Notes to Ordinary Objects

1. Cf. van Inwagen (1990: 99–100). See Hawthorne and Cortens (1995), Schaffer (2007: §8, 2010), Cameron (2008: §3, 2010), Dasgupta (2009), and McDaniel (2010: 641–642) for views on which ordinary objects exist but—in one sense or another—are not among the fundamental constituents of reality.

2. The special composition question is due to van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 2); cf. Hestevold (1981). Hossack (2000) and Dorr (2005) defend the microphysicalist version of nihilism. Horgan and Potrč (2000, 2008: Ch. 7) and Rea (2001) defend existence monism. Turner (2011) defends the extreme nihilist view that there are no objects. See Merricks (2001: §1.1), Lowe (2005a: 527–531), Elder (2007: §1, 2011: §6.1), and Williamson (2007: 219) for discussion of the ‘arranged K-wise’ locution. See Sider (1993) and Van Cleve (2008: §2) for problems that arise for nihilists involving the possibility of ‘atomless gunk’. See §2.2, §4.1, and §5 below on possible motivations for nihilism.

3. See Unger (1979a, 1979b, 1980), Heller (1990: §§2.4–5), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: Ch. 5), and Van Cleve (2008: §2). See §2.1, §3.1, §3.2, §4.1, and §6 for possible motivations.

4. See van Inwagen (1990), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997), Merricks (2001: §4.6), and Olson (2007: §§9.4–5).

5. See van Inwagen (1990: 138–140), Zimmerman (1999: 121–122), Merricks (2001: Chs. 4–5), Rea (2001: §2.2), Eklund (2002: §§4–5), and Carroll and Carter (2005) on concerns about the stability of eliminativist views that make an exception for organisms.

6. The example of trout-turkeys is due to Lewis (1991: 7–8). Proponents of universalism include Leśniewski (1916), Leonard and Goodman (1940), Goodman and Quine (1947), Cartwright (1975), Quine (1981a: 10), Thomson (1983: 216–217), Lewis (1986: 212–213, 1991: §1.3), Van Cleve (1986, 2008), Heller (1990: §2.9), Sider (1997: §3.1, 2001a: §4.9), Rea (1998), Hudson (2000, 2001: §3.8), Varzi (2005), Bigelow and Pargetter (2006), Braddon-Mitchell and Miller (2006), and Baker (2007: 191-193). See van Inwagen (1987: 35–40, 1990: 74–79) for a widely-discussed objection to universalism, and see McGrath (1998), Rea (1999), Hudson (2001: 92–95), McDaniel (2001: §5), and Eklund (2002: §7) for replies. For further criticism of universalism, see Rescher (1955), Markosian (1998: 228–229), Olson (2007: 224–225), Comesaña (2008), Elder (2008, 2011: Ch. 7), and Effingham (2011a, 2011b). See §2.2 and §4.1 for possible motivations.

7. The example of klables is due to Shoemaker (1979, 1988: 201). See Sider (1997: §3.3, 2001: §4.9.3) in defense of diachronic universalism; see Balashov (2005, 2007) for criticism. Note that, while many four-dimensionalists accept diachronic universalism, it is not entailed by four-dimensionalism (see Heller 1993) nor is it clear that it entails four-dimensionalism (see Sider 2001a: 138-9, Lowe 2005b, Miller 2005: §3, and Kurtsal Steen: 2010). See §2.2 and §4.1 for possible motivations for diachronic universalism.

8. The example of incars is due to Hirsch (1976: §2, 1982: 32). Advocates of the doctrine of plenitude and related views (absolutism, bazillion-thingism, explosionism, fullness, maximalism) include Sosa (1987: 178–179, 1999: 142–143), Yablo (1987: §3), Fine (1982: 100, 1999: 73), Hawley (2001: 6–7), Bennett (2004: §4), Hawthorne (2006: vii-viii), Johnston (2006: §17), Thomasson (2007: §10.3), and Eklund (2008: §4). See Hirsch (2004b: §1), Eklund (2006: 111–115), and Elder (2011: §1.4) for objections. See §4.1 on possible motivations.

9. Proponents of DAUP include Carter (1983), Zimmerman (1996: §4), and Hudson (2001: 88). For criticism, see van Inwagen (1981) and McDaniel (2007: 138–141). See §4.1 for a possible motivation.

10. Proponents of constitutionalism include Quine (1953: §1), Wiggins (1968), Perry (1970: §5), Kripke (1971: n.19), Doepke (1982, 1996), Fine (1982, 2003, 2008), Lowe (1983), Thomson (1983: §6, 1998), Simons (1987: Ch. 6), Heller (1990: 332–333), Johnston (1992, 2006: §8), Lewis (1993: 167–168), Tye (1996a: 222), Baker (1997, 2007), Hudson (2001: 57–61), McDaniel (2001: §3, 2004: §4), Paul (2002: §5, 2006), Moyer (2006), Thomasson (2006: §4, 2007: Ch. 4), Koslicki (2008), and Crane (forthcoming). See §3.1 and §6 for possible motivations.

11. Lewis (1976: §3), Robinson (1985), Shoemaker (1988: 208), Stalnaker (1988), Fine (2000), Johnston (2006: §§9–10), and Moyer (2008: §3) endorse moderate varieties. Kim (1976: 170), Chisholm (1976: §3.4), Lewis (1993: 179–180), Unger (2004: 203), and Williams (2006) endorse the more radical version. See §3.1, §3.2, and §6 for possible motivations.

12. Arguments of this sort have been advanced by Unger (1979a, 1979b), Wheeler (1979: §3), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4).

13. See Heller (1990: §2.8), Merricks (2001: §2.2), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4).

14. See Sanford (1979: §1), Tye (1990: §3), Elder (2000: §1), Sider (2001a: 188), and Thomasson (2007: §5.3).

15. For further discussion of this style of response, see supervaluationism and its relatives. Defenders of sorites arguments often complain that proponents of this line of response are still committed to some “sharp status transition”, e.g., a sharp transition from a case in which ‘there is a stone’ is true to a case in which it is neither true nor false; see Unger (1979b: 128–130), Heller (1990: §§2.8–10), Williamson (1994: §4.6), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: 25–26). See Williamson (1994: Ch. 6) on the broader repercussions of embracing sorites reasoning.

16. The argument is advanced by Lewis (1986: 212–213), Heller (1990: 50–51), Sider (1997: §3.1, 2001a: §4.9.1), and Van Cleve (2008: §3), all of whom put the argument to work in defense of universalism. See Noonan (2010) on the relationship between Lewis's and Sider's formulations of the argument. See Nolan (2006: 724) on the need for B2. Sider (1997: §3.3, 2001a: §4.9.3) shows how a structurally similar argument can be given for diachronic universalism; see Koslicki (2003: §3) and Balashov (2005: §3) for critical discussion. See Korman (2010a) for a more detailed discussion of the argument from vagueness and possible lines of resistance.

17. See Horgan (1993: §1), Hudson (2001: 22–25), and Sider (2001a: 123–124 and 130–132) against brute compositional facts. See Markosian (1998: §3) for a defense of brute compositional facts, and see his (1998: §5, 2008: §8) on B3.

18. Merricks (2005: §5) and Hawthorne (2006: 106–109) defend this sort of strategy. See Papineau (1993: §4.8) and Tye (1996b) on the possibility of borderline cases of consciousness. See Nolan (2006), Smith (2006), Barnes (2007), and Merricks (2007) for further discussion of B3.

19. See Howard-Snyder (1997: §4) and Sider (1997: 21-22, 2001a: 125–127).

20. Carmichael (2011) defends this line of response. See Gallois (2004: 652), Merricks (2005: §2), Smith (2005: §6), Baker (2007: 130–132), Donnelly (2009: §5), Effingham (2009), Elder (2011: §7.1), and Nolan (forthcoming: §6) for other attempts to resist C1.

21. For discussion of vague quantifiers and vague existence, see van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 19), Hirsch (1999: 149–151, 2000: 42–43, 2002b: 65–66, 2004a: 663, 2008b: 376), Sider (2001a: 128–130, 2003a, 2009a), Hawley (2002), Barnes (2005), Dorr (2005: 248n25), López de Sa (2006), Liebesman and Eklund (2007), Koslicki (2008: 37–40), and Woodward (2011: §5).

22. See Rea (1995) and the entry on material constitution for more detailed discussion of the puzzles and candidate solutions. The example of Lumpl and Goliath is due to Gibbard (1975: §1). See Fine (2003, 2006), Frances (2006), and King (2006) for discussion of versions of the puzzle that turn on putative nonmodal differences.

23. See Heller (1990: §§2.4–7), van Inwagen (1990: 125–127), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.2), Merricks (2001: §2.3), and Olson (2007: §9.4). Van Inwagen puts the puzzles to work in arguments against permissive views like DAUP (1981) and universalism (1987: §6, 1990: 75–80).

24. The grounding problem is advanced by Heller (1990: §2.1), Burke (1992), Sidelle (1992: 288), Zimmerman (1995: §9), Olson (1996: §3, 2001), Hawley (2001: 146–148), and Merricks (2001: 39–40). For responses to the problem, see Sosa (1987: 173–178), Baker (1997: §2), Rea (1997b: §4), Corcoran (1999: 16–17), Lowe (2002), Wasserman (2002), Bennett (2004: §4), Hawley (2006: §4), Moyer (2006: §6.2), Johnston (2006: §9), Paul (2006: §5), Thomasson (2007: §4.4), Fine (2008), Sider (2008), Koslicki (2008: 179–183), deRosset (2011), Einsheuser (2011), and Crane (forthcoming: §5). Bennett (2004) is especially relevant to this entry, since she argues that the grounding problem is best solved by embracing something like the doctrine of plenitude.

25. See Fine (2000, 2008: 106) and Johnston (2006: §§9–10).

26. See Ayers (1974: 128–129), Price (1977), and Jubien (2001: 7) on the first option; Burke (1994) and Rea (2000) on the second; and Lewis (1971, 1986: §4.5), Gibbard (1975: §5), Noonan (1991), and Fara (2008) on the third.

27. The puzzle is closely related to arguments against indeterminate identity from Evans (1979) and Salmon (1981: 243–246). This version of the puzzle of the Ship of Theseus—in which a second ship is constructed from the discarded planks—is due to Hobbes (1655: 11.7).

28. See van Inwagen (1990: 128–135) and Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.4).

29. See Lewis (1988) and Stalnaker (1988: 349–350).

30. See Lewis (1976: §3), Robinson (1985), Simons (1987: §5.5), Shoemaker (1988: 208–209), Stalnaker (1988), and Moyer (2008: §3) for same-kind permissivist responses to these sorts of puzzles. See Hirsch (1999) for a referential-indeterminacy response which is meant to avoid commitment to same-kind permissivism.

31. See Chisholm (1976: Ch. 3), Sider (1996: §2), and Hawley (2001: Ch. 4) on E1; Lowe (1994: 113) on E2; van Inwagen (1990: 251–252) on E3; and Parsons (1987: 8–11) and Thomasson (2007: §5.6) on E4.

32. For a variety of other arguments from arbitrariness for permissivist conceptions, see Cartwright (1975: 158), Ginet (1985: 220–221), Van Cleve (1986: 145), Rea (1998: 354–355), Sosa (1999), Hudson (2001: 108–112), Johnston (2006: §17), and Moyer (2006: 408).

33. See van Inwagen (1981: §3, 1990: 126), Olson (1995: §1), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: 177–178), Rea (2001: §2.2), and Van Cleve (2008: §2) for eliminativist responses to arguments from arbitrariness.

34. See Goodman (1978), Putnam (1981: 52–54), Sidelle (1989, 1992: §7), and Einheuser (2006) for defense of conventionalism.

35. See Shoemaker (1988), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: 178–179), Lowe (2007), and Korman (2010b) for this style of response.

36. See Putnam (1987, 1994), Hawthorne and Cortens (1995: 158–160), and Hirsch (2000: 44, 2002b, 2004b: 135–136,  2011: xi–xvi).

37. See Hirsch (1978: 485), van Inwagen (1981: §3), Yablo (1987: 307), Shoemaker (1988: 209), Heller (1990: 41–42), Hudson (2001: 111), Merricks (2001: 74–75), Sider (2001a: 156–158), Rea (2002: Ch. 4), Nolan (2005: 35), Hawthorne (2006: 109), and Moyer (2008: 408) for such imaginative exercises and debunking arguments. For discussion of debunking arguments as they arise in other domains—for instance, ethics, logic, and the philosophy of religion—see (among others) Plantinga (1993: Ch. 12), Street (2006), Schechter (2010), and White (2010).

38. See Hawthorne (2006: 109), Heller (1990: 43–44), and Sider (2001: 156).

39. See Shoemaker (1988: 209), Hawley (2001: 6–7), Hawthorne (2006: 109), and Thomasson (2007: §10.3) for permissivist treatments.

40. See Hirsch (2004b: §1) on deflationary treatments, and see Sidelle (1989, 1992: §7) for a conventionalist response. See Thomasson (2003: §3), Baker (2007: 46–47), and Korman (2010b: 139) on creative intentions and artifacts.

41. See Rea (2002: Ch. 9).

42. The argument is due to Merricks (2001: Ch. 3), though it is closely related to causal exclusion arguments in the philosophy of mind.

43. See Merricks (2001: 57) on causal relevance.

44. See Merricks (2001: 66–72), Olson (2002: §6), Sider (2003b: 722–723), Carroll and Carter (2005: §7), Thomasson (2006: §1, 2007: Ch. 1), and Schaffer (2007: §8) for discussion.

45. See Merricks (2001: 72–79, 2003: §3) and Sider (2003b: 723–725) for discussion.

46. See Merricks (2001: 61–66, 2003: §1) in defense of H3. See Lowe (2003, 2005a: 526–531) and Elder (2007: §3, 2011: §6.3) for attempts to resist H3. See Merricks (2001: Ch. 4, 2003: §§1–2), Dorr (2003), and Carroll and Carter (2005) on whether persons and other conscious composites escape overdetermination arguments by virtue of having nonredundant causal powers.

47. The principle is controversial because numbers and other abstracta, if they exist, are plausibly causally inert; though, for present purposes, one could get by with the weaker principle that physical objects exist only if that have causal powers (see Merricks 2001: 81). For general discussion of the Eleatic Principle, see Armstrong (1978: 139), Oddie (1982), Colyvan (1998), and the special issue of the journal Topoi (2003: v. 22.2).

48. The problem is due to Geach (1980: §110) and Unger (1980). See the entry on the problem of the many for a far more detailed overview of the problem and candidate solutions. See Hudson (2001: Ch. 1), Unger (2004, 2005: Ch. 7), Hawthorne (2006: Ch. 9), and O'Connor (2007) for special problems that arise in connection with persons. Olson (2007: 224–225) puts the problem of the many to work in an argument against universalism.

49. See Lewis (1976: 149), Quine (1981b: 92–93), Hirsch (1982: 40–42), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.3), Hawley (2001: 166), and Sider (2001b: §1).

50. See Quine (1981b: 93) and Lewis (1993: 166–167) on this strategy for fortifying the problem. And see van Inwagen (1990: 216–217) on how the puzzle arises even for those who deny that there is such an object as Woodrow-minus (e.g., because they deny DAUP).

51. See Lewis (1993: 171–175), McGee and McLaughlin (2000), McKinnon (2002), Weatherson (2003: §§3–5), and Williams (2006) for discussion.

52. See Lowe (1982, 1995), Johnston (1992: §4), and Tye (1996a: §3) for the constitutionalist response. Van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 17), though not himself a constitutionalist, defends a structurally similar reply.

53. Kim (1976: §3), Chisholm (1976: §3.4), Lewis (1993: 177–180), Unger (2004: 203), and Williams (2006) endorse the same-kind permissivist response; Unger (1980), Heller (1990: 38), Horgan (1993: §2), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4.4) endorse the eliminativist response.

54. Proponents of this strategy include Lewis (1991: §3.5), Jubien (2001: 14n2), Sosa (1999: 142), Sider (2001a: 218, 2004: 680), and Varzi (2003: 213–214).

55. See Thomasson (2007: §10.3) on the ambiguity of ‘object’; van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 10) on loose talk; Horgan and Potrč (2008: Ch. 3) on context-sensitivity; Wiggins (1968: 91–92, 2001: §1.6) and Hirsch (1982: 59) on the ‘is’ of constitution; Chisholm (1976: 102–103), Lewis (1976: 152–154, 1993: 171–179), Robinson (1985: §6), Paul (2002: §6), Moyer (2006: §1, 2008: 314), Baker (2007: 169–172), and Thomasson (2007: §4.1) on revisionary treatments of counting; and Sider (2004: 680, 2009b: 412–413), Dorr (2005: §7), Chalmers (2009: §2), and Cameron (2010: 256–7) on technical uses of quantifiers. See the end of §7.2 below for an “argument from charity” for compatibilist accounts.

56. See Markosian (1998: 228–229, 2008: §3), Hirsch (2000: 42, 2002a: 111–112, 2002b: 64–65, 2004b: 136–137), and Korman (2008b) on restricted quantifiers. See Hawthorne and Cortens (1995: 156–157), Hawthorne and Michael (1996: §2), Markosian (1998: 220–221, 2008: §4), Merricks (2001: §7.1), Hirsch (2002a: 109–111, 2008b: 370–371), Varzi (2002: 65), and Korman (2009: §3) on loose talk. See Olson (2001: §3) and Pickel (2010) on the ‘is’ of constitution. See Hirsch (2008a: §5) and Korman (2008b: §4) on the revolutionary strategy. See Tye (1992) and Uzquiano (2004) on special problems that arise in connection with van Inwagen's (1990: Ch. 11) strategy of paraphrasing ordinary existence claims in terms of arrangements of simples. McGrath (2005) and Nolan (2010) show how counterparts of the arguments for eliminativism cause trouble for the ordinary utterances that compatibilist eliminativists wish to affirm.

57. For a variety of incompatibilist strategies, see Unger (1979a: 150), Heller (1990: §§4.13 and 4.22), van Inwagen (1993: 712), Merricks (2001: §§3.3, 7.2, and 7.3), Rosen and Dorr (2002: §§4–5), Sider (2004: 680), Eklund (2005: §2), Olson (2007: 222), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: §6.2.2). See Korman (2009) for general discussion of the constraints on a satisfactory incompatibilist account.

58. The argument from charity is due to Hirsch (2002a, 2002b: §6, 2004a, 2005, 2008b). See Davidson (1974: 19), Grandy (1973: §1), Lewis (1974: 336–337), Gauker (1986), Hirsch (2005: §5), and Williamson (2007: Ch. 8) for general discussion of principles of charity.

59. See Hirsch (2002a: §§3–4, 2005: 88–89, 2008b: 372–373) for criticism of this line of response. See Hirsch (2008a) and McGrath (2008) for further discussion of conflicts of charity.

60. See Lewis (1974: 336), Hirsch (2002a: 105–6, 2005: 78, 2008b: 370), and Korman (2008a, 2008b: 324–5) for relevant discussion.

61. See Merrill (1980: 77–80), Lewis (1983: 370–377, 1984: 226–229), Sider (2001a: xxi–xxiv), and Williams (2007) on the role of naturalness—or “reference magnets”—in accounts of content determination. Sider (2004: 679–682, 2009b: §11) defends an argument from naturalness against M2; see Hirsch (2002a: §5, 2005: §6, 2008a: §5, 2008b: 377–378, 2009: 243–244) against this line of response. For discussion of compositionality constraints on candidate interpretations, see Hirsch (2005: 79–80, 2009: §4).

62. See Dorr (2005) for an argument that charitable interpretation of ontologists favors interpreting them to be speaking truly when they say ‘there are no statues’.

63. See Baxter (1988) and Wallace (2011) for defense of the identification of composites with their parts.

64. See van Inwagen (1994), Yi (1999), Merricks (2001: §1.4), Sider (2007: §3.3), and McDaniel (2008) against the thesis that composition is identity. See Merricks (2005: 630), Sider (2007: 61–62), Cameron (forthcoming), and McDaniel (forthcoming) on whether the thesis that composition is identity entails universalism.

65. See Devitt (1981) and Thomasson (2007: Ch. 2) for general discussion of this style of response to the qua problem.

66. The argument from application conditions is due to Thomasson (2007: §1.2 and §9.4). Thomasson herself defends the stronger claim that O2 is analytic, on account of the fact that these application conditions enter into the content of ‘statue’ and the associated concept. She also acknowledges that this line of reasoning delivers not only ordinary objects but also extraordinary objects (2007: §10.3).

67. See Thomasson (2007: 157–159) and Schaffer (2009) for discussion of this line of response.