Anaxagoras

First published Wed Aug 22, 2007; substantive revision Sun Aug 9, 2026

When [Anaxagoras] said that noûs is present — in nature just as it is in animals — as the cause of the cosmos and of all its order, he appeared as a sober man among the random chatterers who preceded him. (Aristotle, Metaphysics I.3 984b15)

Anaxagoras of Clazomenae (500–428 BCE) is an important figure in the history of physics and cosmology. He is the earliest philosopher to have resided in Athens. He used empirical evidence to guide the development of his cosmology and science. He was the first Greek theorist to offer the correct account of eclipses. He was also the first to posit that solid heavy bodies exist in the heavens. Further, he thought that these bodies are held aloft by a violent vortex and he claimed that, overcoming this force, some of these bodies would ultimately fall and crash down to Earth. Within just a few years of his first advancing this theory, a stone “the size of a wagon” (Diels-Kranz [DK] 59A11: translations for Anaxagoras are based on those in Curd 2007) crashed to the ground at Aegospotami. Overnight, Anaxagoras gained notoriety for having ‘predicted’ the fall of the meteorite. He also introduced the idea that space is infinitely extended and infinitely divisible. He is praised as “the most brilliant scientist in antiquity” (Janko 2020, 213) and “the greatest astronomer of the early 5th century” (Graham 2013c, 158). In addition, he is celebrated as “the only Greek physicist who made physics completely congruent with mathematics” (Arsenijevic et al. 2019, 59).

Anaxagoras’ physics rests on five core principles which are developed in response to the theory of metaphysical monism that is advanced by Parmenides of Elea (515–450 BCE). Anaxagoras’ principles are: No Becoming, Universal Mixture, Indefinite Types, Thorough Infinitism, and Predominance. Aristotle suggests that Anaxagoras also embraced the principle of Homoiomereity. Anaxagoras advances his treatment of physics and cosmology in two stages. First, he describes a spatially unlimited universe, which is a dense and void-less expanse that is filled with a mixture of pre-existing and interpenetrating types of matter. The mix is so thorough that no phenomenally distinct objects are evident. Anaxagoras affirms that noûs (mind, reason, sense, wit) is coextensive with, or is in some manner fully dispersed throughout, the plenum. Second, he claims that noûs is responsible for a vortex which surges outward from a small region in the plenum. The vortex expands, bringing about a redistribution of matter, and this redistribution causes the emergence of non-basic, but phenomenally distinct, physical objects. Ongoing redistribution also causes the destruction of non-basic objects. The noûs-caused vortex produces our structured world, and it produces innumerable other worlds that are isomorphic with our own.

Anaxagoras theorizes about a variety of astronomical, meteorological, and geological phenomena, including eclipses, shooting stars, comets, meteorites, hail, and the flooding of the Nile. Regarding his influence on later philosophers, Anaxagoras’ treatment of noûs has proven to be the most impactful element of his overall theory.

1. Life and Work

Anaxagoras was a native of Clazomenae, on the western coast of Anatolia. According to Diogenes Laertius (Lives of the Philosophers 2.6.15, DK 59A1) (see the article on Doxography of Ancient Philosophy), Anaxagoras came from an aristocratic and landed family but abandoned his inheritance to study philosophy. We do not know how he acquired his philosophical learning. At some point he came to Athens, and he resided there for between twenty and thirty years. He was a friend and protégé of Pericles, the Athenian general and political leader. It is clear from their dramas that Anaxagoras’ work was known to Sophocles, Euripides, and perhaps Aeschylus (Seneca suggests in his Natural Questions 4a.2.17 that these writers shared Anaxagoras’ view about the source of the Nile); it was certainly familiar to the comic playwright Aristophanes (Curd 2007; Sider 1981 [2005]; see Mansfeld 1979). Diogenes Laertius indicates that Anaxagoras was twenty years old when Xerxes crossed the Hellespont (DK 59A1). This was in 480 BCE, which suggests that Anaxagoras was born around 500 BCE.

Anaxagoras claimed that the Sun, traditionally considered to be a god, is a red-hot stone. The same view is advanced in the Sisyphus fragment: a notorious document of ancient atheism. (In the fragment, the author, who is most likely Euripides (Kahn 1997), claims that a clever man invented fear of the gods in order to deter wicked behavior.) Owing to this and other dangerous ideas, Anaxagoras was charged with impiety. He fled Athens and took up residence in Lampsacus. Upon his death, in 428, the Lampsacenes buried Anaxagoras with high honors and for many years following they celebrated his memory with a children’s festival. Anaxagoras is included in the ancient lists of those who wrote only one book: in the Apology, Socrates reports that it could be bought for a drachma.

There is controversy about Anaxagoras’ time in Athens, about the date of publication of his book, and about the date of his trial. Some scholars argue that Anaxagoras’ arrival in Athens was as early as the Persian invasion of 480 (O’Brien 1968; Woodbury 1981; Graham 2006). This is unlikely, given that Athens was embroiled in war at that time. Others argue for later dates of 478 (Graham 2013c), 464 (Sider 1981 [2005]), 460 (Janko 2020) and 456 (Mansfeld 1979, followed by Curd 2007 and Palmer 2009). One factor that shapes most proposals concerning Anaxagoras’ time in Athens is the supposition that, after leaving Athens, Anaxagoras must have resided in Lampsacus for a considerable period of time, as a leader or educator, in order to have gained a high reputation among the Lampsacenes by the time of his death. Thus, were he to have arrived in Athens in 464 and departed thirty years later in 436 (Sider 1981 [2005]) or were he to have arrived in Athens in 456 and departed twenty years later in 436 (Mansfeld 1979), Anaxagoras would have resided in Lampsacus for a period of time that is sufficient to reconcile with the record of his high reputation in 428.

An alternative interpretative strategy is to place Anaxagoras in Lampsacus both before and after his time in Athens. On one account, Anaxagoras is a protégé of Themistocles at Lampsacus from 466 until Themistocles’ death in 460. (Note that Lampsacus, on the southern shore of the Hellespont, is quite near to Aegospotami, on the northern shore, where the meteorite fell.) Anaxagoras then travels to Athens, becoming a protégé of Pericles. He resides in Athens for thirty years and, facing the charge of impiety, flees Athens for Lampsacus in 430 (Janko 2020). On this account, it is primarily owing to his good work at Lampsacus in 466–460 that, upon his passing, Anaxagoras receives honors from the Lampsacenes.

Some scholars contend that Anaxagoras published his book in 440 (Mansfeld 1980a). Others argue that he published it sometime between 470 and 465 (Sider 1981 [2005]). More recently, it has been masterfully argued that Anaxagoras published his book between 478 and 466 (Graham 2013c). Anaxagoras is the first Greek to propose that eclipses (both solar and lunar) are caused by antiphraxis: the screening of one body by another. Astrophysical retrodiction reveals that on 17 February 478 BCE an annular eclipse of the sun produced a shadow that covered most of the Peloponnese. Further, this eclipse was visible from Athens, Clazomenae, and Lampsacus. Whether he resided in Athens, Clazomenae, or Lampsacus at that time, Anaxagoras would have seen the eclipse and in the following weeks or months, owing to maritime trade, he would have been well-positioned to gather eyewitness testimony from travelers who had themselves witnessed the eclipse while on the Peloponnese. Thus, through eyewitness testimony, Anaxagoras would have come to understand that the shadow produced by the eclipse covered the Peloponnese. With this in mind, a basic grasp of perspective would have brought Anaxagoras to advance a pair of claims which are otherwise oddly specific: these are that the moon is as large as the Peloponnese (Hippolytus, Refutation of all Heresies, 1.8.1, DK 59A42) and that the sun is larger than the moon (Plutarch, The Face of the Moon 932a, DK 59B18). Reports of the extent of the shadow of the eclipse across the Peloponnese appear to have provided Anaxagoras with the standard of measurement upon which he based these two claims. It is all but certain, then, that the eclipse of 478 is the terminus post quem for publication of Anaxagoras’ book.

Pliny tells us that a large stone fell to the ground at Aegospotami in the 2nd year of the 78th Olympiad (i.e. 466 BCE) “while a comet had been seen burning in the night” (Pliny, Natural History, 2.149, DK 59A11). There are two reasons to suppose that, with the fall of the meteorite, 466 is the terminus ante quem for the date of publication. First, were Anaxagoras to have published his book after this event, it would be difficult to explain his consequent fame for having ‘predicted’ the event. (Of course, he did not predict the fall of a token meteorite at Aegospotami. He predicted the fall of meteorites (or stones) as a general type of natural phenomena and, fortuitously, a token meteorite just so happened to fall at Aegospotami (Graham 2013a).) Second, astrophysical retrodiction reveals that Halley’s comet would have been visible across the Mediterranean from June through August in 466 BCE. The motion of the comet would have been visibly brighter and spatially distinct from a pair of planetary conjunctions on 4 June and 21 July 466. But Anaxagoras’ explanation of comets is that they are a conjunction of planets (Plutarch, Life of Nicias, 23, DK 59A18). So, the evidence from summer 466 disconfirms Anaxagoras’ theory of comets, even though it confirms his theory of meteorites. This strongly suggests that Anaxagoras published his book, which included his (pre-disconfirmation) theory of comets, prior to 466.

Some scholars date Anaxagoras’ trial to 450 (Taylor 1917). Others date the trial to 437 (Mansfeld 1979), to 434 (Sider 1981 [2005]), and to 430 (Janko 2020). It is likely that the trial took place in 430, after the outbreak of the great plague (430–427). First, the failed expeditions in 431 and 430, and the emergence of the plague in 430, would have placed Pericles’ political standing at risk and, thus, would have also placed the fate of his close associates – Phidias, Aspasia, and Anaxagoras – at risk. The dangerous link for Anaxagoras was Pericles’ acceptance of his theory of eclipses. Plutarch indicates that Pericles publicly espoused the view that eclipses are caused by antiphraxis. In reference to what astrophysical retrodiction shows to be an annular eclipse of the sun on 3 August 431, Plutarch writes,

[with the fleet preparing for the expedition] … at the very moment the ships were fully manned … an eclipse of the sun took place, darkness descended, and everyone was seized with panic … When Pericles saw that the helmsman was frightened and quite at a loss what to do, he held up his cloak in front of the man’s eyes and asked him whether he found this alarming or thought it a terrible omen. When he replied that he did not, Pericles asked, “What is the difference, then, between this and the eclipse, except that the eclipse has been caused by something larger than my cloak?” (Pl. Per. 35.4–5).

In this account, using his cloak as an analog for the moon, Pericles appeals to the theory of antiphraxis and thereby shows that he places no stock in the superstitious idea that the eclipse might be a warning from the gods. Thus, with the failure of the expedition of 430 and with public sentiment turning toward belief that the plague was divine punishment (perhaps punishment for Pericles’ own manifest affront to the gods a year earlier), 430 would be an opportune time for adversaries to prosecute Anaxagoras, under Diopeithes’ decree, for “not believing in the gods and giving lectures on astronomy” (Pl. Per. 32.2).

Second, while it is possible that Anaxagoras fled in advance of the trial and was prosecuted in absentia, more than one ancient source suggests that he was imprisoned ahead of the trial and fled subsequent to the announcement of the verdict. One source, Satyrus, claims that while in prison Anaxagoras was informed both of his own conviction and of the death of his two sons. Regarding Anaxagoras’ reaction, Satyrus reports, “He said … about his sons, ‘I knew they were mortal when I begat them’” (DK 59A1). Anaxagoras’ claim about the death of his sons, were it to have been offered in 450, 437 or in 434, would seem rather harsh, detached, and cold-hearted. However, the claim offered in 430 during the plague, a plague that took Pericles’ own sons, would seem to suggest a spirit of resignation and acquiescence that is in keeping with the tragic circumstance of the time (Mansfeld 1980a; Janko 2020).

Anaxagoras’ work survives only in fragments quoted by later philosophers and commentators; we also have testimonia about his views in many ancient sources. Twenty-two fragments are extant, amounting to 118 lines of text. Most of the fragments are on the topics of core physical principles, noûs, cosmogony, and cosmology. The testimonia cover a much broader set of topics. Anaxagoras’ theory of perception, as an example, comes to us only through testimonia. The standard collection of Presocratic texts (both fragments and testimonia) is H. Diels and W. Kranz, Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker [DK], in which Anaxagoras is given the identifying number 59. The Greek text and translations can also be found in Gemelli-Marciano 2007–2010; Graham 2010; and Laks & Most 2016a and 2016b. (For discussion of the sources for the Presocratics, and problems associated with them, see the article on Presocratic Philosophy.). Any discussion of Anaxagoras’ views must be a reconstruction that goes beyond what we have in the verbatim quotations. Plausible interpretations will be informed both by the evidence of the fragments and testimonia, and by an understanding of Anaxagoras’ historical milieu. It should be kept in mind in reading the following account that scholars disagree and that other interpretations are possible.

2. Early Influences

Anaxagoras was influenced by two strains in early Greek thought. First, there is the tradition of inquiry into nature founded by the Milesians (Miletus is on the western coast of Anatolia, quite near to Clazomenae) and carried on by Xenophanes (Mourelatos 2008b) and by Heraclitus (Graham 2006). The early Milesian scientist-philosophers (Thales, Anaximander, and Anaximenes) sought to explain the cosmos and all its phenomena by appealing to regularities within the cosmic system itself, without reference to extra-natural causes or to the personified gods associated with aspects of nature by traditional Greek religion (Graham 2006; Gregory 2007 and 2013). They based their explanations on the observed regular behavior of the materials that make up the cosmos (see White 2008 on the role of observation and measurement in early Presocratic theories). Anaxagoras works within the Milesian tradition insofar as he theorizes that regularities in nature are produced by invariable principles of matter and motion. Also, in the extant fragments, Anaxagoras makes no reference to personified gods. (Many interpreters attribute divine status to Anaxagoras’ cosmic noûs (Laks 1993; Lesher 1995; Curd 2007; Sedley 2007). Still, it should be noted that neither theos (‘god’) nor any of its cognates appear in the extant fragments. There is no direct textual evidence indicating that Anaxagoras considers noûs to be a divinity or a god (Trepanier 2010).) Here too, then, Anaxagoras appears to follow the Milesians.

Second, there is the influence of Parmenides. Parmenides, in the first part of his poem, introduces a series of highly metaphysical deductive arguments. Most of these arguments turn on the notion that negation must be excluded from positive ontology. A fundamental tenet of Parmenides’ theory is that what-is-not cannot be (DK 28B2). From this tenet Parmenides argues that coming-to-be and passing-away are therefore ruled out, because genuine coming-to-be is change from what-is-not to what-is, while destruction is change from what-is to what-is-not (DK 28B8.15–16). Thus, says Parmenides, what-is “is without start or stop, since coming to be and passing away have wandered very far away, and true trust drove them out” (DK 28B8.27–28: translations for presocratic other than Anaxagoras are based on Graham 2010). Anaxagoras’ principle of no becoming, as we shall see, is a restatement of Parmenides’ prohibition against generation and destruction. By advancing the principle, Anaxagoras distances himself from the Milesians and aligns himself with Parmenides. Still, Anaxagoras does not agree with Parmenides on all issues. As an example, while Parmenides argues that motion is impossible (see DK 28B4), Anaxagoras relies on motion as a posit within his own system. Anaxagoras claims that motion of metaphysically basic objects results in the emergence of non-basic objects. By embracing motion, Anaxagoras distances himself from Parmenides and aligns himself with the Milesians.

It is difficult to secure a full and credible assessment of Anaxagoras’ relation to Parmenides. Both Anaxagoras and Parmenides advance rich and complex theories that are open to multiple interpretations. Further, while Parmenides offers arguments for many of his claims, Anaxagoras’ style, by comparison, is blunt and dogmatic. Some scholars think that Anaxagoras is a critic of Parmenides (Schofield 1980; Reeve 1981; Graham 1999). Others consider him to be one of Parmenides’ intellectual disciples (Sisko 2003). It is more likely that Anaxagoras is both a critic and a disciple. He accepts certain Eleatic constraints, while artfully freeing himself from others.

3. Principles

3.1 No Becoming

Anaxagoras accepts the Parmenidean view that generation and destruction are impossible, explaining apparent generation and destruction by replacing them with mixture and separation (or dissociation) of ingredients:

The Greeks do not think correctly about coming-to-be and passing-away; for no thing comes to be or passes away, but is mixed together and dissociated from things that are. And thus they would be correct to call coming-to-be mixing-together and passing-away dissociating. (B17)

What seems to us, through perception, to be generation of new entities or destruction of old ones is not that at all. Rather, objects that appear to us to be born, to grow, and to die, are merely arrangements and re-arrangements of more metaphysically basic ingredients. The basic ingredients are eternal and unchanging in their essential character.

No Becoming: Metaphysically basic types of matter exist, and these types neither come to be nor pass away.

The mechanism for the apparent coming-to-be is mixing and separating-out from the mixture produced by the vortex motion of the ingredients. Through that mechanism, the real things, the ingredients, can retain their character throughout. When an arrangement breaks apart (or “passes away”) the ingredients are dissociated from one another (through separation) and can be re-mixed to form (or “become”) different arrangements, i.e., other perceptible objects.

One way to think of Anaxagoras’ point in B17 is that animals, plants, human beings, the heavenly bodies, and so on, are natural constructs. They are constructs because they depend for their existence and character on the ingredients of which they are constructed (and the pattern or structure that they acquire in the process). Yet they are natural because their construction occurs as one of the processes of nature. Unlike human-made artifacts (which are similarly constructs of ingredients), they are not teleologically determined to fulfill some purpose (contra Sedley 2007). This gives Anaxagoras a two-level metaphysics. Basic things, such as earth and water, are genuinely real: they are things-that-are. The objects constituted by these ingredients are not genuinely real, they are temporary mixtures with no autonomous metaphysical status: they are not things-that-are. This view, that the ingredients are more real than the objects that they make up, is common in Presocratic philosophy, especially among those thinkers who are influenced by Parmenides’ arguments against the possibility of generation and destruction. The view can be found in Empedocles and in the pre-Platonic Atomists. While Empedocles, for example, holds that there are four types of metaphysically basic matter (earth, air, fire, and water), Anaxagoras sets out a truly expansive ontology.

3.2 Indefinite Types

All things were together, unlimited both in quantity and smallness. (B1 [in part])

Those who make the elements unlimited in number, as Anaxagoras and Democritus do, say that the infinite is continuous by contact (A45 [in part])

Anaxagoras holds that the variety of basic material kinds is unlimited or indefinite.

Indefinite Types: There are indefinitely many types of metaphysically basic matter.

The principle should not be taken to suggest that anything whatsoever could be a basic type. This would not be consistent with Anaxagoras’ two-level metaphysics. Still, Anaxagoras does not offer an explicit description of the common attributes, or defining features, of the basic kinds. So, it is up to commentators to figure out what he means, given the available evidence.

There are three alternatives. First, some scholars think that, for Anaxagoras, the basic kinds are opposites, such as hot and cold, wet and dry, sweet and bitter, dark and light, and so on. It is the opposites that have explanatory force in the theory, and all other things and properties are reducible to the opposites. Supporters of this view include Tannery 1886, Burnet 1930, Cornford 1930, Mugler 1956, Vlastos 1950 [1995], Schofield 1980 (with reservations), Inwood 1986, Spanu 1987–88, Sedley 2007, and Marmodoro 2015 and 2017. On this view all the material stuffs and all the objects in the universe would be natural constructs.

At the opposite extreme, a second option holds that literally everything in the natural world is in the original mixture — opposites, but also natural materials (fire, earth, copper, iron, and the like), animals and plants (and their parts such as flesh, blood, and bone), and so on. This view makes no distinction between ingredients and what have been called natural constructs above. It can be found in Strang 1963, Stokes 1965, Guthrie 1965, Barnes 1982, Silvestre 1988, Furth 1991, Graham 1994 and 2004, and E. Lewis 2000.

Finally, there is a middle view, which rejects the opposites-only account, and accepts that some things (plants and animals, heavenly bodies) are natural constructs. On this view, the original mix includes opposites, but also natural substances like metals and earth, and the ingredients of animals, such as flesh, blood, and bone, but no whole physical objects such as plants and animals themselves, or their organic parts such as legs and hearts (Curd 2007 and Sisko 2010a).

The “opposites only” view cannot stand (arguments against it are given in Guthrie 1965 and Graham 2004). B15 may provide some evidence for the view:

The dense and the wet and the cold and the dark came together here, where [the] earth is now; but the rare and the hot and the dry [and the bright] moved out to the far reaches of the aether. (Additions in square brackets follow Sider 1981 [2005].)

But Anaxagoras’ own lists include more than the opposites. As examples, Anaxagoras indicates that air, aether, earth, water, hair, and blood are basic types (see B1, B4b, B8, B10, and B15).

If the attempt to reduce the Anaxagorean ingredients to opposites is unsuccessful, so, too, is the interpretation that allows as an ingredient every kind of thing in the phenomenal world. A minor point is that Anaxagoras surely does not think that artifacts made by human beings are part of the mixture, and there are other semi-natural artifacts as well that would not seem to be present: cheese and bronze, as examples. More importantly, the wide-scope view fails to take seriously B17’s replacement of coming-to-be and passing-away with mixture and dissolution. Further, it is unclear how the view can discriminate between an individual and its parts or ingredients. In B4a Anaxagoras refers to the animals and humans “that have been compounded, as many as have soul,” and this suggests that B17’s implicit model of living things as natural constructs mixed together from the ingredients that are genuinely real must be taken seriously.

It seems, then, best to interpret Anaxagoras as claiming that all the material ingredients of natural living things and the heavenly bodies are present in the original mix, but that these objects themselves are not among the ingredients and are instead natural constructions, produced by the processes of mixture and separation that we call nutrition and growth, or by the rotations of the heavens and the attendant clumping-together and breaking-apart of the ingredients of the stars, clouds, comets, planets, and so on. On this interpretation, Anaxagoras considers substance (like water) to be ontologically akin to qualities (like hot). This leveling of the ontological status of substances and qualities is not uncommon among the Presocratic philosophers (see Mourelatos 1970 [2008a]). It has been observed that each of the basic types described by Anaxagoras possesses phenomenal homogeneity: none exhibit variegated structure (Sisko 2010a). Phenomenal homogeneity, for Anaxagoras, may be a necessary condition, but still not a sufficient condition for status as a basic kind (remember cheese and bronze).

3.3 Universal Mixture

In everything there is a share of everything. (B11 [in part])

Anaxagoras affirms that there are no pure stuffs or bits of matter. Rather, each token of matter contains portions of every type of matter. For Anaxagoras, a bar of gold, say, will contain not only gold, but also earth, air, water, flesh, hair, and portions of every other kind of metaphysically basic stuff.

Universal Mixture: Any token or instance of any basic type of matter has within it portions of every basic type of matter.

As we have seen, Anaxagoras’ commitment to Eleatic principles rules out the possibility of genuine coming-to-be or passing-away. It also rules out real material transformations. When a child ingests food (milk and bread, for instance), the milk and bread are (it seems) transformed into flesh, blood, and bone. Yet Anaxagoras objects to this claim because it entails that bread and milk are destroyed while flesh, blood, and bone come to be. His solution is Universal Mixture. If blood and bone are already in the milk and bread, then the growth of the child can be attributed to the accumulation of these ingredients from the bread and milk, and their assimilation into the substance of the child’s body, rather than to the transformation of bread and milk into something else. The clearest statement of this is in Anaxagoras B10, a quotation found in the following passage:

When Anaxagoras discovered the old belief that nothing comes from that which is not in any way whatsoever, he did away with coming-to-be, and introduced dissociation in place of coming-to-be. For he foolishly said that all things are mixed with each other, but that as they grow they are dissociated. For in the same seminal fluid there are hair, nails, veins and arteries, sinew, and bone, and it happens that they are imperceptible because of the smallness of the parts, but when they grow, they gradually are separated off. “For how,” he says, “can hair come from what is not hair, and flesh from what is not flesh?” (DK 59B10 [in part]); the passage is from the anonymous scholiast on a 4th-c. CE work of Gregory of Nazianzus.)

There have been interpreters, both ancient (including this scholiast and Simplicius) and modern (Guthrie 1965 is a good example), who have seen the desire to explain nutrition and growth as the primary motivation for adopting Universal Mixture. (Some question the authenticity of the fragment in DK 59B10. Similar, but less rhetorically charged, passages are found in the testimonia. See, for example, Aëtius, Placita 1.3.5, DK 59A49.). But it is more likely that nutrition and growth are particularly clear instances of change for which Anaxagoras’ explanation runs counter to pre-theoretical or common-sense views.

Some interpreters suggest that No Becoming leads Anaxagoras to affirm Universal Mixture (Schofield 1980; Curd 2007). Aristotle, the earliest champion of this view, hypothesizes that, for Anaxagoras, any type of matter can emerge from any token of some other type of matter and, so, every type must be in every token (see DK 59A52). This, however, is implausible, as Guthrie 1965 shows. It is simply not the case that just any type of matter, through processes of disassociation or refinement, will emerge from a token of a different type: in the process of, say, smelting gold, we never find blood or hair in the dross. With mixture and separation, No Becoming entails ‘some things are in some things’ or even ‘many things are in many things,’ but it does not entail ‘everything is in everything:’ No Becoming does not ground Universal Mixture.

Other interpreters suggest that Universal Mixture is a reformulation of a Parmenidean principle: predicational saturation (Furth 1974 and 1991; Sisko 2003, 2010b, and 2013). Parmenides is sometimes interpreted to be a Numerical Monist, affirming that only one thing – a single token item – exists (see Guthrie 1965). On this approach, Parmenides’ ‘One’ may be considered to be predicationally simple (Curd 1991) or predicationally saturated (Furth 1974). On the former view, little more than being can be predicated of Parmenides’ ‘One.’ On the latter view, the ‘One’ possess all predicates among relevant types throughout itself. Parmenides’ predicates range over quality-powers (like hot and dry) and mass terms (like earth and fire) (Mourelatos 1973 and 1987). (Parmenides is not concerned with ancillary predicates (like height) or relative predicates (like to the right of)). On this interpretation, Parmenides excludes predicates of the form not-F but considers all predicates to be conceptually distinct from one another. Thus, the ‘One’ is both hot and cold, while hot is not considered to be not-cold and cold is not considered to be not-hot. Anaxagoras, it is argued, understands Parmenides to be a Numerical Monist and, just as his No Becoming is a restatement of Parmenides’ prohibition against generation and destruction, his Universal Mixture is a restatement of Parmenides’ principle of predicational saturation. In this context, it is notable that all basic material types that are explicitly identified by Anaxagoras can be viewed as either quality-powers or mass terms (Sisko 2003).

Another view is that consideration of the principle of indifference leads Anaxagoras to posit Universal Mixture (Arsenijevic et al. 2019). On this model, Anaxagoras’ universe, independent of the vortex, rests in a state of maximum entropy, given that no ordered state can be preferred to any other.

Owing to Universal Mixture, there must be interpenetration of ingredients, for it must be possible for there to be many ingredients in the same spatial partition. Indeed, the principle requires that all ingredients be in every space at all times. This will allow any ingredient to emerge from a mixture through accumulation (or, having been unmixed, to become submerged in one), and thus allow for the appearance of coming-to-be (or passing-away) of things or qualities.

Some scholars suppose that Anaxagoras considers the basic kinds to be very small particles (Vlastos 1950 [1995]; Guthrie 1965; Sider 1981 [2005]; E. Lewis 2000). But a particle would have to be a smallest amount of some type of ingredient, occupying some space all by itself: with no other type of ingredient in it. Thus, the particulate interpretation is inconsistent with Universal Mixture. It is crucial to Anaxagoras’ theory that there be (in actuality) no such pure bits or volumes of any type of ingredient.

Rather than supposing that they are particles, one might conceive of the ingredients as fluid, like pastes or liquids which can be smeared together, with different areas of the mixture characterized by different relative densities of the ingredients, all of which are nevertheless everywhere in it (Curd 2007; Torrijos-Castrillejo 2019). Each genuinely real ingredient could be mixed with every other and so would be contained in any area of the mixture, and in principle visibly recoverable from it by accumulation or increased concentration. The differing densities of the ingredients would allow for differences in the phenomenal character of the mixture. As the relative concentration of ingredients in any area of the mixture altered (through the mixture and separation brought about by the rotation of the original blend of ingredients), the phenomenal character of that region of the mixture would alter. An intriguing account, Marmodoro 2015 and 2017, suggests that Anaxagorean ingredients are not material; rather they are primitive physical qualitative powers or dispositions (in the parlance of contemporary metaphysics, they are “gunky”). Marmodoro (2017) argues that Anaxagoras’ mixture is infinitely divided in actuality. Torrijos-Castrillejo (2019) argues that the mix cannot be infinitely divided. Instead, it is only potentially infinitely divisible.

3.4 Predominance

Nothing is completely separated off or dissociated one from the other … but each one is and was most manifestly those things of which there are the most in it. (B12 [in part])

Since all things are mixed, one may ask how any token item could differ in type from any other token item: how could this be hair, while that is gold? Anaxagoras addresses the issue by positing the principle of predominance.

Predominance: Any token of any type of matter has within it a greater share of matter of its own type than its share of matter of any other type.

For Anaxagoras, a token of phenomenal stuff is of a certain type because it contains a greater share of elemental stuff of its own type than its share of any other type of basic stuff. (The distinction between phenomenal and basic stuff is relational. Phenomenal stuff contains basic stuff, but when basic stuff is separated out from a mass, emerging and constituting, through Predominance, a token of its own type, this stuff is realized as phenomenal stuff, which itself contains basic stuff. See Strang 1963 and Graham 2004.) A bar of gold is gold, because there is more gold in it than tin or silver (or hair, earth, blood, or any of the indefinitely many types of basic stuffs that the bar must contain, given Predominance). It is a common error to suppose that, for Anaxagoras, phenomenal gold must contain a measure of more than 50% basic gold. Rather, Universal Mixture requires that the measure of gold in gold must exceed the measure of any other particular type of basic stuff in the gold (Sisko 2003). With Indefinite Types, the share of gold in our bar of gold may be especially slight. The bar might contain, say, 1% gold as long as the share of any other type of matter in the bar is less than 1%.

Reflection on Predominance leads to an old poser: for Anaxagoras, how much gold is within a bar of gold? Some argue that through recursive refinement of an Anaxagorean sample of gold, we could determine a specific limit toward which the refined gold converges (Barnes 1982; Matthews 2002 and 2005). Others contend that no such limit can be determined, given Indefinite Types and Anaxagoras’ stance on the divisibility of matter (Sisko 2005).

3.5 Thorough Infinitism

Nor of the small is there a smallest, but always a smaller (for what-is cannot not be). But also of the large there is always a larger. And [the large] is equal to the small in extent, but in relation to itself each thing is both large and small. (B3)

B1’s claim that, within the original mixture, “all things were together” does not guarantee the truth of Universal Mixture. If separation occurs within the mixture of everything with everything, as a result of the vortex, then, given enough time, it seems that the ingredients could be fully segregated from one another (as they are in Empedocles during the triumph of Strife, when the four roots are completely separated). Anaxagoras needs to block this, so that he can maintain his commitment to Universal Mixture. He blocks the possibility of complete separation of tokens of fundamental matter by advancing a fresh stance on the divisibility (and extension) of space and matter:

Thorough Infinitism: Spatial and material reality have neither an upper limit nor a lower limit in magnitude. (B1, B3, and B6)

The principle can be viewed as a conjunction of a no-least requirement and a no-largest requirement (Marmodoro 2017). Anaxagoras affirms that there is no smallest unit of basic matter (and, thus, both matter and space are continuous and not discrete). On Anaxagoras’ view, all material parts or partitions have proper parts, and Universal Mixture obtains for all such parts. So, as we cut into a bar of Anaxagorean gold, say, even considering indefinitely many cuts, Universal Mixture can (and will) obtain for each resulting bit. Since there is no lower limit of spatial partitioning, there is always room, within small and smaller bits of gold, for portions of each and every basic type of matter. The same will hold for refinement. Within purer and purer bits of refined gold (and within each bit of dross that is extracted from the gold) there is always room for portions of each and every basic type of matter. Thorough Infinitism requires that there is no least bit and there is no least space and, so, Universal Mixture is maintained within Anaxagoras’ system, even with the introduction of vortex motion.

Thorough Infinitism not only requires that all regions of space and all bits of matter have proper partitions, but it also requires that all regions and bits are themselves proper partitions of larger regions and bits. For Anaxagoras, there is no greatest bit and there is no greatest space. It has been argued that Anaxagoras’ infinitely extended and infinitely divisible universe is isotropic and, when considered in isolation from the vortex, it displays invariance under scale (Grujie 2001; Arsenijevic et al. 2019). On this interpretation, each spatial partition of the plenum has the same features as any other partition, no matter how large or small. Thus, Anaxagoras’ universe is a fractal (Grujie 2001). Further, independent of the vortex, Anaxagoras’ universe lacks any privileged location that might stand out from the rest.

Some contend that Parmenides’ ‘One’ is infinitely extended (see McKirahan 2010 and Sisko 2003). Further, it is evident that the notion that the universe is infinitely extended is part of the Milesian tradition (most notably in Xenophanes and perhaps in Anaximander). So, Anaxagoras’ commitment to the no-largest requirement aligns with both Eleatic and Milesian precedents. The no-least requirement is not prefigured in the Milesian tradition, but it is a logical implication of Parmenides’ theory of predicational saturation. If predicational saturation obtains in every location, then space and matter must be infinitely divisible. Anaxagoras’ commitment to the no-least requirement has Eleatic roots.

3.6 Seeds

Before there was separation off, because all things were together, there was not even any colour evident; for the mixture of all things prevented it, of the wet and the dry and of the hot and the cold and of the bright and the dark, there was much earth present and seeds unlimited in number. (B4b [in part]; also, see B4a)

Anaxagoras claims that there are seeds (spermata) in the mixture of all things. But he nowhere explains or makes it clear what he means by ‘seeds.’ There are a number of options. Seeds have been taken to be the smallest possible bits of ingredient (but, as argued above, there are no smallest bits in Anaxagoras’ system) or to be extremely small homunculi-like ingredients, origins of living things, according to some interpreters, which then expand by the addition of other ingredients (E. Lewis 2000; Louguet 2002). Furley (1976 and 2002) advocates for the view that Anaxagoras simply means biological seeds (but not homunculi). Many accept Furley’s interpretation (Barnes 1982, Curd 2007, and Sedley 2007; Peck 1926 advances the same view, but does not seem to influence other interpreters on this particular topic). Sedley 2007 contends that Anaxagoras includes biological seeds in the original mix in order to avoid introducing a theory of spontaneous generation. Marmodoro 2017 acknowledges that biological seeds must contain pre-existing structures.

One difficulty with the notion that Anaxagoras’ ‘seeds’ are biological seeds is that many biological seeds (especially plant seeds) lack phenomenal homogeneity (they contain preexisting structures), while otherwise it seems that, for Anaxagoras, phenomenal homogeneity is a necessary feature of all basic types of matter. Aristotle thinks that Anaxagorean uses the term ‘seed’ as a quasi-technical term for describing the basic stuffs (see DK 59A43). The stuffs constitute the material basis from which all else grows or emerges and, so, the stuffs are in a sense cosmic seeds. This is a safe interpretation. Were we to follow Aristotle’s approach, we would see that Anaxagoras’ mention of ‘seeds’ need not problematize other core assumptions within his system.

3.7 Homoiomereity

[Anaxagoras] makes the homoiomerous stuffs elements, for instance, bone and flesh and marrow and the others of which the part is called the same [as the whole] (DK 59A46: Aristotle, Generation and Corruption 314a18–20)

Aristotle asserts that homoiomerous (like-parted) kinds are Anaxagorean basic stuffs. He does not quite say that all Anaxagorean basic stuffs are homoiomerous. Aristotle might mean that the things which he himself considers to be homoiomerous are among Anaxagoras’ basic types. This would leave conceptual space for the existence of other anhomoiomerous basic stuffs within Anaxagoras’ system. Still, there is a long doxographical tradition in which homoiomereity is considered to be one of Anaxagoras’ fundamental principles. Aristotle is likely to have coined the term homoiomereia, ‘homoiomereity’. So, were Anaxagoras to think that all basic kinds have the characteristics associated with Aristotelian homoiomerous kinds, he would express the view using different terminology.

For Aristotle, homoiomerous kinds possess what is best described as general homoiomereity:

General Homoiomereity: Any token of any type of matter is such that each of its spatially determined parts (i.e. spatial partitions) is the same in kind as the whole: each part is synonymous with the whole.

At the least, Aristotle thinks that some of Anaxagoras’ basic stuffs possess General Homoiomereity.

Cornford 1930 contends that homoiomereity is inconsistent with Universal Mixture. Kerferd 1974 offers a decisive argument against Cornford: in essence, Kerferd shows that Cornford is blind to the distinction between spatial partitions and portions (or densities) of material types within partitions. (Kerferd, within his refutation of Cornford, accepts that Anaxagoras embraces some form of homoiomereity. Graham 2004 shows that Cornford can be refuted without assuming that Anaxagoras accepts homoiomereity.) Still, some contemporary interpreters continue to champion Cornford’s position (see, as an example, Curd 2007).

Barnes 1982 argues that homoiomereity is entailed by the conjunction of Universal Mixture and Thorough Infinitism. (Our discussion of Universal Mixture and Thorough Infinitism, above, harmonizes with the account offered by Barnes.) Some insist that Anaxagoras’ basic stuffs must be anhomoiomerous (Furley 2002), while others contend that, within Anaxagoras’ system, a version of anhomoiomereity would have greater explanatory power than homoiomereity, even though either interpretation is possible (Graham 1994).

In the literature there is some confusion about the meaning of ‘homoiomereity’ as the concept might be applied within Anaxagoras’ physics. Arguments in Barnes 1982, Furley 2002, and Curd 2007 rest on an understanding of homoiomereity, not as General Homoiomereity, but rather as Rigid Compositional Homoiomereity:

Rigid Compositional Homoiomereity: Any token of any type of matter is such that each of its spatially determined parts has the same proportional composition or density as the whole.

Rigid Compositional Homoiomereity is a model of perfect chemical solution. As such, it is more restrictive than General Homoiomereity. Were Anaxagoras to accept Rigid Compositional Homoiomereity, he would face significant difficulties in explaining the underlying shifts in density and proportion of basic stuffs that are required for separation and refinement of token items. This is the core reason why scholars have been hesitant to accept the notion that homoiomereity is a principle within Anaxagoras’ system. However, General Homoiomereity is more flexible than Rigid Compositional Homoiomereity: it allows for localized changes in portions or density. General Homoiomereity is also quite explicitly the principle that Aristotle attributes to Anaxagoras.

Graham 1994 proposes an anhomoiomerous model, in which Anaxagorean mixtures are perfect chemical suspensions. On Graham’s model a bar of gold, for Anaxagoras, contains droplets or globules of every basic material kind together with a dominant matrix of gold. On this model some spatial partitions of the gold are not gold. Sisko 2009 argues that Graham’s anhomoiomerous model does not conform with Predominance, while General Homoiomereity is logically consistent with Anaxagoras’ other principles. While the debate is ongoing, the evidence, together with the analysis of various homoiomerous and anhomoiomerous models, suggests that General Homoiomereity is a principle, or a corollary, within Anaxagoras’ physical theory.

Torrijos-Castrillejo 2018 argues that Anaxagorean stuffs are ‘like-parted’ because all stuffs contain the same (types of) ingredients. On this view, homoiomereity is equivalent to Universal Mixture.

4. Noûs and Cosmogony

4.1 The Ontological Status of Noûs

The other things have a share of everything, but noûs is unlimited and self-ruling and has been mixed with no thing. If it had been mixed with anything, the things mixed together with it would thwart it so that it would control none of the things in the way that it in fact does, being alone by itself. For it is the finest of all things and the purest, and indeed it maintains all comprehension [or knowledge or determination: gnōmēn] about everything and has great strength. (B12 [in part])

For Anaxagoras, the principles of physics do not apply to noûs. Noûs is not a basic material kind: it is unmixed, pure, and the finest of all things. Were noûs mixed, it would not be able to control the mixture. Anaxagoras uses ‘noûs’ as a mass term and so some scholars understand him to hold that noûs is a special kind of matter (Barnes 1982; Menn 1995; Palmer 2009). This is difficult. Thorough Infinitism entails that there is no limit to the fineness of any basic type of matter. So it is unclear how a material noûs could outpace other types of matter in fineness. By contrast, some contend that, in claiming that noûs is the purest of all things, Anaxagoras is reaching for language to describe noûs as an immaterial substance or non-corporeal entity (Guthrie 1965; Curd 2007; McKirahan 2010). In this context, it is argued that it is only in Plato that we meet a genuine notion of immateriality (Renehan 1980; Sedley 2007).

Others contend that noûs is natural law (Sider 1981 [2005]). And some interpreters advance readings that are adjacent to the natural law approach. Menn, for example, writes “noûs is…not a mind…but rather…rationality as such.” (Menn 1995, 26–28; also see Trepanier 2010 and Gregory 2013). If we understand noûs is natural law, it would be a category mistake to suppose that noûs is subject to the principles of physics; for noûs, on this approach, simply is the principles of physics.

It has been argued that, for Parmenides, Dikē (Justice), Anankē (Necessity), and Moira (Fate) serve as immanent sources of necessity which enforce Parmenides’ principles (Vlastos 1947). Anaxagoras, in developing his theory of noûs may be influenced by Parmenides’ treatment of Dikē, Anankē, and Moira. If this is so, then it is, perhaps, not unreasonable to suppose that Anaxagoras’ noûs is (non-material) law and not substance: noûs is an immanent source of necessity, but it is neither some material stuff nor an immaterial entity.

According to Anaxagoras, noûs is co-present with the infinite universe: noûs is everywhere.

Noûs … assuredly is and is now where everything else also is: in the surrounding multitude and in the things which have been joined together and separated out. (B14 [in part])

Anaxagoras maintains that noûs is present both within and beyond the vortex: it exists throughout the infinitely expansive, yet static, regions of the universe. It is difficult to explain co-presence if we assume that noûs is a non-corporeal entity or a volitional agent of change. These views are tied to the notion that noûs instigates and manages the vortex in pursuit of some aim or goal. The vortex constitutes one portion of Anaxagoras’ universe, but given Thorough Infinitism, there is beyond the vortex (and there will always be beyond the vortex) an infinite expanse of motionless matter. If noûs were a volitional agent of change, it would be difficult to explain its role in this vast motionless expanse. Graham gives voice to the concern: he writes, “Mind is present in the area surrounding the vortex … But if there are no organized animate things in the surrounding chaos, it is not clear what mind is doing there.” (Graham 2010, 319)

Anaxagoras thinks that noûs plays a governing role over, or within, living things.

Noûs has control over all things that have soul, both the larger and the smaller. (B 12 [in part])

In everything there is a share of everything except noûs, but there are some things in which noûs too is present. (B 11)

It may be that Anaxagoras thinks noûs is responsible for the functional capacities, or for the growth and development, of living things. It has been suggested that, for Anaxagoras, noûs in living things is responsible for awareness: either perceiving or knowing (Curd 2007). In the testimonia, it is claimed that Anaxagoras believes that plants have sensation, emotion, and intelligence (DK 59A117) and it is claimed that he believes animals have noûs (A100). Aristotle suggests that Anaxagoras fails to expound in any intelligible way on the role of noûs in connection with living things. Aristotle writes, “Anaxagoras is less clear about noûs and soul; for he often says that noûs is the cause of the fine and the right, but elsewhere he says that [noûs] is soul” (DK 59A100 [in part]). Aristotle’s perspective appears to be that, while Anaxagoras claims that cosmic noûs is a source of good order and also claims that noûs controls ensouled things, he, unfortunately, does not show how these two suppositions might be connected or jointly explained.

Still, for those who consider cosmic noûs to be a mind, Anaxagoras’ claims about noûs in living things lead to the question of whether Anaxagoras thinks that the human mind, in respect to its substance or functioning, is somehow akin to cosmic noûs. Aristotle himself explores this line of inquiry and within his own theory concludes that, for us, mind controls the body, is unmixed with the body, and is separate from the body (see Aristotle, De Anima III.4). Aristotle’s position on ‘noûs in us’ is replete with Anaxagorean concepts and terminology (Sisko 1999 and 2000; F. Lewis 2003; Carter 2019).

4.2 Noûs and the Vortex

Noûs controlled (kratēsen) the whole rotation, so that it revolved (perikhōrēsai) in the beginning. And it began from a small region (apo tou smikrou), now it is revolving more, and it will revolve still more. And the things that mix, as well as those that are detached and separate out, all these noûs comprehended [or knew or determined: egnō]. And as things were to be – such as were but now are not, all that now are, and such as will be – all these did noûs set in order, as well as this revolution, with which the stars, the sun, the moon, the air, and the aether which are being separated now revolve. (B12 [in part])

According to Anaxagoras, our world comes to be formed through the action of a noûs-caused vortex. Quite naturally, one might ask whether this noûs is a volitional agent of teleological change: a being that entertains a goal, chooses to act, and shapes the world to achieve its goal. In Plato’s Phaedo, Socrates’ answer to this question is a resounding ‘no.’ Socrates indicates that, prior to reading Anaxagoras’ book, he had anticipated that he would learn how noûs organizes the heavens for the sake of the best. Socrates states,

I was glad to think that I had found in Anaxagoras a teacher about the cause of things after my own heart, and that he would tell me, first, whether the Earth is flat or round, and then would explain why it is so of necessity, saying which is better, and that it was better to be so … I was ready to find out in the same way about the sun and the moon and the other heavenly bodies, about their relative speed, their turnings and whatever else happened to them, how it is best that each should act or be acted upon. (Phaedo, 97d6–98a7)

Socrates had hoped to find that noûs arranges the cosmos with proper stewardship. Yet, upon reading the book, he was disappointed. Socrates states,

I saw that the man made no use of noûs, nor gave it responsibility for the management of things, but mentioned as causes air and aether and water and many other strange things. (Phaedo, 98b7–c1)

On Socrates’ account, Anaxagoras does not employ noûs as a teleological cause and instead explains change as an interplay of purposeless material causes. Aristotle echoes Socrates’ claim and affirms that Anaxagoras focuses on material causation in his physics, making little or no use of noûs (DK 59A47).

Notwithstanding Socrates’ report, the dominant view among contemporary scholars is that Anaxagoras’ noûs is a teleological cause. Some proponents of this view offer a thin teleological interpretation. On this approach, given that the fragments assign motive power to noûs and (purportedly) assign cognitive power to noûs, it is presumed that Anaxagoras must tacitly accept that noûs has volitional power: the power that links cognition to motion and action (Lesher 1995; Curd 2007; Gregory 2007; McKirahan 2010; Pinto 2017). The thin interpretation depends on an untested analogy between human reason and Anaxagoras’ cosmic noûs. (Von Fritz 1964 espies the influence of Parmenides in Anaxagoras’ (purported) assignment of cognitive powers to noûs and the influence of the Milesian tradition in the assignment of motive powers. Von Fritz thinks that Anaxagoras fails to connect or reconcile these distinct inherited threads.)

Other proponents offer a thick teleological interpretation (Laks 1993 and 2002; Sedley 2007). According to this approach, details within Anaxagoras’ cosmogony reveal specific aims and goals that must be entertained by noûs. Sedley 2007 argues that noûs builds and shapes our world, together with multiple others, to promote the emergence of the best form of life: human life. Sedley detects “an anthropocentric bias” in Anaxagoras’ teleology (Sedley 2007, 24). Laks (1993 and 2002) argues that the goal of noûs is cognitive discernment. Noûs separates matter to reveal purer and purer tokens of each basic type in order to better understand the nature of each type. While on Sedley’s account, noûs is a purposive worldbuilder, on Laks’ account the formation of worlds is an ancillary effect of separation. According to Laks, each world comes into being and perishes as only a transitory stage within a never-ending process. Unfortunately, owing to Universal Mixture and Thorough Infinitism, noûs, on Laks’ interpretation, is engaged in an endless task in pursuit of an unattainable goal: the process of separation will never be completed and, thus, noûs will never come to discern a pure token of basic stuff.

Other proponents of the teleological interpretations affirm that noûs must have robust knowledge of the basic material kinds and the laws of physics (Lesher 1995; Curd 2007; McKirahan 2010). Graham 2004 suggests that knowledge by acquaintance - ostensive knowledge - may be sufficient for noûs.

Some scholars think that Anaxagoras’ noûs is a principle of motion and not a principle of cognition (Silvestre 1988). By contrast, some, as we have indicated, contend that noûs is natural law (Sider 1981 [2005]). On this non-teleological account, noûs (as law) produces good order without willing or choosing good order.

Louguet 2002 contends that the outcomes of the vortex motion are based solely on the material properties of the stuffs in the original mixture. On this non-teleological account, noûs is not empowered to select a goal to pursue in sparking the vortex: the outcomes are independently predetermined. Some compare the instigation of the vortex to the modern idea of the Big Bang (Gregory 2007; Tzamalikos 2016). Torrijos-Castrillejo 2021 outlines several important differences between Anaxagoras’ vortex and the Big Bang. Grujie 2001 considers the instigation of the vortex to be at best ill-defined, contending that a process that will continue with no end would be better suited to also lacking a temporal beginning. Others who are eager to celebrate the rigorous material physics in Anaxagoras’ account take the (perceived) deus ex machina of a noûs-sparked vortex to be a step too far. Barnes, for example, considering Anaxagoras’ noûs (mind) to be a mysterious non-natural cause, writes, “the details of mind’s cosmic activity are of no philosophical interest” (Barnes 1982, 409). Arsenijevic et al., reflecting on the regularity and uniformity of the plenum, write that the introduction of the vortex is “non-natural and inexplicable” (Arsenijevic et al. 2019, 60)

A majority of interpreters take the instigation of the vortex by noûs to be a cosmic first event. This event marks the first moment in time for which change obtains in the plenum. For champions of teleological interpretations, noûs selects the time and location of the first event. For champions of non-teleological interpretations, the episode of a first event is difficult to reconcile with the notion that noûs may be a power, force, or law (Trepanier 2010). On either approach (i.e. the teleological or the non-teleological), it is difficult to understand how the vortex could begin at a specific time and in a specific place, since, within the otherwise static plenum, any time will be functionally indiscernible from any other time and any location will be functionally indiscernible from any other location.

4.3 Noûs and Multiple Worlds

Since these things are so, it is right to think that there are many different things present in everything that is being combined, the seeds of all things, having all sorts of forms, colors, and flavors, and that humans and also other animals are compounded, as many as have soul. Also, that there are cities that have been constructed by humans and works made, just as with us, and that there are a sun and a moon and other heavenly bodies, just as with us, and the earth grows many different things for them, the most valuable of which they gather together into their households and use. I have said this about the separation, because there would be separation not only for us but also elsewhere. (B4a)

Anaxagoras advances a thesis of multiple isomorphic worlds. He nowhere provides information concerning the spatial or temporal arrangement of these worlds. Fränkel 1969 thinks that Anaxagoras advances the theses of multiple worlds as a thought experiment about possible worlds, making no commitment to the actual existence of other worlds. This view is effectively countered in Mansfeld 1980b.

Some scholars think that Anaxagoras’ worlds are different locations on Earth (Cornford 1934). Others think that these worlds are similar in size to our world, occupying separate regions of space (Sedley 2007). This is unlikely, since Anaxagoras refers to just one noûs-caused vortex rather than to a plurality of vortices (Gregory 2007).

On most other interpretations, Anaxagoras’ worlds are contained within the single vortex that shapes our world. Within this group, some think that Anaxagoras’ other worlds are located in sub-vortexes or eddies along the edge of this expanding vortex (Curd 2007). Others contend that Anaxagoras’ worlds exist as microscopic bits within every token of basic stuff (Leon 1927; Strang 1963; Schofield 1996). This is unlikely, since we have no indication from Anaxagoras that worlds might be subject to Universal Mixture. Still others contend that Anaxagoras’ other worlds exist at smaller and smaller levels nested concentrically in our world (Mansfeld 1980b). And yet others think that these worlds are both smaller and smaller worlds nested within our own and larger and larger worlds in which our world is nested (Sisko 2003). According to one final interpretation, Anaxagoras’ worlds, not unlike the plenum, exhibit invariance under scale and are functionally indiscernible from one another. Gregory 2007 finds this view to be implausible, since it has no antecedent in the doxographical tradition. Louguet 2002 argues that Anaxagoras artfully constructs the narrative in fragment 4a to emphasize the indiscernibility of the world ‘for us’ and the world ‘elsewhere.’ Interestingly, and while the details are quite different, Empedocles and the pre-Platonic Atomists also advance theories of multiple worlds.

4.4 Noûs and the First Event

Some scholars think that there are contextual and conceptual grounds for challenging the supposition that Anaxagoras posits an initial moment of change within his cosmogony (Sisko 2003; Guetter 2009). First, Parmenides offers an argument against the possibility of such an event (DK 28B8.9–10). His argument entails that either there can never be motion or there has always been motion. Empedocles, Anaxagoras’ near contemporary, understands the entailment and, within his cosmogony, posits an eternal cycle of motion: Empedocles maintains that there has always been motion. Anaxagoras’ approach to Parmenides aligns with Empedocles’ insofar as both advance a theory of multiple worlds. (Although, Empedocles posits cyclical repeating worlds, while Anaxagoras posits an array of synchronic worlds.) So, in context, it might seem discordant for Anaxagoras to posit the existence of multiple worlds and yet also affirm that world-formation begins with a first event and a first world. The pre-Platonic Atomists also conjoin the theory of multiple worlds with the supposition of eternal motion. (Although, for Anaxagoras, all worlds are isomorphic, while, for the Atomists, worlds formed by chance-wise causes vary greatly in structure and internal configuration: for Democritus, see DK68A40.)

Second, Anaxagoras writes, “noûs controlled (ekratesen) the whole rotation, so that it revolved (perikhōrēsai) in the beginning. And it began from a small region (apo tou smikrou), now it is revolving more, and it will revolve still more” (B12.14–15). He affirms that the vortex emerges out of a small region. But, in keeping with his principle of Thorough Infinitism, Anaxagoras accepts that what is a small region from one perspective is a large region from another perspective. He writes, “…with reference to itself each thing is at the same time both large and small” (B3.3). So, the small region of our world from which the vortex had first emerged may also be a large region and, within that large region, there may also be a small region out of which the vortex had first emerged (ad infinitum). The inferential path runs in the other direction as well. Just as the vortex emerges from a small region in our world, the vortex may continue to emerge from larger and larger regions of the expanse which, from other perspectives, are small. So, in light of the principle of Thorough Infinitism, it is not unreasonable to think that Anaxagorean worlds emerge in series throughout all time, with no beginning and no end.

Recently it has been noted that Philodemus explicitly states that, for Anaxagoras, noûs-caused motion is eternal: this motion lacks both a temporal beginning and a temporal end (Vassallo 2019). Philodemus writes,

it is because noûs imposed order … that motion always has been and is and will be. And noûs which is infinite, rules and governs all things, and ordered the sum total of all things mixed together. (PHerc. 1428, col. 320: Vassallo 2021)

To date, little scholarly work has been done on the implications of this intriguing fragment (not included in DK), which clearly suggests that, for Anaxagoras, there is no first event.

5. Science

5.1 Meteorology, Astronomy, Geology, and Generation of Animals

Anaxagoras says that whenever the hot falls on the cold (this is when part of the aether falls into the airy region), it makes thunder by the noise and lightning by the colour in comparison with the dark of the cloud-form. Further, it produces thunderbolt by the extent and intensity of the light, a typhoon by fire composed of many more particles, and the hurricane by fire mingling with the clouds. (DK 59A84)

For Hesiod, an interventionist and capricious Zeus is the cause of intense and seemingly non-lawlike meteorological changes, including five prominent phenomena: thunder, lightning, thunderbolts, hurricanes, and typhoons (see Theogony 139ff and 689ff: Gregory 2013). Within the Milesian tradition, these five phenomena are specifically targeted for explanation through natural and lawlike material causes (Gregory 2013). Following this tradition, Anaxagoras provides naturalistic explanations for these key five types of meteorological change. On Anaxagoras’ account, the phenomena are not omens or acts of vengeance. Instead, they are natural happenings. In addition, testimonia indicate that, according to Anaxagoras, hail is formed when clouds ascend into cold air (DK 59A85), rainbows are caused by a reflection of sunlight through clouds (Scholium BT on Homer, Iliad 17.547), and the flooding of the Nile is caused by the melting of snow in the mountains of Ethiopia (DK 59A89).

Testimonia indicate that Anaxagoras thinks the Earth is flat and drum-like in shape (DK 59A87). In connection with this thesis, Panchenko 1997 contends that Anaxagoras advances an argument against the sphericity of the Earth. Anaxagoras’ commitment to the solidity of the Earth, Moon, and Sun, and both his theory of eclipses and his theory of comets, are outlined above, in section 1. We are told that Anaxagoras thinks the Milky Way is reflected starlight, that shooting stars are sparks generated by the violent motion of the vortex, and that certain invisible bodies (asteroids) are carried together with the stars in their rotation about the Earth (DK 59A42). Anaximenes also posits the existence of asteroids. So, Anaximenes’ theory may have been attributed to Anaxagoras. Still, as Graham 2013a suggests, Anaxagoras might posit the existence of these additional bodies in order to explain lunar eclipses that occur around sunrise or sunset. In these cases, with a flat Earth, the shadow of the Earth upon the Moon, at the requisite orientation, would be realized as a thin band across the face of the Moon. Since the shadow during an eclipse is always circular, it is possible that Anaxagoras incorporates these, otherwise unwitnessed, asteroids into his system to explain eclipses that occur in such special circumstances.

We are told that, for Anaxagoras, water is separated from compacted clouds, earth from compacted water, and stone from compacted earth (DK 59A16). This account, however, closely resembles Anaximenes’s theory of material transformation. For Anaximenes, transformation requires the destruction of one type of basic matter and the genesis of another (Graham 2006). Here Anaximenes’ theory appears to have been attributed to Anaxagoras.

Testimonia suggest that Anaxagoras provides a theory of the generation of animals. Diogenes Laertius tells us that, according to Anaxagoras, “Animals arose from the moist, hot, and earthy, and later from each other” (DK 59A1 [in part]). Here we have a two-stage theory of generation. In stage one, animals are formed out of material stuffs. In stage two, with functional members of species in existence (owing to stage one), animals are formed through procreation. This two-stage account might be viewed as a less robust precursor of the four-stage account that is offered by Empedocles (see DK 31A72). Empedocles does not propose that biological seeds are contained within his mixture of air, water, fire, and earth. Our passage may be taken to suggest that Anaxagoras, not unlike Empedocles (and not unlike the Atomists), explains the emergence of organisms without relying on the supposition that biological seeds pre-exist within the plenum.

5.2 Cognition

Theophrastus, in his De Sensibus, offers a synopsis of Anaxagoras’ theory of perception. He says, most surprisingly, that for Anaxagoras all sensation is accompanied by discomfort or pain (DK 59A92). Theophrastus links this to Anaxagoras’ belief that like is perceived by unlike; on Theophrastus’ view, perception is via touch, and unlike things produce some irritation when touched. Theophrastus adduces loud noises and very bright light as producers of pain in perceivers and suggests that the mechanism is the same in all cases of sensation. In B21, Anaxagoras recognizes the weakness of the senses (“Owing to feebleness [of the senses], we are not able to determine the truth”), but in B21a he accepts that sense perception can be a step towards understanding: “appearances are a sight of the unseen.” (See Warren 2007 for a good discussion of Anaxagoras on perception.)

Nowhere do we have an analysis of the process of thinking for Anaxagoras, and although Aristotle and Theophrastus say that earlier thinkers identified thinking and sense perception, there is little evidence for this view in Anaxagoras (Laks 1999; Warren 2007). This shortage of evidence has led some to the conclusion that Anaxagoras does not offer an explicit theory of intellection (Laks 1993; DeFilippo 1993).

6. Influence

The impact of Anaxagoras’ treatment of noûs on later thinkers should not be underestimated. Anaxagoras’ account influences both Plato’s treatment of cosmic noûs in the Timaeus and Aristotle’s theory of the Unmoved Mover in the Metaphysics. In addition, Aristotle, in De Anima, builds his own theory of human intellect to meet desiderata that he draws quite explicitly from Anaxagoras’ account of noûs (F. Lewis 2003, Sisko 1999 and 2000). Elements of Anaxagoras’ philosophy are echoed or appropriated by Diogenes of Apollonia, who claims that air (as noûs) controls all things. Some scholars have thought that the author of the Derveni Papyrus (found in Northern Greece in 1962) was familiar with Anaxagoras’ theories (Betegh 2004; Kouremenos et al. 2006). Zeno of Elea (perhaps) and Melissus (certainly) criticize his theory. Anaxagoras’ principle of Predominance is developed and modulated by Plato, forming the groundwork for Plato’s theory of Forms and theory of predication (Denyer 1983; Frede 1985; Mann 2000; Silverman 2002; Furley 2002). Further, like Anaxagoras’ noûs, Platonic forms are “themselves by themselves” in being self-explanatory (see Herrmann 2007). It has been argued that the early Christian theologian Origen is influenced by Anaxagoras (Tzamalikos 2016). Most recently, it has been argued that Anaxagoras may have formulated the sorites paradox before Eubulides (Weiss 2025).

Anaxagoras was famous as a prognosticator of everything from meteor falls to rain showers. We are told that he once predicted the collapse of a house, and for this he later received joking derision from Aristotle (Galzerano 2019). Still, for Aristotle, Anaxagoras stands out amongst other Presocratic philosophers as a paradigmatic naturalist and empiricist: as a sober man among random chatterers. Aristotle treats Anaxagoras’ explanation of eclipses as a paradigmatic model of scientific explanation (see Aristotle, Posterior Analytics II.8).

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Editions and Texts

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Other Secondary Literature

  • Althoff, J., 2012, “Presocratic Discourse in Poetry and Prose: The Case of Empedocles and Anaxagoras,” Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science (Part A), 43: 293–299.
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  • –––, 2008, “Anaxagoras and the Theory of Everything,” in Curd and Graham 2008: 230–249.
  • –––, 2009, “Thought and Body in Heraclitus and Anaxagoras,” in G. Guertler and W. Wians (eds.), Proceedings of the Boston Area Colloquium in Ancient Philosophy, Leiden: Brill, 1–20, 39–41.
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Other Internet Resources

  • Anaxagoras, a short podcast by Peter Adamson (Philosophy, Kings College London).

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