1. Cognate words are faylasuf and its plural falasifa. Saʿid al-Andalusi (d. 1070) gives the following account: “The language of the Greeks (Yunaniyun) is called Greek (ighriqiya). It is one of the richest and most important languages in the world. As to religion, the Greeks are Sabians, that is, worshippers of the stars and idolaters. Their scholars used to be called philosophers (falasifa). Philosopher (faylasuf) means in Greek ‘friend of wisdom’. The Greek philosophers belong to the highest class of human beings and to the greatest scholars, since they showed a genuine interest in all branches of wisdom, mathematics, logic, natural science and metaphysics, as well as economics and politics”: trans. Rosenthal (1975, 39).

2. So Nasr (1996a) and (1996b), protesting against those who conceive of Islamic philosophy as “simply an extension of Greek philosophy” (31) and coming to the conclusion that “Islamic philosophy is Islamic not only by virtue of the fact that it was cultivated in the Islamic world by Muslims but because it derives its principles, inspiration and many of the questions with which it has been concerned from the sources of Islamic revelation” (27). According to Nasr, it is “essentially a philosophical hermeneutics of the Sacred Text while making use of the rich philosophical heritage of antiquity” (37). In the same vein of Nasr, see Jambet (2011). The standard work on the notions of science (ʿilm) and wisdom (hikma) in Islam is Rosenthal (1970).

3. This position is best exemplified by Walzer (1950) and (1970, 23): “Sa naissance a été le résultat de circonstances historiques très spéciales, à savoir la conquête musulmane des provinces intellectuellement plus avancées de l’Empire romain d’Orient d’une part, la situation politique et religieuse au premier siècle du califat abbasside d’autre part. Elle est, de ce fait, l’importation d’une tradition étrangère et elle a dû lutter pour être reconnue et intégrée. […] Cependant, la philosophie grecque n’a pas été imposée aux musulmans, et les traductions furent entreprises parce que les musulmans avaient spontanément décidé d’intégrer à la littérature arabe cet héritage étranger”. See also Rosenthal (1975); Endress (1987, 1992); Gutas (1998); Gutas et al. (2022); Martini Bonadeo (2025).

4. This approach is often preferred in the scholarship: see Badawi (1968). Rosenthal (1940); Walzer (1960); Klein-Franke 1973; Strohmaier (2002); Arnzen (2009, 2011); Gutas (2012) survey the translations of Plato’s works. Peters (1968) deals with the translations of Aristotle’s works, and a survey of these translations, following the systematic order of the Aristotelian corpus, is provided by Geoffroy (2011). The outstanding Dictionnaire des Philosophes Antiques directed by R. Goulet (9 volumes, 1989-2018, also available online) deals systematically with the translations into Arabic of the ancient philosophical works that got one, often providing an up-to-date account of the new findings.

5. See Endress (2004), 227–28, describing Averroes’ exhaltation of Aristotle within the context of the project “to vindicate the work of philosophy (…) as a rule of reason governing all of society. Relying on Aristotle to carry his point through all of the rational sciences, this meant to expound the truth on the basis of all the works of Aristotle which had been transmitted”.

6. Together with the grammatical tradition: for instance, the Τέχνη γραμματική by Dionysius Thrax was translated into Syriac within AD 580: see Contini (2001). Overview of the Greek sources in the Syriac literature by Fiori (2011); McCollum (2015); Arzhanov (2019b).

7. On the Aristotelian logical tradition in Syriac see Baumstark (1900) and (1905); Furlani (1916, 1922, 1921–22, 1922a, 1922b, 1923a, 1923b, 1928, 1933), and Georr (1948), to be corrected in the light of Brock (1993) and Hugonnard-Roche (2004), 60–62. See also Hugonnard-Roche (2012a); Watt (2014, 2017); Aydin (2019); Kessel (2019). On the Syriac versions of Porphyry’s Isagoge, see Brock (1993) and Hugonnard-Roche (2012). On the Syriac reception of the De Interpretatione see Hugonnard-Roche (2013). In addition to Porphyry’s Isagoge, also other works by Porphyry have been translated into Syriac: parts of the Philosophical History (see below note 49) and, according to Altheim and Stiehl (1962), also parts of the so-called Against the Christians. A treatise in Syriac, unknown in Greek, has been attributed to Porphyry by Arzhanov (2021). Besides Porphyry (or works connected in a way or another with him), there are Syriac translations also of collections of sayings, like that which is ascribed to Pythagoras’ wife Theano (see Possekel [1998]; Brock 2003) and the ‘Sayings’ of the pseudo-Menander (see Bettiolo 2003; Arzhanov 2019). Other translations of moral writings include the pseudo-Aristotelian De Virtutibus et vitiis and Divisiones edited by Brock (2014), plus some Plutarch and Themistius: see Brock (2003) and the overview by Hugonnard-Roche (2011), who raises the question of the readership of these translations. For an overview of the knowledge of Plato’s dialogues and doctrines in the Syriac-speaking world see Hugonnard-Roche (2010); Arzhanov (2019a). Finally, on the philosophical theories about soul in the Syriac tradition see Hugonnard-Roche (2014).

8. On the Syriac and Arabic tradition of the pseudo-Aristotelian De Mundo see the survey by Raven (2003); on the Syriac version see McCollum (2011).

9. Endress (2002), 43, referring also to previous literature: See also Fiori (2010); King (2010a).

10. Up-to-date survey of Sergius’ translations and personal works in Hugonnard-Roche (2004, 125–32). See also King (2010); Fiori (2011, 2014); Watt (2015, 2017); Aydin (2016); Perkams (2019, 2019a); Arzhanov (2024).

11. On the Syriac translations of mathematical, astronomical and scientific works in general see Hugonnard-Roche (2001), 36–41; Villey (2014). On the different stages of the translations from Greek into Syriac and the increasing importance of philosophy with respect to rhetoric, see Hugonnard-Roche (2011). For a general survey and up-to-date bibliography see Kessel (2019).

12. According to Gutas (2006), 97 “These letters (…) derive primarily from Byzantine manuals of administration and warfare (the Tactica) with accretions from Greek material from the classical and Hellenistic periods, and from so-called Hermetic material deriving from sundry sources”. The pseudo-Aristotelian letters have been edited by Maróth (2006), review by Gutas (2009).

13. Ryan and Schmitt (1982); for a status quaestionis see Zonta (2003a). For a comprehensive updated research see Forster (2006, 2025).

14. According to the 12th century historian Saʿid al-Andalusi, Ibn al-Muqaffaʿ was the first to deal with logic: see Kraus (1934), Hermans (2018).

15. K. al-Fihrist, 248.27 Flügel = 309.9 Tajaddud and 249.4 Flügel = 309.14 Tajaddud. This work is extant and edited: Danish Pazuh (1978). The attribution to either Ibn al-Muqaffaʿ or his son is ruled out by Vallat (2011), 69, but is assessed by Hermans (2018), 84: “the translator was either Ibn al-Muqaffaʿ or his son, both Persian secretaries”. If so, the consequence is that the translations from Middle Persian carried out under the reign of al-Mansur included, besides other works translated from this language, also works on logic. From Middle Persian were translated mostly works of astrology, but also “mirrors for princes”. On the translations into Middle Persian (mostly from Sanskrit and Greek) see Zakeri 2022; van Bladel 2025; on the translations from Middle Persian into Arabic, see van Bladel 2025a; on the “mirrors for princes” in early Arabic literature, see Marlow (2013); Van Ruymbeke (2020). Even apart the compendium of logic mentioned above, there are traces of knowledge of Porphyry’s Isagoge even in this early stage of Arabic philosophy, i.e. before the translation carried out later on, from Syriac into Arabic, by Abu ʿUthman al-Dimashqi (see below, note 79). Porphyry’s work is echoed by the title of an Epistle by al-Kindi: On the Five Predicables, now lost (256.16 Flügel = 313.22 Tajaddud).

16. Danish Pazuh (1978); cf. Elamrani Jamal (1989), 510; Hermans (2018).

17. Brock (1999); this translation might be hinted at in the K. al-Fihrist (249.18 Flügel = 309.28 Tajaddud); see Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525 and Gutas (1998), 61. Brock (1999) highlights the role of Aristotelian logic in the inter-faith controversy. See also Suermann (2000); Griffith (2007a, 2009); Berti (2009); Heimgartner (2012). The role of Greek philosophy, and especially of Aristotelian logic, in the formation of Muslim theology (Kalam) is matter of a prolonged debate in scholarship: see Wolfson (1976), van Ess (1976), Frank (1979) and (1992); Treiger (2016). On Kalam as such see the survey by Griffel (2011) and the companion edited by Schmidtke (2016). The reference work on the formative period of Muslim theology is van Ess (1991–97). On the attitude of the Muslim theologians toward philosophy see the overview by Kukkonen (2011).

18. Aouad 1989c, 456–7; extensive study by Vagelpohl 2008. On Ibn al-Samh’s “edition” see below note 105.

19. K. al-Fihrist, 244.5–6 Flügel = 304.27 Tajaddud (where however Sallam and al-Abrash appear as two people).

20. See Sourdel (1962). Gutas (1998), 78–79 outlines al-Ma’mun’s education, which was “imbued with the Zoroastrian Sasanian imperial ideology first applied to the Islamic empire by al-Mansur” and calls attention to his “reliance on astrology and hence his deep study of the ancient books”, both leading him to view “the ʿAbbasid dynasty as the inheritors of the past empires in the area”. Gutas points also to al-Ma’mun’s way of understanding the leadership, after his return to Baghdad and the conquest of the power, to the cost of the murder of the caliph (and his brother) al-Amin: “al-Ma’mun’s new policy was based on an absolutist interpretation of Islam, with the Caliph as the ultimate arbiter of dogma”. See also Cooperson (2005). Nawas (2015) argues convincingly for al-Ma’mun’s strong conception of his God-given authority as the rationale behind his decision to impose the doctrine of the “created Qur’an” via the “inquisition” (mihna). To this caliphal policy is connected is some way the rise in the court and the ʿAbbasid elite of a propensity for the foreign wisdom; see Adamson (2003).

21. On this development, see the all-embracing analysis by Endress (1987) and (1992), summarized as follows in Endress (1997a), 44–45: “An element of personal competition and resulting animosity between the intellectual circles of rationalist theologians (…), of traditionists (…) and of the rising community of scientists—the vanguard of intellectual innovation—was the obvious result of the official and semi-official encouragement of the Hellenistic movement. The leaders of the administration furthered and financed translations of scientific (mainly astronomical and mathematical) and medical works on a large scale. Foremost was the ʿAbbasid caliph: the court library founded by Harun al-Rashid was expanded by his son al-Ma’mun and devoted exclusively to the rational sciences with a continuing predominance of astronomy: the Bayt al-hikma. (…) The medium of most of this activity was Arabic: a language in the course of being standardized by normative grammar, and being instrumentalized as the code of communication in a centralized theocratic state”.

22. The scientific nature of the works studied and translated within the context of the Bayt al-hikma is accounted for in detail by Endress (1987), 423–9. See also Di Branco (2012).

23. See, with different emphasis on the scope and nature of the Bayt al-hikma, Balty-Guesdon (1992), Micheau (1997), Gutas (1998), 58–60, and Di Branco (2012).

24. See Endress (1997a) and, on al-Kindi, Adamson (2006) and (2011); Endress (2012b); Endress - Adamson (2012).

25. Ed. by Abu Rida (1950) and Rashed-Jolivet (1999); English trans. Ivry (1974); Adamson-Pormann (2012).

26. K. al-Fihrist, 251.27–28 Flügel = 312.14 Tajaddud. On Kindi’s importance in the creation of the agenda of subsequent Arabic thought see Endress (2007, 2012a); on Kindi’s role in the creation of the pseudo-Aristotelian texts out of Neoplatonic materials, see D’Ancona (2001, 2011b, 2017).

27. The K. al-Fihrist, 246.15–16 Flügel = 306.29–307.1 Tajaddud, claims that the Timaeus was translated by Ibn al-Bitriq (“the son of the Patrikios”, a Byzantine title: see Endress 1997a, 55). Ibn al-Bitriq was one of the translators whose works bear the typical features of the “circle of al-Kindi”. See on this translator Dunlop (1959); Strohmaier (2021). On the knowledge of the Timaeus in the Arabic-speaking world see the outstanding study by Arnzen (2012); on the role of Galen in the Arabic reception of the Timaeus, see again Arnzen (2012) and Das (2020); see also below notes 51 and 74.

28. Either the dialogue itself or a doxographical report concerning the speeches about love lies in the background of Kindi’s Epistle The Agreement of the Philosophers regarding the signs of passionate love, which is lost to us, but is quoted by the 9th century physician Ibn Bakhtishu: see Klein-Franke (1973) and Gutas (1988a).

29. The Myth of Er of Republic X, 614 A - 621 D is known to al-Kindi. Various explanations have been advanced for this: see Furlani (1922c), Walzer (1937), Genequand (1987–88) and Endress (1994). The Myth of Gyges of Republic II, 359 D - 360 B features in the Epistles of the Brethren of Purity: see Baffioni (2001); another passage from the Republic has been discovered by Reisman (2004), and paraphrases of selected passages have been found by Arberry (1955). For a general survey on the Arabic Plato see Arnzen (2009, 2011, 2012); Gutas (2012).

30. It has been copied in the margins of a manuscript housed in Leiden, which is at one and the same time also the only testimony of Averroes’ Great Commentary on the Metaphysics and of the other versions of the Arabic text of Aristotle’s Metaphysics. This unique document is available in the outstanding edition and study by Bouyges (1938–48, available also online at https://learningroads.cfs.unipi.it/bibliotheca-arabica-scholasticorum-online/). For a survey on the translations of Aristotle’s Metaphysics see Martin (1989); Martini Bonadeo (2003), with reference to previous literature; Bertolacci (2005); for a detailed study of Ustath translation see Geoffroy (2003, 2003a). The importance of the Metaphysics for the rise of falsafa is apparent not only from Kindi’s First Philosophy (see above note 25), but also from the Concise Exposition of Aristotle’s Metaphysics by the Harranian astronomer and mathematician Thabit ibn Qurra (d. 901). A prominent figure of the caliphal court in Baghdad, roughly in the age of al-Kindi, Thabit ibn Qurra was deeply involved also in Aristotelian logic and metaphysics, which he interpreted in Neoplatonic vein: see Reisman (2011) and the edition and translation of the Concise Exposition of Aristotle’s Metaphysics by Reisman - Bertolacci (2009).

31. Eustathius, in all likelihood of Byzantine origin; he is also credited with the translation of Olympiodorus’ commentary on the De Gen. corr. (see below, note 47), and has been identified as the translator of books V-X of the Nicomachean Ethics by Ullmann (2011-2012).

32. Translated by Ibn al-Bitriq: see Endress (1997a), 58; Vagelpohl (2010).

33. A translation of the Soph. El. into Syriac is attributed to ʿAbd al-Masih ibn Naʿima al-Himsi: K. al-Fihrist 249.26–28 Flügel = 310.9–10 Tajaddud, mentioning also the subsequent translation into Arabic by Ibn Bakus al-ʿUshari; the manuscript of the so-called “Organon of Baghdad” attributes one of the three Arabic translations of the Soph. El. to Ibn Naʿima al-Himsi: see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 526–8; Vagelpohl (2010). Note that Hugonnard-Roche (forthcoming) raises doubts about ibn Naʿima al-Himsi’s authorship of this translation.

34. As mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.28 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud, the De Caelo was translated by Ibn al-Bitriq. The translation is extant and edited: Badawi (1961); however, the text as it has come down to us is not Ibn al-Bitriq’s translation itself, but rather features a revision of it: see Endress (1966) and (1995a), 47–8; Hugonnard-Roche (2003a); Endress (2017, 2022).

35. Ibn al-Bitriq translated also the Meteorologica. This translation is extant and edited: Schoonheim (2000); see also Schoonheim (2003).

36. The Arabic translation of De Gen. an. (mentioned under the general heading of K. al-Hayawan) is attributed to Ibn al-Bitriq in the K. al-Fihrist, 251.26 Flügel = 312.8 Tajaddud; the translation is extant and edited: Brugman - Drossaart Lulofs (1971); see Kruk (2003), 329, who challenges Ibn al-Bitriq’s authorship. The translation of the De Part. an. also is attributed to Ibn al-Bitriq under the same heading (K. al-Fihrist, see above in this note); the translation is extant: Kruk (1979); see also Kruk (2003) and Coda (2017). The books of the Historia animalium translated into Arabic that have come down to us as the first part of the K. al-Hayawan have been edited by Filius et al. (2019).

37. The Arabic translation of the De Anima edited by Badawi (1954) and Al-Ahwani (1962) under the name of Ishaq ibn Hunayn (see note 68) is not by him. It rather traces back to this early stage of the Graeco-Arabic translations, as suggested first by Frank (1958–9). See in the same vein Gätje (1971); for a survey of the problems involved in the translations and revisions of the De Anima see Ivry (2001); Elamrani Jamal (2003), 346–58.

38. Editio princeps: Dieterici (1882); another edition has been provided by Badawi (1955a).

39. For futher details see the entry on the Theology of Aristotle and D’Ancona (2021); survey and bibliography in Aouad (1989b), Adamson (2003); D’Ancona (2003, 2011a, 2017, 2017a). On the Epistle on the Divine Science, i.e. another part of the Arabic Plotinus which was not included in the so-called Theology, see D’Ancona (2020).

40. Editio princeps: Bardenhewer (1888); another edition has been provided by Badawi (1955b); for the status quaestionis see D’Ancona-Taylor (2003).

41. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; see Rashed (2003). This translation is not extant; for the extant fragments of the later translation by Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus see below, note 111. On the early acquaintance of the Arab readership with Alexander’s interpretation of the De Generatione et corruptione see Kupreeva (2004), esp. 314-17.

42. Daiber (1980), 4. On the life and works of Qusta ibn Luqa see Gabrieli (1912); on Qusta’s philosohical and scientific ideas see Daiber (1990); on his treatise On the Difference between the Soul and the Spirit see Livingston (1981); Wilcox (1987); Troupeau, Dagher, Miquel (2011).

43. The translation of Plotinus’ treatises is heavily adapted. The translator, as mentioned in the Arabic work itself, was the Christian ʿAbd al-Masih ibn Naʿima al-Himsi, allegedly also the translator of the Soph. El. (see above, note 33). For some, ʿAbd al-Masih ibn Naʿima al-Himsi was also the author of the adaptation of the Plotinian writings (status quaestionis in D’Ancona 2021). ʿAbd al-Masih ibn Naʿima al-Himsi is credited also with the translation of part of the commentary on the Physics by John Philoponus (see below, note 45).

44. See above, note 39.

45. K. al-Fihrist, 250.18 Flügel = 311.1 Tajaddud; see Endress (1977), 36–37; Lettinck (1994), 5–6 and Giannakis (2002–3, 2011); see also Hasnaoui (1994). Extracts from the commentary on the Physics are found in the so-called “Physics of Baghdad”, a manuscript housed in Leiden which contains the Arabic version of Aristotle’s Physics accompanied by notes taken from various commentaries, among which Philoponus’. On the doctrines held in it and witnessed in the “Physics of Baghdad” see Davidson (1979), Zimmermann (1987) and Giannakis (1992). Up-to-date analysis of the primary data and of the bibliography by Gannagé (2012), 518–31, containing also an in-depth account of the influence of Philoponus’ physical theories on Muslim thought. On the knowledge of the works and ideas of Philoponus in the Arabic-speaking world see also Chase (2012); D’Ancona (2019).

46. On the influence of Philoponus’ arguments against eternalism see Davidson (1987), Gannagé (2012), 546–9. That Philoponus’ De Aeternitate mundi was translated into Arabic in its entirety is suggested by Ibn al-Qifti’s remark that this work which he has ready at hand is a “huge book” (D’Ancona 2019, 215 with note 78).

47. K. al-Fihrist, 251.5 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; see Rashed (2003), 312. On the translator Ustath see above, note 31.

48. See Daiber (1980, 1994); Gutas (1994); survey on the doxographical literature in Arabic by Strohmaier (2011). The Arabic versions of various items of the Greek doxographical literature on ancient physical doctrines provided in all likelihood the main link between the atomistic views held by Muʿtazilite theology and Greek atomism. However, the details of this transmission are matter of debate: see Pines (1936); Baffioni (1982); Dhanani (1994); Sabra (2006); see also the overview by Baffioni (2011). Another conduit of information about atomism was Plotinus’ anti-Stoic argumentation which embeds detailed discussion of atomism, known through the translation of Enneads IV-VI (D’Ancona 2015).

49. Rudolph (1989). On the doxographical and gnomological literature see Rosenthal (1937) and (1941); Gutas (1975) and (1981); Daiber (1994); De Smet (1998); Cottrell (2008) and, for an overview of the problems, D’Ancona (2011c, 1059). On the Siwan al-hikma (Repository of Wisdom), one of the most important pieces of the doxographical literature in Arabic, see Al-Qadi (1981). Another important collection of philosophical doctrines has been edited by Wakelnig (2014); see also Wakelnig (2015); (2022). In recent scholarship Ammonius son of Hermeias, the Neoplatonic commentator of Aristotle active in the early 6th century Alexandria, has been credited with decisive influence on Arabic philosophy (especially al-Farabi and Avicenna) on two counts: the doctrine of the harmony between Plato and Aristotle, and the understanding of the scope of Aristotle’s Metaphysics: see Wisnowsky (2003), 21–141 and Bertolacci (2006), 65–95. In the entry on Aristotle, the K. al-Fihrist mentions Ammonius’ commentaries on the Categories (248.21 Flügel = 309.5 Tajaddud) and on the Topics (249.24–25 Flügel = 310.7 Tajaddud); in the entry on Ammonius, three writings are mentioned which lie in the background of the influence attributed to him in the studies mentioned above. For a note of caution, one may see D’Ancona (2008).

50. Bergsträsser (1932); Watt (2004, 2014a, 2015); Griffith (2007b); King (2022). On his translations of Galen’s works Hunayn wrote an Epistle (edited first by Bergsträsser 1925) which has been repeatedly studied both from the point of view of the history of medicine and from that of the translation studies; the Epistle has been edited anew by Lamoreaux (2016). For a list of Galen’s works in the Arabic-speaking world see Boudon (2000), 458–60; for an overview of the Arabic circulation of the textbooks of medical instruction in Greek (mostly based on Galen), see Biesterfeldt (2011a); for a survey on medicine and philosophy in the Arabic-speaking world, see Biesterfeldt (2011b).

51. K. al-Fihrist, 246.15–16 Flügel = 306.29–307.1 Tajaddud. On the earlier Arabic translation of the Timaeus see above note 27. The knowledge of the Timaeus in the Arabic-speaking world appears to be inextricably connected with that of Galen’s exegesis of this Platonic work (see below note 74). Arnzen (2013) calls attention to a letter by Hunayn “addressed to Salmawayh ibn Bunān, court physician and personal doctor of the ʿAbbāsid caliph al-Muʿtasim. From this letter we learn that Hunayn prepared a translation of Galen’s Περὶ ἐθῶν and attached the two excerpts of the commentaries by Galen and Proclus to this translation, because he deemed them suitable for a better understanding of the Galenic work” (Arnzen 2013, 5).

52. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5–6 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud. The knowledge of the Laws in the Arabic-speaking world is a nest of problems. The translation by Hunayn is listed in the K. al-Fihrist under the title Kitāb al-nawāmīs, roughly corresponding to the Greek title Νόμοι, and an Arabic translation of Plato’s Νόμοι or parts thereof must indeed have existed: Gabrieli (1947) detected its traces in al-Bīrūnī’s India. However, the Arabic work which bears the title Kitāb al-nawāmīs (edited: Badawi 1974, 197-234) has nothing to do with the Laws, featuring instead a cento of magic (Saif 2016, who challenges the parallel nawāmīs/Νόμοι, suggesting rather “The sacred secrets of Plato” as a title). Plato’s genuine Laws are reflected, instead, in a work by the philosopher al-Farabi (d. 950), namely the Summary of Plato’s Laws (edited by Gabrieli 1952; new edition by Druart 1998) but there is no scholarly consensus on the exact source of this work. For some, al-Farabi had direct access to an Arabic version of Plato’s Laws (see esp. Mahdi 1961); others (see esp. Gutas 1997), think that the source is Galen’s lost summary of this Platonic work; for a more nuanced position, see Harvey (2003).

53. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud. Reisman (2004) calls attention to a passage from the Republic quoted by the tenth century scholar Abū Ḥāmid al-Isfizārī, showing that, besides the knowledge of the contents of this Platonic work based on Galen’s summary translated by Ḥunayn (see below note 74), other sources of information were available: “I would hazard the guess that there was more of Plato’s Republic circulating among medieval Arabic authors than the synopsis of Galen, some source which, while perhaps not a translation of the entire work, most certainly contained sophisticated translations of the more important passages for Neoplatonism in Islam” (Reisman 2004, 270-71). For a detailed analysis of the meaning of “commentary” in this context see Reisman (2004, 265 with note 6).

54. K. al-Fihrist, 246.11–12 Flügel = 306.25–26 Tajaddud. The K. al-Fihrist presents the ductus “s ṭ s ṭ s”, and Flügel (volume II, 112) tentatively identifies the dialogue in question with the Sophist; the commentator (the K. al-Fihrist has “bi-tafsīr, with the commentary”) is “al-msrdyus” (Flügel) or “al-msrduyus” (Tajaddud), interpreted by Flügel as “al-Imqīdurus /Olympiodorus”.

55. K. al-Fihrist, 248.20 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud. However, the manuscript which contains the translation attributes it to Ishaq; see Hugonnard-Roche (1993). The translation is edited: Badawi (1980); see Elamrani-Jamal (1989), 510–12.

56. K. al-Fihrist, 249.1 Flügel = 309.12 Tajaddud. The translation is edited: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 513–15; (2004a).

57. K. al-Fihrist, 249.6 Flügel = 309.17 Tajaddud; this Tayadurus has been identified with Tadhari ibn Basil Akhi Istifan, a translator of the circle of Hunayn: see Lameer (1994), 4. The Arabic translation is edited: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 516–20; Vagelpohl (2010).

58. K. al-Fihrist, 249.11–12 Flügel = 309.23 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 520–1; (1993); Elamrani-Jamal (1989), 521–4. This translation, lost to us, provided the basis for the Arabic version by Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus (see below, note 94).

59. K. al-Fihrist, 249.15 Flügel = 309.27 Tajaddud. Later on (249.24–25 Flügel = 310.7 Tajaddud) we are told that Ishaq translated “what Ammonius and Alexander have commented upon”: see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524 and Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525. A translation into Arabic of the Syriac version was made by Yahya ibn ʿAdi (see below, note 102).

60. On this physician and translator see Endress (1995b).

61. K. al-Fihrist, 249.16 Flügel = 309.27–28 Tajaddud. The translation is edited: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524 and Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525.

62. K. al-Fihrist, 250.1 Flügel = 310.13 Tajaddud; a translation by Ibrahim ibn ʿAbd Allah is also recorded (250.2 Flügel = 310.13 Tajaddud).

63. Lyons (1982); see Aouad (1989c), 455–9 and Watt-Aouad (2003), 219–23; see also above, note 18 and below, note 105.

64. As witnessed in the manuscript Leiden, Bibl. der Rijksuniversiteit, or. 583, which contains the translation (edited: Badawi 1984). A translation, perhaps only of books IV–V, is attributed to Abu ʿUthman al-Dimashqi in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.14 Flügel = 310.25 Tajaddud. The Arabic translation of Book VIII by Ishaq ibn Hunayn has been edited by Arnzen 2021. On the Arabic circulation of the Physics see Giannakis (1993); Lettinck (1994), 3–6, (2002, 2015); Arzhanov-Arnzen (2014); Puig Montada (2018).

65. K. al-Fihrist, 250.28–29 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (2003), 284–86; Endress (2017, 2022).

66. K. al-Fihrist, 251.3 Flügel = 311.17 Tajaddud.

67. There are hints that it was Ishaq’s translation which was translated into Latin by Gerard of Cremona in the 12th century: see Serra (1973) and (1997); Rashed (2003), 304–5.

68. K. al-Fihrist, 251.11–18 Flügel = 311.24–312.3 Tajaddud. The Arabic translation of the De Anima edited under Ishaq’s name is in fact an earlier version: see above note 37.

69. K. al-Fihrist, 251.26 Flügel = 312.12 Tajaddud. Books Alpha Meizon, Gamma, Theta and Iota of Ishaq’s translation have come down to us thanks to Averroes’ Great Commentary; for this translation and the other translations of separate books of the Metaphysics (especially Lambda), see Martin (1989), 531–32 and Martini Bonadeo (2003), 262. On the earlier translation of the Metaphysics see above note 30; on the title Book of Letters under which the Arabic Metaphysics was also known see Bertolacci (2023).

70. K. al-Fihrist, 252.2 Flügel = 312.19 Tajaddud; the translation has been edited by Badawi (1978) and by Akasoy-Fidora (2005). Both editions should now be compared with the detailed critical assessment by Ullmann (2011-2012); as for the authorship of this translation, Ullmann (2011-2012) demonstrates that only books I-IV were translated by Ishaq, while the extant books V–X were translated by Ustath (see above note 31). For the relationship between the Arabic and the Greek Nicomachean Ethics see Schmidt-Ullmann (2012); for a survey on Aristotle’ ethical works in Arabic see Zonta (2003, 192–3).

71. Edition: Kellerman-Rost 1965; see Cacouros (2003), 511–13 and 537–42; Dorandi-Marjani (2017) .

72. For the mention of Theophrastus’ Metaphysics see K. al-Fihrist, 252.5–11 Flügel = 312.21–26 Tajaddud; for the discussion of the authorship of the translation see Alon (1985) and Gutas (2010), 84–9. The De Causis plantarum and in part the De Sensu et sensato were translated by Ibn Bakkus, one of the translators associated with Hunayn’s circle. On the Arabic tradition of Theophrastus’ works see Daiber (1985), Gutas (1985, 1992, 2010); Crubellier (1992); on the indirect knowledge of Theophrastus’ ideas in the Arabic-speaking world through the translation of Themistius’ paraphrases see Gutas (1999). On the knowledge of the doxographical tradition tracing back ultimately to Theophrastus via Hunayn’s Nawādir al- Falāsifa see Wakelnig (2022).

73. Drossaart-Lulofs (1965). See below, note 109, for the Arabic version from this Syriac translation.

74. The Arabic version Galen’s summary of the Timaeus and the fragments of the summaries of other Platonic dialogues are edited in volume I of the Plato Arabus: see Kraus-Walzer (1951); on the authorship of the translation of the summary of the Timaeus, attributed to Hunayn ibn Ishaq in the manuscript sources, see ibid., 18–21. On the impact of this work in the Arabic-speaking world see Das (2020), 30-68.

75. K. al-Fihrist, 251.28 Flügel = 312.14–15 Tajaddud (it is not clear if this information refers to Book Lambda itself or to Alexander’s commentary on it); this version is lost to us.

76. The Arabic version is lost, but the Hebrew version has come down to us, and is partly available in the German translation by Moritz Steinschneider in the footnotes to the 1887 edition of the Greek text. This Hebrew version mentions Ishaq ibn Hunayn as the translator into Arabic. See Gätje (1971), 69–70.

77. Edited by Genequand (2001, 2017); this work, lost in Greek, had already been translated into Syriac: see above, note 9.

78. In on of the two manuscripts containing this version the translation is attributed to Ishaq, while the other credits with it Ibrahim ibn ʿAbdallah al-Nasrani al-Katib (see Genequand 2001, 31–39), mentioned in the sources as one of the translators of Aristotle’s Topics.

79. The translation is extant: see Al-Ahwani (1952), Badawi (1952, 2nd ed. 1980, 1021–68 (edition 1952), 1055–104 (edition 1980). It has been made out of the Syriac version of Athanasius of Balad (d. 687): see Gyekye (1979), 16. On the Syriac versions of the Isagoge, as well as on its circulation in Kindi’s times, see above, notes 7, 15; for a survey on the Arabic Porphyry, one may see D’Ancona (2011c); much more detailed is the all-embracing entry by Hugonnard-Roche (2012); on the Isagoge, both Syriac and Arabic, 1450–60.

80. K. al-Fihrist, 252.15 Flügel = 313.23 Tajaddud. This work is lost in Greek, but was known to Boethius.

81. K. al-Fihrist, 248.20 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud.

82. On this scholar (a pupil of Yahya ibn ʿAdi: see below, notes 109, 110) as well as on his “edition”, see Hugonnard-Roche (1993) and Martini Bonadeo (2011c).

83. K. al-Fihrist, 250.21–22 Flügel = 311.6–7 Tajaddud. This translation has not come down to us, but Porphyry’s commentary was known to some extent (and in all likelihood indirectly) to the Arab readers: an opinion held by Porphyry "in the second treatise of the Physics" is recorded by Abu Bakr al-Razi (the Rhazes of the Latin Middle Ages): see Brown (1972), Genequand (1984), Adamson (2007).

84. K. al-Fihrist, 252.2 Flügel = 312.18 Tajaddud; see Zonta (2003), 192–94. This commentary was known to some extent: al-Farabi and al-ʿAmiri refer to it (see Martini Bonadeo 2008, 56.13, 170, and Ghorab 1972)

85. Edited by Daiber (1995). On the span of time of the translation see Daiber (1995), 15.

86. Paraphrase of the De Anima: K. al-Fihrist, 251.12 Flügel = 311.25 Tajaddud. Edition: Lyons (1973); see also Browne (1986, 1998). Paraphrase of Book XII of the Metaphysics: Meyrav (2019), coming to the conclusion that “all the fragments which contain direct quotations of the work ultimately come from the original complete Arabic translation, probably the work of Isḥāq ibn Ḥunayn, and plausibly revised by Ṯābit ibn Qurra” (Meyrav 2019, 65). On the impact of this translation on falsafa see Coda (2024), 43-80. Overviews on the Arabic Themistius: Elamrani Jamal (2003), 352–3 and Coda (2011). On the (direct or indirect) knowledge of the paraphrase of the Posterior Analytics see Martini Bonadeo (2026).

87. As the earlier translation carried out in the circle of al-Kindi (see § 3, Proclus), this translation (edited: Badawi 1955, 32–42) is incomplete, but contains the first argument which is lost in Greek. While the earlier translation contains eight arguments, this one contains nine. See Anawati (1956), Endress (1973), 15–16 and (2012), 1657–61. According to Anawati (1956), 23 and Wakelnig (2012), 52 both translations were carried out on the basis of Proclus’Eighteen arguments on the Eternity of the Cosmos. This work is lost in Greek, but is preserved (except for the first argument) by Philoponus’ quotations in his De Aeternitate mundi. Since the latter was translated into Arabic (see above note 46), one might wonder whether the Arabic versions were made on the basis of this work or out of Proclus’ Eighteen arguments on the Eternity of the Cosmos: this is the conclusion of Anawati, endorsed also by Wakelnig.

88. Lost in Greek, albeit doxographically preserved by Simplicius: see Wildberg (1987).

89. It seems to be unknown to al-Kindi, whereas al-Farabi (d. 950) has written a treatise against it: see Kraemer (1965); Mahdi (1967, 1972). Up-to-date bibliography in Gannagé (2012), 537–50. Another writing by Philoponus on the createdness of the universe is extant in Arabic: see Pines (1972) and Troupeau (1984). An analysis of the intricacies of this textual tradition has been provided by Gannagé (2012), 550–2. According to the bio-bibliographical sources, Philoponus’ commentaries on the Categories, De Interpretatione, An. Pr., An. Po., Topics, and Porphyry’s Isagoge were translated into Arabic; since they are lost (although attested in various ways), and since there is no mention of the translators, it is not easy to determine when they became available to the Arab readership; also from this viewpoint Gannagé (2012), 511–18 is an accurate and clear source of information. See also D’Ancona (2019).

90. See Endress (1997b). On the reception of this model in al-Farabi and in Avicenna see Reisman (2005); Gutas (2005); Bertolacci (2006). It has been advanced by Gutas (1998b), 242–52, followed by Bertolacci (2006), 149–211, that al-Farabi marked a turning point in the Arab reception of Greek metaphysics, in so far as he realized, at variance with al-Kindi, that metaphysics does not collapse with rational theology. For another account of the divide between al-Kindi and al-Farabi see Puig Montada (2011), pointing he too to the attitudes of these two philosophers towards Muʿtazilite Kalam, but with a different emphasis. While Gutas and Bertolacci see the divide between al-Kindi and al-Farabi in that the latter was aware of the distinction between ontology and theology, Puig Montada highlights the difference between the two cosmological models: al-Kindi sides with creation in time, a basic issue of Muʿtazilite Kalam, and al-Farabi decides in favor of emanationism.

91. On the cosmopolitan atmosphere of the circle animated by Yahya ibn ʿAdi and his successor Abu Sulayman al-Sijistani see Kraemer (1992), outlining as follows the membership and main features of this group: “The chief architects of this philosophic humanism in our period were the Christian philosophers Yahya b. ʿAdi and his immediate disciples. They divide into two groups. The first—Ibn ʿAdi’s Christian pupils—continued the (predominantly Christian) tradition of meticulous textual editing, translating and commenting, which goes back to Hunayn b. Ishaq and his school (…). The second group of disciples were Muslim scholars (…) in the circles of Yahya b. ʿAdi and of his pupil Abu Sulayman al-Sijistani, and in the general ambiance of the time, Muslims, Christians, Jews, Sabians, and Mazdaeans communed in the study of the ancients—united by what Werner Jaeger once called ‘the ecumenical power of antiquity’.” (Kraemer [1992], 6–7). The reference work on Yahya ibn ʿAdi is Endress (1977); see also below note 101.

92. The ancient sources record an argument he had in the year 938 with the grammarian Abu Saʿid al-Sirafi about the meaning and importance to translate into Arabic the Greek works, in particular Aristotle’s. While for Abu Bishr Matta translating was the gate for reaching a universal form of knowledge, Abu Saʿid al-Sirafi challenged the very possibility of rendition of concepts from Greek, which he saw as a dead language, into Arabic; he did not refrain from remarking also that Matta was translating from Syriac instead of from Greek. See Endress (1986).

93. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud. See Gutas (2012), 852–3 and above note 52.

94. K. al-Fihrist, 249.12 Flügel = 309.23 Tajaddud; see Elamrani Jamal (1989), 522. Another Arabic version of an unknowk author lies in the background of Averroes’ Middle Commentary on the An. Po., as shown by Minio Paluello (1951); Hugonnard-Roche (1999) has convincingly argued that this version is later than Abu Bishr Matta’s one and counts as a reworking of it, possibly influenced by Themistius’ paraphrasis of the An. Po. (on the Arabic version of this work see also Martini Bonadeo 2026).

95. K. al-Fihrist, 250.4 Flügel = 310.16 Tajaddud. The translation is extant: Tkatsch (1928–32); Taran and Gutas (2012); see also Schrier (1997); Hugonnard-Roche (2003c), 208–10; Taran and Gutas (2012), 77-127.

96. K. al-Fihrist, 249.21 Flügel = 312.9 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 527. For a survey on the circulation of Aristotle’s logical works in the Arabic-speaking world see El-Rouayheb (2011).

97. K. al-Fihrist, 250.29 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (2003 a), 284; Endress (2017, 2022).

98. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; see Rashed (2003), 305. Rashed (2015) edited also an epitome of the De Generatione et corruptione, that he considers to be the work of the 10-th century theologian Al-Hasan ibn Musa al-Nawbakhti.

99. K. al-Fihrist, 251.20 Flügel = 312.2 Tajaddud; see Hasnaoui (1996) and Di Martino (2003), 375–78.

100. K. al-Fihrist, 251.28 Flügel = 312.14–15 Tajaddud: see above, note 75, for the (lost) translation into Syriac attributed to Hunayn ibn Ishaq; the Arabic translation is lost too, but some quotations appear in Averroes’ Great Commentary, as mentioned in the main text by note 75; for further details see Martin (1989), 532 and Martini Bonadeo (2003), 263.

101. On Yahya ibn ʿAdi’s biography and work see, in addition to Endress (1977), Platti (1983); Martini Bonadeo (2003a); (2011e); for an overview of his translations, see also Kraemer (1992), 108–10. Recent scholarship on this prominent scholar of 10th century Baghdad includes Endress (2015) and Wisnovsky (2012).

102. K. al-Fihrist, 251.15–16 Flügel = 309.27 Tajaddud; see Endress (1977), 26; Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524; Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525.

103. K. al-Fihrist, 249.27 Flügel = 310.9 Tajaddud); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 527.

104. K. al-Fihrist, 250.4–5 Flügel = 310.16 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (2003c), 211; Watt (2005).

105. Lyons (1982), xxiii-xxiv; see Stern (1956), Aouad (1989c), 457, and Martini Bonadeo (2011b); see also notes 18 and 63 above. On the influence of the Rhetoric on Arabic philosophical thought see Black (1990); Vagelpohl (2008).

106. On this physician, Nestorian Christian, and commentator of Aristotle see Ferrari (2006); on his work on the earlier Arabic version of Aristotle’s De Caelo see Endress (2017).

107. K. al-Fihrist, 252.11 Flügel = 312.26 Tajaddud; see Gutas (2010), 84–5.

108. See above, note 73.

109. K. al-Fihrist, 264.26 Flügel = 323.7–8 Tajaddud: see Drossaart Lulofs (1965), 10 and 39. The Arabic translation survives only in the fragments quoted by Averroes’ in his Great Commentary on the Metaphysics: see Freudenthal (1885), 126–27. On Ibn Zurʿa see Martini Bonadeo (2011d).

110. K. al-Fihrist, 254.1–4 Flügel = 314.9–12 Tajaddud: see Drossaart Lulofs (1965), 13 and 39.

111. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud. English translation of the remnants of this Arabic version: Gannagé (2005); cf. also Fazzo (2003), 63 and Rashed (2003), 312–14.

112. Mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 251.9 Flügel = 311.22 Tajaddud; see Endress (1977), 25–26.

113. The translation by Abu Bishr Matta was corrected by Yahya ibn ʿAdi: see Goulet-Aouad (1989), 130; Hugonnard-Roche (2003), 287; Endress (2017, 2022).

114. This translation is edited and translated into French by Thillet (2003).

115. K. al-Fihrist, 250.22–23 Flügel = 311.7 Tajaddud; see Coda (2011), 1262; Arnzen (2021).

116. Lettinck (1994), 4: “The Leiden MS which contains Ishaq’s translation is the outcome of the study of the Physics in the Baghdad school of Yahya ibn ʿAdi (d. 973) and his pupil Abu ʿAli ibn as-Samh (d. 1027). Besides the Arabic text of the Physics it contains commentaries by Ibn as-Samh, Yahya ibn ʿAdi, Yahya’s teacher Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus (d. 940), and Abu l-Faraj ibn at-Tayyib (d. 1044). In addition a few comments of Alexander and Themistius are quoted, as well as some phrases from the translations of Qusta and ad-Dimashqi. Many comments in Books III–VII are preceded by the name ‘Yahya’; they appear to be a summary or paraphrase of Philoponus’ commentary. (…) The editor of the text in the Leiden MS was Abu l-Husayn al-Basri (d. 1044), a pupil of Ibn as-Samh”. See also Giannakis (1993); (1995–96); up-to-date survey by Gannagé (2012), 518–21.

117. This paraphrasis is mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.30 Flügel = 311.13 Tajaddud: it has been translated by Abu Bishr Matta and corrected by Yahya ibn ʿAdi. The Arabic version is lost; its Hebrew translation is extant and has been edited, together with the Latin version: Landauer (1902); see Hugonnard-Roche (2003a), 287; Coda (2011), 1263; Coda (2012); Coda (2024), 81-116; Endress (2022).

118. Paraphrasis of the An. Po.: K. al-Fihrist, 249.13 Flügel = 309.24 Tajaddud: this text is lost, but was known to Averroes: see Hugonnard-Roche (1999). The Latin translation made from Arabic is extant: see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 52, Coda (2011), 1261–2. Paraphrasis of Metaphysics Lambda: K. al-Fihrist, 251.29–30 Flügel = 312.15–16 Tajaddud; edition: Meyrav (2019); see also Brague (1999). On the importance of this work in shaping the subsequent interpretations of Aristotle’s philosophical theology see Pines (1987); Coda (2024), 43-80. A more complicated issue is that of Themistius’ work on the Topics, whose Arabic translation is lost, but was known to Averroes. It is mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist twice, namely in the entry on Aristotle apropos the Topics (24923 Flügel = 310.6 Tajaddud) and in that on Abu Bishr Matta (246.1 Flügel = 322.15 Tajaddud). It has been advanced by Hasnawi (2007) that the two mentions may point to different works; on Averroes’ quotations, see Gutas (1999); for an overview with up-to-date bibliography, see Coda (2011), 1261–3.

119. K. al-Fihrist, 248.21 Flügel = 309.5 Tajaddud; see Zimmermann (1981), cii n. 1.

120. K. al-Fihrist, 251.8 Flügel = 311.22 Tajaddud. The commentary was translated by Abu Bishr Matta and annotated by Abu ʿAmr al-Tabari: see Hasnaoui (1996), 41–2. It is lost to us; for an epitome of the Meteorologica attributed to Olympiodorus see Badawi (1971), 95–190 and above § 4, Olympiodorus.

121. K. al-Fihrist, 251.5 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud: see Rashed (2003), 312.

122. K. al-Fihrist, 251.13–14 Flügel = 311.26 Tajaddud: see Elamrani Jamal (2003), 354.

123. K. al-Fihrist, 248.21 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud.

124. See above, note 49.