Notes to Ludwig Andreas Feuerbach

1. For analyses of philosophical developments in Germany during this period, see Gedö, 1995 and Löwith, 1964.

2. After his brother Anselm’s unexpected death Ludwig assumed the responsibility of editing for publication his father’s Nachlass and selected correspondence. These were published in 1852 under the title, Paul Johann Anselm Ritter von Feuerbachs Leben und Wirken, which reappears as Vol. 12 of the critical edition of Feuerbach’s works edited by Schuffenhauer. The preceding quotation is from a brief lexicon article authored by Ludwig that summarizes the accomplishments of the distinguished jurist and his sons, and can be found on pp. 324-332 in v. 10 of the same critical edition. For a good recent biography of Feuerbach, see Winiger (2004).

3. Shott, 1973, analyzes Feuerbach’s early intellectual development up to the time of this transfer.

4. One of the best discussions of the issues involved in the disintegration of the Hegelian school in to Right, Left, and Center camps is to be found in Toews 1980, 201-369.

5. The phrase appears in the second part of Heine’s essay, Zur Geschichte der Religion und Philosophie in Deutschland (1835).

6. For analyses of Feuerbach’s early pantheistic idealism, see Wartofsky 1977, 28-48, Cornehl 1969 and Gooch 2013, from the latter of which some of the paragraphs in this section have been adapted.

7. A translation of the letter is included in Hegel, 1984.

8. Feuerbach, GW, v. 17, Briefwechsel I (1817-1839), 103-08.

9. For discussions of Feuerbach’s approach to the history of philosophy, see Wartofsky 1977, 49-134, and the essays collected in Jaeschke & Tomasoni 1998.

10. In the second edition of The Essence of Christianity (1843) Feuerbach renamed the two parts of his book “The True or Anthropological Essence of Religion” and “The False or Theological Essence of Religion,” respectively. Eliot’s translation is based in this edition.

11. Here Feuerbach follows Hegel. Cf. Hegel (1991), 56-63 (Enc. § 24).

12. Feuerbach makes this point most explicitly in an unpublished draft of the foreword to The Essence of Christianity, which is quoted at length in Ascheri (1969). See esp. p. 20.

13. Cf. Feuerbach’s preface to the second edition (1843) of The Essence of Christianity, where he specifically mentions Jacobi and Schleiermacher, and remarks that “whoever is unfamiliar with the historical presuppositions and stages of mediation of my book lacks the [necessary] points of access to my arguments and thoughts” (WC, 24/xliii).

14. The decisiveness of this break was called into question with some justification by the Neo-Kantian historian of materialism, Friedrich Albert Lange, who maintained that Feuerbach was never a materialist in the strict sense, and that “It is just the same old [eben doch wieder] philosophy of spirit that we encounter here in the form of a philosophy of sensuality” (Lange 1875, v.2, 74).

15. The most penetrating comparative analysis of the theories of religion contained in The Essence of Christianity and in Feuerbach’s later writings on religion is Harvey (1995).