirer” assumes everything ultimately explicable in naturalistic terms, in principle we should reject any supernatural explanation of mystical and religious experience (see Bagger, 1999). Invoking God to explain mystical experiences is like invoking miracles to explain natural phenomena. We should match our elimination of miracles from our explanatory vocabulary with an elimination of a supernatural explanation of mystical experiences of God. Hence, we do not have to wait until we discover a live alternative explanation to the theistic explanation of mystical experiences of God. We should resist a theistic explanation in the name of our epistemic standards. Hence, we should reject both the doxastic practice approach and the Argument from Experience.

This argument raises the important question of the relationship between theistic explanation and a naturalistic program of explanation. Various theistic philosophers have attempted to square special divine activity with a modern scientific understanding of the world (see for example, Swinburne, 1989 and Plantinga, 2011). Whether they have succeeded is a question beyond the scope of the present essay, however. Of course, a person for whom supernatural explanation is not a live option would have reason to reject the Argument from Experience and refuse to engage in a doxastic practice of identifying valid God-experiences. However, most defenders of the Argument from Experience advance it at best as a defensible line of reasoning, rather than as a proof of valid experiences of God that should convince anyone, and the doxastic practice approach is not meant to convince everybody to participate in a theistic doxastic practice (see Gellman, 2001b).

8.8 The Rainbow of Experience

Kai-Man Kwan has significantly expanded the Argument from Experience in a way that avoids from the start several objections to that argument (Kwan, 2011). Kwan argues for what he calls a “holistic empiricism,” which considers an array of dimensions of human experience: the noetic – consisting of epistemic seemings; the qualitative – the feel or tenor of what it is like to have the experience; and the volitional, of action, choice, deliberation, and the like. Kwan argues that when judging the credentials of religious experience, we should take into account the following experiences, in addition to narrowly selected religious experience: experiences of the natural world, of the self, existential experience, interpersonal experience, moral experience, aesthetic experience, and intellectual experience.

Kwan argues that the integration, in the appropriate way, of these types of experience coherently and fruitfully constitutes a defeasible justification for relying on the product of religious belief. Kwan argues in this way for theistic belief in particular. A similar argument is forthcoming for judging narrowly construed mystical experience. The unit of justification of believing a proposition when having had a mystical experience would be the entire holistic complex of the mystic’s experience. Going beyond, but including, discrete mystical episodes, the mystic is able to fashion a cumulative case for mystical conclusions.

If Kwan’s argument is sound, it avoids the objection based on dissimilarities between mystical and religious experiences, narrowly considered,on the one side, and sense experience on the other. The unit of justification, it turns out, encompasses far more than the mystical experience itself. Kwan also seems to neutralize objections from neuroscience against the validity of mystical experiences. Belief in the deliverances of mystical experience will seek justification far beyond what can be possibly identified with a discrete, local brain analogue to the mystical experience itself.

9. Mysticism, Religious Experience, and Gender

Some feminist philosophers have criticized what they perceive as the androcentric bias of male philosophers of mysticism. There are three main objections: (1) Contemporary male philosophers treat mysticism as most centrally a matter of the private psychological episodes of a solitary person. Philosophers believe these private experiences reveal the meaning and value of mysticism (Jantzen, 1994 and 1995). Instead, philosophers should be studying the socio-political ramifications of mysticism, including its patriarchal failings. Sarah Coakley maintains that the focus of mysticism should be on the ongoing contemplative practice and all that entails. (Coakley 2009). (2) At times. scholars of mysticism have systematically ignored or marginalized much of women’s mysticism. Closer attention to women would reveal the androcentric bias in male mysticism (Jantzen, 1995). Nancy Caciola (2000, 2003) argues that the criteria the Church developed for authentic mystical experiences curtailed the power of women in the Church. For example, on the basis of theories about female physiology, women were deemed more vulnerable to devil possession than men. Hence one was to be more suspicious that women are devil-possessed, and not God-possessed, than about men. More recently, Coakley notes that while some analytic philosophers attend to the mysticism of Teresa of Avila, they do not do justice to the content of her mystical writings, picking out experiences only. (3) The traditional male construction of God has determined the way male philosophers think of theistic experience. Thus, theistic experience is conditioned from the outset by patriarchal conceptualizations and values, and by sex-role differentiation in the practice of religion (Raphael, 1994). Typically, the view states, men understand theistic experience as a human subject encountering a being wholly distinct, distant, and overpowering. A paradigm of this approach is Rudolf Otto’s “numinous experience,” of a “wholly other” reality, unfathomable and overpowering, engendering a sense of dreaded fascination. The mystic is “submerged and overwhelmed” by his own nothingness (Otto, 1957). Otto claims that this is the foundational experience of religion. This approach, it is claimed, is mediated by the androcentrism of Otto’s worldview, entrapped in issues of domination, atomicity, and submission. Some feminist thinkers deny the dichotomy between the holy and the creaturely that makes Otto’s analysis possible (see Daly, 1973 and Goldenberg, 1979). Feminist theologians stress the immanent nature of the object of theistic experience, and bring to prominence women’s experience of the holy in their fleshly embodiment, denigrated by androcentric attitudes.

Feminists have entered the debate on constructivism and mystical experience by supporting the constructivist position (Lanzetta, 2005, especially Chapter One). They do so in the name of anti-essentialism and diversity of experience. The thinking that there is a common, unconstructed, essence to mystical experience has worked against the recognition of women’s experiences as properly mystical.

The feminist critique poses a welcome corrective to undoubted androcentric biases in mysticism and mystical studies. The feminist critique should help neutralize the conception of the solely private nature of mysticism and religious experience, introduced to philosophy largely by William James. Objection (2) has begun to bring about a welcome change with scholarship dedicated to women’s mysticism and its significance (see for example, Hurcombe, 1987, Brunn and Epiney-Burgard, 1989, Beer, 1993, and Borchert, 1994). Several collections on women mystics have helped change the over-emphasis on men mystics. (See, for a good example, Furlong, 2013.) Regarding (3), we must distinguish between Otto’s androcentric claim that his type of numinous experience constitutes religious experience at its most profound, and the rich variegation of religious and mystical experience of men throughout history. This includes men’s experiences of God’s immanent closeness as well as mystical union with God, quite opposite, by feminist lights, to Otto’s numinous experience. The study of gender in religious experience and mysticism has barely begun and promises new insights into and revisions of our understanding of these human phenomena.

10. Mysticism and Morality

Some maintain there is an intrinsic connection between mysticism and moral behavior. This is because mystical experience blurs or erases the distinction between the subject and others (Stace, 1961) and so removes the barrier to moral motivation, or because, as typically in monistic mysticism, the ego disappears entirely (Browning, 1979). Several scholars have argued, to the contrary, that some forms of mysticism are incompatible with morality. (Danto, 1987 and Kripal, 2002). One charge is that a conceptual requirement of morality is the recognition of individuals other than oneself to whom one has obligations and to whom one is to display moral virtues. However, monistic mysticism eliminates all distinctions between one person and others. All are One. Hence, monistic mysticism precludes being moral. Morality must be between “independently real persons.” (Wainwright, 1983, pp. 211–12.) Others argue that morality can get off the ground solely with the ability to conceptualize “the well-being of others” without the need to recognize others as ontologically independent beings. (Zelinski, 2007, Jones, 1993).This leaves open whether this is morality or mock morality since it might be lacking in fundamental moral sentiments. Wainwright, for example, argues that the ideal of detachment, common in monistic mysticism, can be quite detrimental to the self-investment and emotional attachment required in moral commitment and behavior.

David Loy argues that even if monistic morality not be incompatible with morality, it fails to reveal the best way to help people with compassion. (Loy, 2002) Others maintain, more strongly, that there is no intrinsic connection between mystical experience and moral behavior. We need look no further than to Christian complaints about mystical moral excesses, the Mahayana Buddhist rejection of the alleged selfishness of the ideal of the arhat in Theravada Buddhism, or the moral scandals of some Eastern mysticism in the West.(Kripal, 2002). If moral behavior does follow it does not issue from mystical experience but from the mystic’s cultural setting. The mystic must fall back on the normative behavioral standards of the group, standards not derivable from monistic experience. Mystical experience, so the charge goes, in itself is amoral without the addition of cultural guidance. However, it seems that much will depend on the mystical practice meant to lead to mystical experience as to its moral or amoral orientation. The resulting behavior will be a consequence of both the practice undertaken to reach mystical experience and the experience itself. (See Jones, 2016, Chapter 5).

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