Capitalism

First published Wed Aug 5, 2026

The case can be made that a more contested concept than capitalism does not exist. There is no agreement upon how or whether to define it. Many would identify capitalism with an economic system where productive assets are privately owned, labor is hired for money wages through market contracts, commodities are traded through exchange markets, markets govern the allocation of resources between productive and other activities, investment is largely in private hands, and production is oriented towards profit. However, each of these features, if taken separately, can be shown to have existed for a very long time, leaving open the question of what makes capitalism a historically distinctive economic system (Neal and Williamson 2014: ch. 1).

Further, there is disagreement as to whether capitalism can be reduced to an economic system in the first place. As some scholars have argued, capitalism may be understood as more than just a way of organizing the economy. It is “an institutionalized social order” – a way of organizing society and its reproduction as a whole (Fraser 2022: 3; see also Streeck 2016). The distinctive feature of this mode of social organization, in this view, includes a sharp separation of the economic sphere from the political and social spheres. Economic activities, including relations of production and market exchange, are detached from familial, social, and political relations, and presented as autonomous. However, it is argued that such autonomy is largely a fiction, which obscures the fact that economic production, as well as the smooth functioning of markets, ultimately and necessarily depend on the care labor primarily performed by women within the household, as well as on the exploitation of nature, and the presence of stable political institutions (Fraser 2014). But if capitalism can be found at work everywhere, this raises the question of how to delimit the phenomenon.

Beyond disagreement about whether capitalism is an economic system or an institutionalized social order, there is also disagreement about how – through which methods and with the help of which disciplines – to answer the question of what capitalism is in the first place. While some believe that answering this question should be the purview of economic theory and conceptual analysis, others emphasize how capitalism is an historically specific phenomenon, the constitution and development of which can only be identified through the study of history, whose complexity may confound analytic precision. Given these disagreements, it is not surprising that no unitary conversation about capitalism exists among disciplines.

Surely, an entry such as this one might cover an extraordinary variety of themes and thinkers. But coverage must be selective and disputable, leaving aside matters that others might plausibly argue are no less essential than what is chosen for discussion here. Since this is an entry primarily addressed to people who have philosophical and normative interests in capitalism, we will exclusively focus on those accounts of capitalism that have most influenced contemporary philosophical work on the subject. Additionally, our attention will be concentrated on contemporary normative arguments about capitalism, rather than, say, capitalism’s phenomenological, epistemological, ontological, or ideological dimensions (see Lukács 1923 [1971]; Benjamin 1936 [1969]; Horkheimer and Adorno 1947 [2002]; Althusser 1995 [2014]). What normative reasons and values, if any, support a capitalist organization of the economy, and of society? By contrast, what reasons and values support the case for overcoming capitalism in order to try to bring about alternative modes of economic and social organization? Is there anything wrong or amiss with the way capitalism organizes economic and social life? If so, are these wrongs or ills distinctive of capitalism? Are they contingent to it, or necessary, such that they cannot be overcome but by leaving capitalism behind? Is capitalism unjust? Is it illegitimate? If capitalism is unjust, could it be tamed or regulated in ways that would make it just, while still remaining capitalism? We will leave aside questions concerning socialist alternatives to capitalism and the process of social transition to them, as they have received extensive treatment in the entry on socialism).

This entry is divided into four main parts. The first part offers a brief overview of theories of and approaches to capitalism which have influenced contemporary philosophical work on the subject. The second part surveys normative defenses of capitalism in the fields of contemporary political philosophy and normative political theory. The third part focuses on normative critiques of capitalism within these fields. The fourth part briefly surveys a set of narrower questions that touch upon particular aspects of the capitalist economy.

1. Theories of Capitalism

Since its appearance in the late nineteenth century, capitalism, among all keywords in the social sciences and humanities, has been among the most ill-defined. Keeping this in mind, the following approaches to theorizing and understanding capitalism have been the most influential for contemporary philosophy and normative theory.

1.1 Marx: capitalism as relentless accumulation

As far as theorizing capitalism is concerned, above anyone else there is Karl Marx, who, while he very rarely employed the term “capitalism,” titled his multi-volume opus Capital: A Critique of Political Economy (volume 1 1867 [1990]). For Marx, the relentless accumulation of capital is the driving dynamic of capitalism. Marx’s theory of capitalism is complex. On the one hand, Marx’s analysis of capitalism addressed industry - the relentless accumulation of industrial capital, or “the means of production,” in the forms of machines and technology. On the other hand, Marx argued that capital accumulation only occurred within a historically specific social context, or what he called “the social relations of production.” Capital is not a “thing” but a “social relation,” defined by wage labor (vol. 1, ch. 33). The widespread prominence of wage labor, and the absence of alternatives to it, is a necessary condition for the existence of capitalism. Wage-laborers must be “divorced” from the “means of production” for capitalism to exist (vol. 1, ch. 26). This divorce happens when one class, the capitalists, own the means of production as their private property, and the other class, the proletariat, own nothing else but their labor power. The latter are forced by their inability to independently access the means of subsistence to work for the capitalists. That is, since they lack their own means of production, they are forced to sell the only commodity they own, their “labor power,” in order to survive.

In addition to the commodification of labor power, for Marx a related precondition for the existence of capitalism is the widespread prominence of market exchange, and the generalization of the commodity form (vol. 1, chs. 1, 4). Workers produce neither for their own direct consumption nor for immediate consumption by their employers. Rather, they produce commodities for sale on the market. Production is oriented towards exchange, and through exchange, towards profits, and through them, accumulation.

The dual prominence of wage labor and market exchange distinguishes capitalism from what came before, feudalism, when feudal lords directly extracted from their peasant subordinates, through blatantly coercive, non-market means, whatever economic surplus might exist. This in turn means that what distinguishes capitalism is a contradiction that Marx calls “double freedom” (vol. 1, ch. 6). While under feudalism some were forced to work for others, under capitalism, by contrast, because of the existence of a labor market and contractual relations between workers and employers, labor is free, in the sense that it takes the form of a voluntarily entered market exchange. At the same time, however, owning no means of production, workers are forced to work. Further, under capitalism, the free exchange of commodities masks the unfree coercions behind wage labor, resulting from the fact that wage-earners have no alternatives to it to survive. Importantly, the unfree character of labor and production under capitalism is not a result of contingently imperfect or underregulated markets. Marx assumed the existence of perfect market competition when modelling the exchange of all commodities, including the exchange of “labor power” through the wage (although he did not make this assumption when studying particular capitalist economies).

For Marx, labor is necessarily exploited by the owners of capitalism. Marx is widely thought to use the term “exploitation” in a technical, non-moralized sense, as the extraction of “surplus value” from labor (vol. 1, ch. 9). However, Marx’s understanding of exploitation has been used to ground many normative critiques of capitalism as an unjust, because exploitative, system (more below). But what is exploitation for Marx?

According to Marx’s “labor theory of value” (vol. 1, ch. 1), the value of a commodity is determined by the amount of socially necessary labor time required for its production. This refers to the average amount of labor time needed to produce a good under normal production conditions and with average skill levels. Marx argued that capitalists, by controlling the means of production, extract surplus value from workers, which is the difference between the value workers produce and the value of the wages they receive. The latter only pay for the worker’s socially necessary labor time, or what is required for the reproduction of the worker’s labor power, which is the hours needed to produce a sum of value that covers the costs of the worker’s subsistence. The capitalist appropriates the rest of the worker’s labor time–the time needed to produce other commodities, from the sale of which the capitalist will profit–as “surplus value.” Capitalists may extract “absolute surplus value,” from the raw extension of the length of the working day, or “relative surplus value,” from increasing the productivity of labor in a given time (for this distinction see vol. 1, chs. 10, 12, and 16). The extraction of surplus value is considered exploitation because workers are not compensated for the full value they create. It is a forced extraction because the worker has no reasonable alternatives to it.

Because of market competition, to stay in business capitalists have no choice other than to pay their workers the minimal wage the labor market will allow. They also have no choice, because of market competition, other than to accumulate ever more capital, to exploit more labor, and to employ more machines and find technologies that increase labor productivity, and thereby increase the extraction of relative surplus value. The unending need to extract relative surplus value is the engine of capital accumulation, as well as capitalism’s drive to incessantly revolutionize all methods of production.

Thus for Marx capitalism is an economic system premised upon the relentless and systematic accumulation of capital, the use of innovative, disruptive technologies of production, and, last but not least, labor exploitation. On this last point, Marx believed that capitalism furthered class-consciousness among immiserated wage-earners (vol. 1, ch. 25), and that eventually they would come together and overthrow capitalism, in favor of communism.

In the vast “Marxist” literature, various commentators and philosophers have emphasized different dimensions of Marx’s analysis of capitalism (see later sections). Some emphasize the inherent “class conflict” between capitalists and wage earners and the forms of exploitation and domination it engenders (G.A. Cohen 1979, 1983; Roemer 1982a, 1982b, 1982c, 1985, 2017; Vrousalis 2021a; Gourevitch 2013). Others underscore Marx’s assertion that the “economic base” of capitalism – the relations of production – is the motor of history (G.A. Cohen 1978). Others deal with the “generalization of the commodity form” as a social, cultural, and intellectual phenomenon (Horkheimer and Adorno 1947). Others have explored Marx’s emphasis on the various “crisis tendencies” of capitalism, including its propensity for financial crises, a topic explored in the second and third volumes of Capital (Harvey 2010). Others still have explored Marx’s understanding of the “value form,” or notions of “abstract social domination” under capitalism (Postone 1993; Heinrich 2012; Mau 2023). Marx has been a starting point for feminist theorists of “social reproduction,” premised on the idea that the care and child-raring activities performed by women are also a form of exploited labor (Federici 1975, 2012; Fraser 1994, 2009, 2014, 2022; Gardiner 1976; Gerstein 1973; Vogel 1983; Dalla Costa 1972). Marx has inspired theorists of “racial capitalism,” which contend that the development of capitalism is inseparable from the creation of racialized hierarchies and the exploitation of racialized labor (Robinson 1983). Marx’s focus on “unequal exchange” under capitalism has led to writings on imperialism, dependency, and the unequal character of globalization (Luxemburg 1913 [1951]; Harvey 2003; Valdez 2023). Marx has inspired accounts of global warming and climate change, as being premised upon “cheap nature,” and not only “cheap labor” (Moore 2015; Saito 2017; Fraser 2022; Battistoni 2025a) This paragraph is hardly exhaustive, and just scratches the surface of Marx’s singular influence on contemporary writings on capitalism.

1.2 Weber: cultural capitalism

Among the most important non-Marxist interpreters of capitalism, perhaps the most influential has been the German sociologist Max Weber. In The Protestant Ethic and the Spirit of Capitalism (1904/5 [2002]), Weber agrees with Marx that wage labor is an important dimension of modern capitalism, but Weber’s understanding of capitalism is distinctively rooted in a sociological account of capitalist culture. Weber holds that the “ancient capitalism” of Roman antiquity was politically motivated (Introduction and ch. 2). The Roman empire spread market relations to further its imperial agenda. When Rome collapsed, so did capitalism. By contrast, modern capitalism is motivated by a cultural “spirit” that is sociologically internalized by modern subjects. The Protestant work ethic, a religious complex that motivated work and saving, an outward, this-world sign of a Christian soul’s salvation in the afterlife, explains the ultimate origin of capital accumulation. Shorn of its original religious motivation, the “work ethic” lives on in modern capitalism, furthered by the “iron cage” of modern “instrumental reason,” by which a rational means-end relationship in economic life—the pursuit of profits by rational means—obscures the desirability of the end itself. In contrast to antiquity, modern capitalism is thus far more durably motivated, and lasting. Weber nonetheless did not believe that modern capitalism was fated to last forever. As he put it cryptically, a new “prophet” would someday arrive, and society would transcend the soulless “spirit” of capitalism (Epilogue). Regardless, all cultural accounts of capitalism, whether they focus upon Protestantism or some other cultural milieu, follow in Weber’s footsteps and regard cultural and ideological phenomena, rather than only or primarily material ones, as crucial to understanding the birth, development and essence of capitalism.

1.3 Schumpeter: entrepreneurial capitalism

The Austrian economist Joseph Schumpeter greatly appreciated both Marx’s and Weber’s analyses of capitalism. In his Capitalism, Socialism, and Democracy (1942), he added his distinctive focus upon the “entrepreneur” as the singular and distinctive actor in a capitalist economy. An entrepreneur combined capital (either his own or someone else’s) with the various other factors of production, whether labor, technology, or raw materials. According to Schumpeter, risk-taking entrepreneurs, the lifeblood of capitalism, could only thrive in societies, cultures, and polities that valued their contributions (Introduction). When that happened, entrepreneurs were largely responsible for capitalism’s irrepressible “gales” of “creative destruction” (ch. 7). Creative destruction, not market competition, Schumpeter held, explains how, for instance, the horse carriage was replaced by the steam-power railway. Hurtling towards the new, capitalism continually threw old values, traditions, and methods of production on the scrapheap. Schumpeter held that bouts of creative destruction create both winners and losers, a general social fatigue with relentless change, and sufficient material abundance and comfort for intellectuals, including professors, to criticize capitalism’s shortcomings. Eventually, Schumpeter speculated, capitalist societies devalue entrepreneurship, paving the way for a post-capitalist, bureaucratic socialism (chs. 11-13).

1.4 Hayek and Friedman: market capitalism

Other important approaches to capitalism descend from other intellectual traditions than Marx. The most prominent non-Marxian approach claims descent (rightly or not) from Adam Smith’s The Wealth of Nations (1776). According to this account, the two necessary conditions for capitalism are the free market and private property. Arguably, Milton Friedman’s (1962) and Friedrich Hayek’s (1944) distinctive variants of this approach have been the most influential. For capitalism to exist, there must be complete, private, and unregulated markets for all “factors of production,” including capital and labor. So must the goods that result from production sell in unfettered markets. From all these exchanges, an “equilibrium,” perhaps a “general equilibrium,” spontaneously arises in a capitalist economy. Such economy can thus be regarded as a “spontaneous order.” This in turn means that the factors of production that are capital and labor are employed in their most efficient proportions. Also, produced goods and services flow through markets to where, at the margin, they are most valued, making these markets efficient, too. Consumer preferences, exercised in the consumer marketplace, act as the engine of the system. Premised upon the spontaneous flow of free market exchange, capitalism is the most efficient economic system. Inherently, it has no real crisis tendencies that it cannot self-correct. Capitalism goes wrong when it is politically interfered with (more below).

1.5 Institutionalist accounts of capitalism

Another set of theories of capitalism deserves mention. They include “institutional” accounts of capitalism, which go as far back as the writings of the American economist Thorstein Veblen (1904). However, the most influential “institutionalist” or “neo-institutionalist” scholars of capitalism, especially among contemporary economists, have significantly departed from Veblen. These scholars (e.g. Coase 1937; North 1992; Williamson 1985; Ostrom 1990) underscore that capitalism, far from being an autonomous system that arises when the state removes itself from the economic realm, is constituted by legal and political institutions, whether those be “the rule of law,” “property rights,” or something else. The most influential institutionalists, who contributed to the field of so-called “New Institutional Economics,” have underscored these institutional prerequisites for the healthy functioning of the market. But in this admittedly rough grouping other prominent scholars in different, even contradictory, ways have moved away from the market paradigm altogether, whether, for instance, to underscore the ideological prerequisites of capitalism (Piketty 2020), or the relationship between capitalism and egalitarian and inegalitarian institutions (Acemoglu and Robinson 2015).

1.6 Polanyi: Capitalism’s fictitious commodities

The Austro-Hungarian émigré Karl Polanyi’s account of nineteenth-century liberal capitalism in his book The Great Transformation (1944 [2001]) has become a distinctive and influential theorization of capitalism’s defining characteristics. Polanyi (ch. 6) argued that capitalism was characterized by the presence of three “fictitious commodities,” which made generalized market exchange possible: land, labor, and money. They were “fictitious” because, unlike other commodities (say, a bushel of wheat), they were not in the first instance produced for sale on a market. Labor consists of human activity, which is social; the land cannot be hauled away to the market in bushels; money is a product of state sovereignty. Such commodities are “fictitious” because society, often through conscious state power, first commodified them.

Therefore, Polanyi argued—contrary to the ideological tenets of nineteenth-century liberalism, which saw “the market” as spontaneously emerging from free, willful human interactions—that a free-market economy was a product of state action. By this, Polanyi did not simply mean that capitalism has legal and political foundations (see section on institutionalists and neo-institutionalists). He also meant that “laissez-faire” must always be planned by elite actors, who then ideologically cover their cracks by appeals to free-market liberalism (ch. 12). What gives their claims a ring of truth, according to Polanyi, is that once achieved the self-equilibrating tendencies of the market under capitalism genuinely do make further state interventions into the market disordering.

The “fictitious” character of the three commodities also explains the seeds of social and political resistance to capitalism. Leaving land, labor, and money subject to the laws of the market alone, Polanyi held, inevitably leads to spontaneous “countermovements” by society (ch. 10). While countermovements seek to de-commodify fictitious commodities, countermovements are ideologically and normatively indeterminate. Writing during World War II, Polanyi believed that aspects of fascism, Nazism, communism, and social democracy all could be explained by resort to his general concept of a countermovement (ch. 15 and conclusion).

Recently, Polanyi has been influential among scholars of late twentieth century “neoliberal” capitalism, who see in it recurring characteristics of nineteenth-century liberal capitalism, as analyzed by Polanyi (Block and Somers 2014; Blyth 2013).

1.7 Keynes: investment-centered capitalism

Finally, in recent decades there has been a revival in Keynesian approaches to understanding capitalism (e.g. Crotty 2019; Levy 2021, 2025). Here, much emphasis is placed on Keynes’s discussions in The General Theory of Employment, Interest and Money (1936 [2012]) of money (ch. 6), the “inducement to invest” (ch. 15), and “liquidity preference” (ch. 13) or the overriding desire of wealth-owners to hold assets that safely store value into the future. The existence of money as a store of value under capitalism means that capitalists can decide, on the basis of their expectations about an uncertain future, whether to invest in production or exercise their liquidity preference, by either hoarding or speculating in liquid, money-like assets. Since under capitalism investment drives production and productive investment through mechanisms such as bank credit, and money creation makes productive investment possible in the absence of accumulated savings, investors’ propensity to invest becomes crucial for economic reproduction as a whole. Keynes theorized that all things being equal, the owners of capital preferred liquidity, which generally undermined the productive potential of capitalist economies, including for reaching “full employment” (chs. 13 and 15). As a money asset, capital was capable of being invested in production, but also of being held in a liquid or money-like form—such as money itself, or a stock or bond. Keynes thus held that capital was not a “factor of production,” but rather a monetary asset, with a projected future yield. Assets become capital when they are assigned monetary value on the basis of their expected future returns. Hence, for Keynes, “expectations” about the future, not past “accumulation” of savings, rule capitalism’s dynamics, explaining their distinctiveness.

While there has been a recent surge of normative work on capitalism from Keynesian (Eich 2022; Cordelli 2025) and Polanyian (Klein 2017) perspectives, and while Weber and Schumpeter remain important references in the social sciences as a whole, a market-based approach to understanding capitalism (see the section on market capitalism above), often allied with a focus on its supportive institutions (see the section on institutionalist accounts of capitalism above), remains dominant. In the specific fields of political theory and political philosophy, normative defenses of capitalism have also tended to focus on accounts of capitalism centered on the benefits of free markets, while critiques of capitalism generally rest on Marx-inspired accounts of capitalism as an extractivist mode of production (see the section on capitalism as relentless accumulation above). However, as we will further see below, the case can be made that most normative defenses and critiques of capitalism are only defenses and critiques of particular aspects of capitalism, whether focusing on markets as allocation mechanisms, on the distribution of private property over the means of production, on the wage system, on the division of labor, or on commodified exchange.

2. Normative Defenses of Capitalism

This section covers contemporary philosophical debates about capitalism. It is organized around the plurality of principles and values that ground normative defenses of capitalism. Such defenses may be based on reasons of social welfare, efficiency, individual or political freedom, self-ownership, or moral self-development. For purposes of analytic clarity, we will distinguish six normative arguments in defense of capitalism according to the values and principles that ground them. It is worth emphasizing, however, that defenses of capitalism generally appeal to more than one value, and, as we mentioned above, may apply to specific parts (e.g. free markets), not necessarily to the whole of capitalism, however defined.

2.1 Welfarist arguments

Capitalism has been defended on consequentialist grounds, as the economic system that best promotes overall social welfare, compared to alternative systems. In contemporary debates, such arguments often appeal to Adam Smith’s influential defense of markets and of “commercial society.” Smith (1776) famously argued that an expansive competitive market in combination with the division of labor and the individual pursuit of self-interest increases the wealth of nations. Led by the market, and not by the redistributive capacity of the state, the creation of wealth is instrumentally valuable insofar as it redounds to the benefit of all, including the worst off. Assuming this is true (we here leave aside the empirical debate), then a Smith-inspired defense of capitalism is supported by a utilitarian notion of welfare maximization, coupled with the sufficientarian ideal of a society where, no matter how much inequality exists, all enjoy a decent standard of living (see Wells 2013).

2.2 Efficiency-based arguments

Efficiency is at the center of many defenses of capitalism. Hayek (1945, 1960, 1973/1976/1979) is one example (see also Brennan 2014). For Hayek the market creates a “spontaneous” order, which produces the best outcome, relative to conscious state planning, insofar as the market best allocates resources among agents, given their preferences, and most efficiently processes information of which agents are not conscious. In this way, a free market tends to fare better in terms of overall preference-satisfaction compared to alternative arrangements. A political regime of liberty is also necessary for the market to function efficiently (1960: 205-206). Such a regime of liberty is, in turn, instrumentally valuable because it allows for the pursuit and achievement of a variety of valuable human purposes, including the preservation of liberty itself. Importantly (pace socialist planners), these valuable human purposes, like preferences, cannot be objectively known before the independent operation of the market (1973/1976/1979: ch. 10). Planners, by contrast, can only achieve their goals by imposing their own conception of values on everyone else, thereby engendering tyranny (1944). (But for recent defenses of planning see Malleson 2014; Schweickart 2002/2011; O’Neill 2020; Devine 1989/2020; Cordelli 2025.)

Critics may wonder what happens to the Hayekian justification of capitalism if what people happen to want or prefer is a fully egalitarian redistribution of wealth, or the common ownership of the means of production (Gray 1981). Further, Hayek himself was aware of the fact that, when an amoral market becomes the predominant means of social coordination, the alienation and greed that such mechanism may engender could destabilize the proper operation of markets themselves. Hayek’s response to these potential problems invokes the market’s superior epistemological capacities (e.g. 1973/1976/1979: ch. 10) compared to conscious human action, as well as the role of markets in fostering community (see the entry on Friedrich Hayek).

“High liberal” and social democratic defenses of capitalism also tend to rest on an appeal to Hayekian efficiency. So-called “high liberals,” unlike classical liberals, do not assign basic status to the economic liberties and are thus willing to restrict them to reduce unjust distributive inequalities and to secure political equality and fair equality of opportunities (Freeman 2011). Although high liberals do not regard markets as the fundamental criterion for assessing just distributions of income and wealth, they do endorse the role of markets as essential allocation mechanisms. Social democrats, on their part, are animated by ideals of democratic equality and fair cooperation – their central commitment is to a society of persons freely and fairly contributing as equals to the production and distribution of social goods and benefits (Von Platz 2020). Both strands of thought believe that capitalism can best achieve the demands of justice compared to other systems, but only if properly tempered by the institutions and guarantees of a welfare state. Although their defense of capitalist markets is based on a Hayekian principle of efficiency, they argue that the pursuit of productivity and preference-satisfaction should be constrained by ideals of distributive justice, reciprocity and democratic equality. In particular, social democrats argue that democratic equality requires not only that the benefits of economic cooperation be distributed fairly but also that labor be empowered to act as an equal partner in negotiating the very terms of cooperation (Von Platz 2020; Freeman 2011).

2.3 Freedom-based arguments

Capitalism is often defended on grounds of freedom. While negative liberty – the absence of coercive restraints on action – has figured prominently in such defenses (Smith 1776; Friedman 1962; Hayek 1960; Brennan 2014), arguments for capitalism have also relied on alternative conceptions of freedom, including republican freedom as non-domination (Smith 1776; see also Pettit 2006), positive freedom (Tomasi 2012; Van Parijs 1995), and political freedom (Friedman 1962).

2.3.1 Negative liberty

Milton Friedman (1962) remains today a touchstone for defenses of capitalist markets on grounds of negative liberty. Economic freedom, Friedman claims, is an “end in itself”, beyond being a means for the achievement of political freedom. Economic freedom is, in turn, a component of a person’s “total freedom” (ch. 1). Economic freedom is a necessary precondition for the free pursuit of a person’s ends and life plans, whatever these may be (see also Tomasi 2012: 77, 90). Capitalism is to be preferred because it protects individuals’ economic freedom from external encroachments. Further, markets are systems of voluntary cooperation. The market “provides for co-operation without coercion,” as it prevents one person from interfering with another (Friedman 1962: ch. 1: 7-9). The minimization of interference is what makes markets superior to alternative arrangements. Critics have objected that this characterization of the capitalist employment relation obscures the inequalities of power, as well as relations of exploitation and domination, that necessarily characterize capitalist labor markets (see G.A. Cohen 1983: 150; see the discussion in the entry on socialism.

2.3.2 Republican freedom

Republican conceptions of freedom as non-domination, understood as the absence of subjection to the arbitrary, discretionary or uncontrolled power of a master or superior, have played an important role in defenses of capitalism. Here, again, Smith who sees market relations as ethically superior to the arbitrary dependencies of feudalism, figures prominently along with Hayek and Friedman (Smith 1776; see also Pettit 2006). The general idea is that, by being constituted through voluntary and mutually beneficial exchanges between free and symmetrically situated contracting parties, rather than by social hierarchies, markets remove those arbitrary power imbalances that are instead a feature of inherited social status under feudalism. Again, critics dispute the characterization of market relations as non-dominating, especially in the context of capitalist labor markets, pointing out that relations of domination and undue dependence characterize many, if not all, employment relations under capitalism. They point out, following Marx, that those who have the appearance of “free and symmetrically situated contracting parties” are, in fact, workers who often have no reasonable alternatives but to put themselves under the arbitrary power of employers (Arnold 2017; G.A. Cohen 1983; Gourevitch 2013; Vrousalis 2013, 2021a, 2021b, 2022; Cicerchia 2022; Bryan 2023; Leipold 2014; Anderson 2019; Landemore and Ferreras 2016; Gonzalez-Ricoy 2014; Roberts 2018; White 2011).

2.3.3 Positive freedom

More positive conceptions of freedom have also been used to defend capitalist arrangements (Tomasi 2012; Brennan 2014). (See also Van Parijs 1995, which argues that real freedom for all requires granting to everyone an unconditional basic income at the highest sustainable level and that capitalism would likely better secure such income than socialism.) John Tomasi (2012: 98), for example, argues that a wide range of economic liberties ought to have “basic” status because they are necessary conditions of both personal self-determination – the capacity to form, pursue and revise ends – and self-authorship. To say that a liberty has basic status is to say that it can be restricted only for the sake of protecting other liberties, not for other purposes such as reducing economic inequalities, or maximizing social welfare.

While so-called “high liberals” (Freeman 2011) would grant, on grounds of self-determination, basic status only to a minimal set of economic freedom, including freedom of occupational choice and a limited right to hold personal property (Rawls 1996: 74, 187, 293, 308, 325), Tomasi (2012: 94-100) defends a much wider account of basic economic liberties, including, for example, private ownership of the means of production, the freedom to negotiate contracts and to contractually set the terms of employment, and the freedom to determine the direction of exchange and investment. For Tomasi, such liberties are basic in the sense that they enjoy lexical priority over principles of socio-economic distributive justice - they can never be restricted just for the sake of promoting socio-economic justice.

By defending the basic status of a wide range of economic liberties on liberal grounds, as essential conditions of individual self-determination, Tomasi envisions an ideal just society – which he calls not capitalism but “market democracy” - which achieves fairness in the distribution of the benefits and burdens of social cooperation by means of market competition. Unlike libertarians, Tomasi embraces the Rawlsian commitment to a just society that benefits everyone, not just the wealthy. Social justice, for Tomasi, requires maximizing the income floor as well as making opportunities widely and fairly available. As critics have pointed out (e.g. Arnold 2013), it is not clear how market democracy can simultaneously protect thick economic liberty and pursue social justice. However, Tomasi (2012: 230) would argue that governments best promote fairness by creating an institutional framework which supports economic dynamism, growth, and opportunity, and by then letting the invisible hand of the market allocate resources.

Critics have also questioned Tomasi’s argument for the basic status of a large range of economic liberties (Patten 2014; Von Platz 2014). Meanwhile, some high liberals (Freeman 2011) agree with Tomasi that the right to own some productive property, beyond personal property, should be regarded as a basic liberty. Their justification, however, is different. To them, only through the widespread ownership of the means of production basic liberties can be secured, for only such model of ownership enables individuals not to become dependent upon labor markets for their sustenance and thus protects them from domination and exploitation in the workplace.

2.3.4 Political freedom

Normative defenses of capitalism have also appealed to the value of political freedom. Friedman (1962: 9) prominently argues that economic freedom is “an indispensable means toward the achievement of political freedom.” The first reason is that capitalism decentralizes political power. It “separates economic power from political power and in this way enables the one to be an offset to the other” (10). As Friedman provocatively puts it, “you cannot very well have two presidents in a country … but it is perfectly possible to have a large number of additional millionaires” (ibid.) The second reason is that alternative systems to capitalism, especially socialism, inevitably constrain the exercise of political freedom. Socialism makes people dependent upon government, especially but not exclusively those dependent upon welfare, undermining political liberty (143-150). Third, in separating economic and political power, capitalism also better promotes genuine freedom of expression. “The person who buys bread doesn’t know whether the wheat from which it was made was grown by a pleader of the 5th Amendment or a McCarthyite” (7). Critics object that by depoliticizing many important decisions and by treating them as purely economic, capitalism undermines crucial aspects of political freedom (Fraser 2022; Gould 1988), including democratic self-determination (Cordelli 2025). Further, the concentration of economic power under capitalism undermines the fair value of political liberty (Rawls 2001).

2.4 Entitlement-based arguments

In contemporary philosophy, Robert Nozick’s libertarianism is often taken to provide the most direct and unequivocal defense of capitalism, one based on the principle of self-ownership and on an historical entitlement theory of justice in holdings. Nozick (1974: ch. 7) famously argues that a distribution of resources is just insofar as, and only insofar as, what people possess (i) results from a permissible and title-conferring initial act of acquisition, or (ii) is acquired by means of just transfer of something originally justly acquired, or (iii) is acquired through an act of just rectification of an unjust taking. Although Nozick sympathizes with the Lockean view that because we own ourselves and our skills we can come to acquire property rights over external objects through labor, he never provides a full account of the conditions that a process of initial acquisition (or transfer or rectification) must meet in order for it to be title-conferring (for an overview of the historical entitlement theory and references to the vast literature on Nozick’s theory of justice see the entry on Nozick’s political philosophy). Nozick claims that, in order to be just, a distribution need not promote any common good, nor comply with any independent distributive pattern (just desert, equality, maximization of welfare, etc.). Indeed, a state that tried to redistribute to promote any such good or achieve any such pattern would infringe on negative liberty, as it would necessarily require continuous interference with people’s choices as to how to use their just holdings. As Nozick puts it, “no…distributional patterned principle of justice can be continually realized without continuous interference with people’s lives” (163). Further, the realization of distributive principles would require some people’s partial ownership over others, thereby violating the separateness of persons, and their self-ownership (172). This is because taxing some to redistribute to others is equivalent for Nozick to forcing them to work for the benefit of others. Taxation is a form of forced labor, akin to slavery.

It would seem to follow that a just Nozickian society would necessarily take the form of a capitalist society, constituted by free markets for the voluntary exchange and transfer of justly acquired holdings, unregulated labor contracts between consenting adults, and a minimal state limited to the protection of private property and the provision of security. Importantly, the justice of such society would in no way depend on market exchange producing a rational system of production or being, in the Hayekian sense, an efficient coordination mechanism. Nor would market transactions, including labor contracts, be just only if they track or reward some pre-existing notion of natural desert, or support the individual capacity for self-authorship. Rather, it would be sufficient that the market transactions in question are in compliance with principles of just acquisition and just transfer—i.e. they are fully voluntary and exclude fraud or the exchange of unjustly acquired property. Such transactions may result in irrational outcomes and very wide inequalities but still be just.

However, Nozick’s libertarianism does not require capitalism. All that it demands is that people be left free to do as they please with their justly acquired property and that they not be forced to give up what is rightfully theirs. Nozick’s commitments to self-ownership and to the separateness of persons put limits on the way some can appropriate what belongs to others – their body, labor, time, resources, etc. – in order to achieve socially desirable ends. Such commitments put, however, no limits on what people can permissibly do with their holdings, at least as long as they do not infringe upon other people’s rights. Individuals can permissibly and validly enter into slavery contracts, if they wish to do so. Yet, precisely because of this, individuals can also voluntarily form and subject themselves to a socialist association, agreeing to live under its rules. Indeed, Nozick himself tries to win the sympathies of those who defend conditions for meaningful work and workers’ control of productive enterprises by arguing that the minimal state he defends would be perfectly compatible with the existence of voluntary communities and associations that tried to institute such conditions (246–253).

Because philosophical libertarianism does not necessarily lead to capitalism, characterizing popular defenders of capitalism such as, for example, Ayn Rand as “libertarian” risks generating confusion. Rand (1964), unlike Nozick, would judge voluntary socialist associations as morally impermissible because incompatible with ethical “egoism,” according to which one should, morally speaking, act according to one’s rational self-interest. But Rand’s egoism is completely extraneous to libertarianism, as a theory of justice (not capitalism).

2.5 Virtue-based arguments

Appeals to human virtue and moral self-development have also played an important role in defenses of capitalism (Smith 1776; Tomasi 2012; Brennan 2014). Adam Smith (1776: book 1, ch. 5), for example, argues that when people are entitled to the fruits of their own labor they become more industrious and temperate; people who interact through markets are more honest than when trapped in hierarchies (see also Wells 2013). Economic growth depends on capital accumulation, it is said, and capital is accumulated when there is respect for the virtues of prudence, thrift, and self command (Fitzgibbons 1997). In a similar vein, Brennan (2014: 67-68) argues that market exchange bolsters the traits of “mutual trust, reciprocity, and trustworthiness.” Tomasi insists that not being insulated from economic risk is a necessary condition for the development of “responsible” self-authorship (Tomasi 2012: 80; but see Patten 2014). Critics worry that, rather promoting these virtues, capitalism may undermine them (Hussain 2020), and that, rather than being necessary for responsible self-authorship, free markets may undermine its very possibility (Roberts 2018; see also MacGilvray 2011).

3. Normative Critiques of Capitalism

Even more so than defenses of capitalism, critiques of capitalism can take a wide variety of forms. While some critiques are presented as amoral – their point is not to show that there is something morally amiss with capitalism but rather that capitalism is functionally self-defeating – other critiques highlight moral failings, understood in a variety of ways, whether in terms of distributive injustice, wrongful exploitation, domination and authoritarianism, alienation and commodification, and/or an infringement on political self-determination. Some of these failings amount to wrongs, others to social ills or bads, which are not per se wrongful. Some are a matter of justice, others of legitimacy, others again of the good life.

Critiques of capitalism may also have different practical purposes and institutional implications. They need not necessarily amount to defenses of socialism. Some defend intermediate arrangements, such as property-owing democracy (Rawls 2001), co-determination (Anderson 2019), and intermediate capitalism (Hussain 2023; for a review of alternative economic systems see Corneo 2017; Elster and Moene 1989).

Last but not least, there is not a fully formed view about what criteria a philosophical critique of capitalism must meet in order to count as a critique of capitalism. First, because capitalism is a complex phenomenon, a critique of capitalism cannot arguably be limited to a critique of just one of its components, e.g. free markets, however essential this may be, at least unless it is first proved that the component in question constitutes the core or essence of capitalism. Further, some (Jaeggi 2016) insist that the critique must meet criteria of (i) distinctiveness, showing that the problem at stake is distinctive to capitalism (see also Van Parijs 1984), (ii) causality (capitalism must “carry the blame” as the primary cause of the problem at stake), and (iii) systematicity (the matter is not an incidental side-effect of capitalism but occurs systematically in conjunction with it). Others (e.g. Vrousalis 2021a) add that the defect must be (iv) non-contingent – it must occur regardless of contingent facts such as the subjective dispositions of particular capitalists, or whether capitalism may just happen to produce desirable distributive outcomes. However, some of the most influential critiques of capitalist arrangements in contemporary philosophy, such as, for example, Rawls’s critique of welfare-state capitalism (2001), do not meet such stringent criteria. We include them in this section, leaving open the question of whether they should be understood as genuine critiques of capitalism.

3.1 Functionalist critiques

Functionalist critiques argue that capitalism is inherently prone to undermining its own functioning. Such arguments tend to appeal to Marx’s arguments about the crisis tendencies of capitalism, whether the tendency of the profit rate to fall, a tendency towards systemic anarchy that breeds financial crisis, or the need for a “reserve army” of unemployed to suppress wages and living standards (Marx 1867 [1990]: ch. 25). There is debate (e.g. Jaeggi 2016) on whether pointing to these tendencies requires taking an independent normative standpoint – how can we know what the proper functioning of capitalism is, unless we ask what ends it ought to pursue? If what the proper functioning of an economic system is cannot be determined independently of normative standards (e.g. why should capitalism provide for future generations, rather than only for present ones?), the functionalist critique always already presupposes a normative critique.

3.2 Distributive critiques

Capitalism has been criticized on grounds of distributive justice. Especially in his later work, John Rawls (2001: part IV, §42-43) argues that both laissez-faire and welfare-state capitalism are incompatible with the principles that ought to govern the arrangement of a society’s basic structure in order for such society to be just. By laissez-faire capitalism, Rawls means an economy where the means of production are privately owned, production is geared toward profits, and the overall extent as well as the direction of production are determined by the consumption and investment choices of individuals and corporations within a competitive free market. Welfare-state capitalism is a “tamed” version of this system, where certain goods, such as healthcare and education, are directly funded by the state, and their provision is not geared toward profit but toward the satisfaction of need, and all members are guaranteed access to a social minimum that provides the conditions for a decent life (this is more than a minimal safety net for the poor), although not an equal level of resources (O’Neill 2020).

Rawls argues that welfare-state capitalism is likely to undermine, through the creation of large inequalities of property and wealth, both the principle of fair equality of opportunity (because large wealth inequalities will mean that persons similarly motivated and capable at birth will enjoy very different chances of education and culture, from which the development of their talents depends) and the fair value of political liberties (because wealth inequalities will translate into inequality of opportunity for political influence). It is also incapable of institutionalizing the difference principle as a principle of reciprocity and to confer to citizens a secure sense of self-respect, insofar as only those who own capital can truly participate in the shaping of a society’s economic future, by determining the patterns of production (see O’Neill 2012).

On the one hand, Rawls’s critique of welfare-state capitalism can be read as a contingent critique, insofar as, for the most part, it would seem to depend on the assumption that, under capitalism, certain political solutions will be absent or ineffective (see O’Neill 2012; Weale 2013). Such an assumption, in turn, largely depends on the subjective motivations and dispositions of capitalists. For example, in a world of capitalists motivated by the Rawlsian sense of justice, there may be no attempts to convert wealth into political power, and more support for public provision, strongly redistributive policies, and campaign finance regulation. The critique would then need to be reframed as a cultural one: capitalism makes the cultivation of a sense of justice impossible. Such critique, however, would still be contingent.

On the other hand, scholars (Von Platz 2020; Freeman 2013; Thomas 2017) have argued that Rawls’s critique is not contingent. Rawls’s point would be to show that welfare-state capitalism is governed by a utilitarian logic that makes it inherently, not merely contingently, incompatible with the demands of justice. Either way, Rawls’s critique of welfare-state capitalism should not be understood as a rejection of capitalism as such, for his proposed solution is not an exit from capitalism but a more egalitarian capitalism, one achieved through the wide pre-distribution of capital assets, also known as property-owning democracy (although Rawls seems to think that, in some contexts, liberal socialism may be better suited to realize the demands of justice). (On property-owning democracy see O’Neill and Williamson 2012.) Although Rawls calls his preferred system an “alternative to capitalism” because he understands capitalism as implying an unequal distribution of the means of production or capital assets, a property-owning democracy remains compatible with private ownership of the means of production and leaves decisions concerning the amount of investment and the direction of production to markets (O’Neill 2020).

3.3 Exploitation

The most influential critique of capitalism is contained in Marx’s account of exploitation, although, as we saw, Marx debatably did not provide such account as a moral critique but rather as a description of capitalism’s objective functioning. Recall, the generation of surplus value occurs through an exchange of labor power that upholds, on its face, all the standards of competition and fairness involved in the exchange of all commodities under capitalism. What makes the capitalist mode of production exploitative is that, first, it is extractive, as the capitalist can unilaterally appropriate the surplus value generated by the worker’s laboring activity, and second, that the extraction is forced, for workers have no real alternatives but to enter the labor contract in order to access the means of subsistence.

Marx did not directly or explicitly address the normative questions of why and when exploitation is wrong and when an exploitative system is unjust. Yet such questions are crucial to exploitation-based philosophical critiques of capitalism, especially those inspired by Marx’s own work (G.A. Cohen 1978, 1979, 1995; Roemer 1982a, 1982b, 1982c, 1985, 2017; Reiman 1987; Vrousalis 2022; Wollner 2019). Although the debate on the necessary and sufficient conditions for wrongful exploitation is vast (for a review see Vrousalis 2018; and the entry on exploitation), three accounts of the wrong of exploitation as the central piece of a critique of capitalism (and of defenses of socialism, see also the entry on socialism) have been proposed.

According to the first account, the problem with capitalist exploitation is unequal exchange (Roemer 1982a). By forcibly appropriating surplus value, capitalists unfairly benefit from workers’ labor, because they appropriate more than the latter do. The notorious problem with this account, as a general account of exploitation, is that not all forms of unequal exchange, including forced exchange, are exploitative (e.g. the welfare state is arguably not exploitative just because it taxes those who can work to support those who cannot work because of, say, physical or mental disabilities). Defenders of capitalism would further object that the appropriation of surplus value by the capitalist does not necessarily amount to unequal exchange because the capitalist entrepreneur offers special inputs into production, including risk-taking. To this it could be answered that workers are not better off in a capitalist economy, because they must work, in order to achieve the same level of consumption, longer hours than they would if the capital stock was collectively owned (Roemer 2017). But neoclassical economists would argue that far from being an unequal exchange, the “surplus” labor the worker supplies is a justifiable payment of “rent” by the worker to the capitalist for access to the means of production (Roemer 2017). The question of the wrongfulness of exploitation would then seem to depend on the previous question of whether the background and unequal distribution of productive property can be justified.

According to a second account, the problem with capitalist exploitation is that it amounts to unfair advantage-taking (e.g. Roemer 2017). In this view, a group of people A (the capitalists) unfairly benefits at the expense of another group B (workers), while B is made worse off for no fault of their own. The account assumes that, under capitalism, (i) non-owners are made worse off because they must work longer hours to achieve the same level of consumption than they would if the capital stock were collectively owned, (ii) capitalists are made better off because they can appropriate the value produced by the surplus labor of workers, and (iii) the unequal ownership of capital is itself the result of an unjust history of capital accumulation, rather than of the voluntary choices of workers.

This account makes the injustice of capitalist exploitation contingent on the historical origin of the unequal distribution of capital assets. If such unequal distribution was the consequence of the voluntary choices of workers, e.g. their preference for leisure or spending, as different from the capitalists’ preference for working hard and saving, then the capitalist profiting from the worker’s labor on the basis of honestly accumulated capital would not give rise to unjust exploitation. However, since most capital accumulation has historically happened through forced expropriation and plunder (see section below on “racial capitalism”), capitalism is unjustly exploitative. It follows that the neoclassical economists’ claim that the “surplus” labor the worker supplies is a justifiable rental payment by the worker to the capitalist becomes implausible. Against this second account, critics (e.g. Vrousalis 2021) argue that a background of distributive injustice is not necessary for the wrongfulness of exploitation. For example, If A negligently falls in a pit, it would be wrongfully exploitative for A to offer B rescue only if B agrees to work for free for A for the rest of his life, and this is so even if there is no injustice in the background, since B is responsible for his own state of vulnerability (Vrousalis 2013, 2018).

The above observation has generated a third account of exploitation, according to which exploitation is wrong because it consists in a form of disrespectful, although not necessarily unfair, advantage-taking (Vrousalis 2013, 2022). The reason why A’s exploitative offer is wrong is that A takes advantage of his own position of power – his dominance – over B for self-enrichment, thereby disrespecting B. The reason why A disrespects B is that A aims to get B to act not on the basis of reasons the strength of which B can independently appreciate but rather on the basis of the fact that A has power over B, and does so to enrich himself. Wrongful exploitation “obtains when the power-directed act, performed for the power-given reason, is geared towards A’s enrichment” (Vrousalis 2013: 110; see also Julius 2013). Under capitalism, some (the capitalists) unjustly exploit others (the workers) because the unequal ownership of the means of production by the former, even if just, means they have the power to get workers to do what they would not otherwise be willing to do (e.g. work longer to achieve the same level of consumption), and they do so for their own self-enrichment. Exploitation, in this view, can happen even in the absence of unfairness.

Some may argue that self-enrichment is not necessary for exploitation. The offer A makes to B in the case of the pit would seem to be unjustly exploitative even if A makes it to benefit her church or if she decides to randomly distribute the gains to strangers. Capitalist exploitation would then be unjust even if capitalists were willing to donate the extracted surplus value to philanthropic causes. Other critics (Arneson 2016) have argued that unfairness is a necessary condition of unjust exploitation. For example, imagine that I am thirsty, and A is selling bottles of water. If I had not forgotten my bottle of water at home, I would not be willing to buy one of A’s bottles. A can thus take advantage of the fact that I am thirsty to get me to buy a bottle of water from him. But unless the price A charges is itself unfair or unless there is an injustice in the background, e.g. A tricked me into forgetting my bottle of water at home, it is unclear why A asking me to pay for the bottle of water would be wrong. A theory of unjust exploitation under capitalism may not be able to escape the question of why and when capitalists are unfairly taking advantage of workers.

3.4 Domination

Critiques grounded in a concern for domination can be broadly divided into interactional and structural critiques, depending on whether they see capitalist domination as a property of the relation between a particular capitalist and a particular worker, or whether they see it as a property of the capitalist mode of production as a whole, or of the institution of property that supports it.

Interactional critiques argue that because capitalist labor markets tend to produce both monopolies and unemployment, thereby foreclosing meaningful exit options, and because it is very difficult to write complete and costlessly enforceable employment contracts, then such markets are prone to generate a condition of domination or oppression at the point of production. Employers can exercise sweeping and arbitrary discretion over their employees and can freely boss them around, to the point of preventing the latter from exercising their basic rights, including expressing their political views, or even taking breaks to go to the bathroom (Anderson 2019; see also Pettit 2006; Gonzalez-Ricoy 2014). (On why even a universal basic income would not provide a meaningful exit option from labor markets see Gourevitch and Stanczyk 2018.) More radical critics of capitalism would argue that, although it is true that workers are often mistreated and oppressed within the workplace, at the point of production, a critique of capitalism must be able to explain why capitalism is unjust even under perfectly competitive conditions, and even if capitalists are well-motivated to respect established contractual terms (Vrousalis 2021).

These critics also tend to argue that the problem with capitalism should be understood in terms of structural, rather than interactional, domination (Gourevitch 2013; Vrousalis 2021a, 2021b; Cicerchia 2022; Roberts 2018). According to one such view, the problem with capitalism is that the capitalist mode of production, by conferring to some exclusive control over the means of production, ipso facto also confers to them unilateral, that is to say, non-reciprocal, control over the “productive purposiveness” of others, i.e. their ability to pursue productive ends (Vrousalis 2021a). Such unilateral control, in turn, is pro tanto unjust, because it violates neo-republican freedom as non-domination. One problem with this view is that, as long as everyone, including workers, could unanimously vote in support of a capitalist system of production, it is unclear why the resulting power of unilateral control conferred to the capitalist would necessarily count as arbitrary. Further, by having the power to offer jobs to non-owners and to control the conditions of their employment, capitalists would only seem to have the power to add options, however bad these may be, rather than to remove them (Corvino 2019; Cordelli 2025). It could be argued that arbitrary interference happens at a prior stage. What amounts to arbitrary interference is “the exclusion of a consistent group of people from the control of the means of production” (Corvino 2019). But if this is the case, it seems that what is ultimately wrong with capitalism is not unilateral control over labor, or domination, but rather distributive injustice or actual interference. Some people have been unjustly deprived of what they were rightfully entitled to. Further, it becomes unclear why only capitalists dominate, since all those who support a system of private property may be responsible for that exclusion, whether they are capitalists or not, whether they control the productive purposiveness of others or not.

According to an alternative view, which we may call “the dependency account,” capitalism dominates not because it provides some with unilateral control over the labor of others, but because it leaves some unduly dependent on others for their own subsistence (Gourevitch 2013; Bryan 2023). Alexander Bryan, for example, has recently argued (2023: 698) that even workers who have independent access to capital can be subject to domination “because they remain dependent on the cooperation of capitalists on terms insensitive to their own needs, to engage in productive activity and make a living.” The dependency account seems to presuppose that people are entitled not simply to subsistence or to certain capabilities, but also to acquire them through productive activity. But it is difficult to imagine an argument for a specific entitlement to participate in productive activity that does not rely on a perfectionist idea of self-realization through work or does not contingently presuppose a capitalist culture within which a person’s self-respect is made dependent on her participation in production.

Second, the dependency account would seem to imply that everyone is dominated under capitalism. For, the ability of any capitalist to keep producing depends on available investment. Yet no single capitalist nor, more arguably, the capitalist class as a whole can unilaterally control investment patterns, therefore no capitalist can be able to meet their needs by engaging in productive activity without the cooperation of thousands of others, whose cooperation, of course, no single capitalist can control (Cordelli 2025). Now, to say that the capitalist mode of production, or investment markets, dominate everyone, including the capitalists, is neither logically incoherent nor new (this was arguably Marx’s final analysis in Capital). But some are suspicious of a conception of domination that is unable to distinguish between a factory worker and a rentier as equally subject to domination (see O’Shea 2019, 2020).

According to a third view, the wrong of capitalism consists in a form of “impersonal domination” (Roberts 2018). Unlike a hurricane, market forces are not a force of nature but rather the “aggregated preferences of the owners of money and the producers of commodities.” But, very much like a hurricane, such forces dominate without any particular agent necessarily intending that domination or being fully responsible for it. Indeed, domination under capitalism consists precisely in the fact that “commercial society…renders us systematically irresponsible for our economic life. The exposure to the market leaves each producer a slave to the decisions of others, made without any consultation or debate. The preferences of others [as they aggregate in and through the market] impose themselves on each producer without any need to justify themselves, and without the possibility of consultation” (Roberts 2018: 101; see also Battistoni 2026; Hussain 2023).

A potential problem with this account is that if de-responsibilization is core to the workings of capitalism, then it remains unclear why capitalist domination is unjust rather than merely bad, as it is produced by an aggregate of actions no one is responsible for (Cordelli 2025). (On the question of whether a purely structural injustice can be unjust see also Estlund 2024.) Further, critics may argue that markets do not dominate us – make us unfree - by simply imposing certain preferences on us or changing the options that are available to us. If, as a consequence of the operation of a market, my favorite type of food disappears because there are no longer sufficient consumers for that product, my freedom has not been infringed upon, simply because I don’t have a right to that option in the first place (Pettit 2006; Ripstein 2009). It is true, however, that under capitalism very important decisions concerning the future course of a society – think about investment decisions that determine what will be produced and at what rate, and what jobs will exist – are left to impersonal market forces and made without any deliberation. This raises the interesting philosophical question of what is wrong or bad, if anything, about being subject to this form of impersonal governance or “rule of none.” The problem at stake is arguably better captured in terms of social alienation and a lack of collective self-determination, rather than republican unfreedom (Cordelli 2025).

3.5 Political self-determination

Critics of capitalism have argued that capitalism undermines political values, including democratic legitimacy and political self-determination, in three ways. First, insofar as it allows for large inequalities of wealth and capital, and insofar as economic inequality can be converted, through a variety of mechanisms (e.g. campaign finance), into political inequality, capitalism is de facto incompatible with the proper functioning of the democratic process and with basic democratic principles such as a principle of fair opportunities for political influence (Rawls 2001). The critique remains contingent on the feasibility of mechanisms aimed at blocking the conversion of economic power into political influence, e.g. campaign finance regulations (see O’Neill 2012). Critics (Malleson 2014; Dietsch 2015, 2018; Ronzoni 2009; Wollner 2014) have further pointed out that, in a capitalist society governed by norms of free global capital mobility, the capacity of states to implement such regulations is itself undermined by the power of capital, who can at any moment threaten to leave (so-called “capital strike”).

The above consideration leads to a second way in which capitalism can be regarded as undermining core political values. Capitalism may be said to be incompatible with the ability of states to maintain the capacity for self-determination because of capitalism’s tendency towards the deregulation of markets, the expansion of privatization (Cordelli 2024), a financial sector tasked with the creation of money (Eich 2022; Downey 2024), or the weakening of organized labor (Cicerchia 2022). Capitalist globalization also undermines states’ ability to tax, as well as other functions constitutive of state sovereignty. Overall, then, states increasingly find themselves dominated by capital (see Dawson and Katzenstein 2019; Ronzoni 2009).

Finally, capitalism consists in the depoliticization of decisions that, some argue, ought to be made collectively (Fraser 2014, 2022; Cordelli 2025). Such depoliticization takes at least two forms. First, capitalism leaves certain decisions such as the overall rate of investment and the direction of production to markets. Critics (Malleson 2014; Schweickart 2002; White 2011; Hussain 2023) argue that such decisions ought to be made collectively whether because they affect everyone’s past and future interests or because markets only respond to an unduly narrow set of social values. Second, under capitalism, even crucial economic decisions that are under the direct purview of politics are often delegated to independent bodies of experts, such as in the case of monetary policy being handled by independent central banks that are insufficiently accountable to democratic processes (Eich 2022; Downey 2024). Some argue that such depoliticization imperils the capacity for citizenship and produces, in the long run, political detachment (Offe 2008; see also Joshua Cohen 1989).

3.6 Alienation

Capitalism has also been criticized on grounds of individual and social alienation. Alienation is generally understood as a pathological relation of separation, or as a psychological state of detachment, between a subject and an object (see the entry on alienation; Jaeggi 2014). Individuals are, for example, said to be alienated from their own life when they cannot identify with it, or when they feel indifferent to how their life goes. Workers are said to be alienated from the product of their labor when they cannot understand and relate to it as the product of their own actions, as “their own,” and rather perceive or relate to it as a separate, alien product (Marx 1844).

Capitalism can be regarded as being alienating in more than one way and in relation to more than one domain. Capitalism has been said to alienate workers from the labor process. As the young Marx (1844 [1978: 74]) famously argued, because of a narrowly specialized division of labor, the capitalist mode of production prevents workers from understanding how their own actions contribute to the broader process of production. The process of production itself puts workers in competition among themselves and results in exploitation. The quality of the work, rather than contributing to realizing the workers’ human capacities, stunts these capacities, by separating bodily and mental activities. The result is that the worker cannot appropriate the product of her own labor as her own and cannot self-realize in the work process. The worker is alienated because rather than affirming herself, she denies herself through the labor process (see also Kandiyali 2020; Gilabert 2023). Critics have argued that Marx’s account of alienation relies on a problematic, because essentialist, conception of truly human functionings and of self-realization (e.g. Jaeggi 2014; but see Brixel 2024).

Capitalism has also been said to constitute a socio-cultural condition of alienation where the alienated subject includes not just workers but all market participants (Ypi 2024; Maguire 2022) and even humanity at large (Marx 1844; Horkheimer and Adorno 1947 [2002]). Here the claim, most forcefully expressed by the Frankfurt school, which drew from Weber’s cultural account of capitalism as much as from Marx, is that under capitalism a form of economic rationality becomes all-encompassing, thereby colonizing and impoverishing non-economic aspects of human life, reasoning, and modes of valuation. Capitalism generates a condition of objective alienation from one’s humanity and from society at large (Horkheimer and Adorno 1947 [2002]: part I: Habermas 1984; Brown 2017). Contemporary philosophical reflections on the moral limits of markets have sometimes echoed aspects of this critique, by arguing that the commodification of certain goods and activities constitutes an inappropriate way of valuing them, or an undue extension of economic rationality to non-economic spheres of lives (Anderson 1993; Walzer 1983; but see Satz 2010). Although the literature on the moral limits of markets is relevant to debates about capitalism, arguably it does not amount to a critique of capitalism, since, on the one hand, commodification can exist outside of capitalism and, on the other hand, you can have capitalist systems where certain goods are decommodified.

More recently, some (e.g. Cordelli 2025) have argued that capitalism generates an alienated relation between citizens and their socio-political order because by leaving transformative investment decisions to impersonal market forces it deprives citizens of control over the future of their society. Under such conditions, citizens cannot be reasonably expected to regard their society as the result of their collective doing and valuing, and cannot affirm it as their own. While it may be that only workers (including domestic laborers) are exploited under capitalism, all citizens, whether capitalists or not, are socially alienated. This leaves open the further question of whether capitalism, by necessarily alienating citizens from their sociopolitical world, generates a distinctive kind of unfreedom, different from domination, interference, or mere lack of autonomy. Further, insofar as an interest in nonalienation can be regarded as a grounding value of political self-determination (Stilz 2016), and the latter should be arguably exercised compatibly with its grounding values, to argue that capitalism is necessarily socially alienating may lend support to the view that capitalism is illegitimate, whether or not it is also unjust.

3.7 Feminist critiques

Feminists have criticized capitalism for relying upon and reproducing a patriarchal organization of society. The conditions for the possibility of a capitalist economy include a background of unwaged domestic and care labor enabling “social reproduction,” e.g. housework; the birthing and rearing of children; the care of adults, including wage workers, the elderly, and the unemployed (Federici 1975, 2012; Fraser 1994, 2009, 2014, 2022; Gardiner 1976; Gerstein 1973; Vogel 1983; Dalla Costa 1972). Without such unpaid labor production would be impossible and yet capital does not value such work. Indeed, it does not accord to it even a subsistence salary.

In these ways, capitalism (i) exploits women (at a higher rate than men), (ii) contributes to the reproduction of gender inequality and patriarchal domination within the household, and (iii) reproduces a mystified idea of the family as a private sphere rather than as an integral part of the economy.

Since the means to fight women’s exploitation (e.g. remunerating domestic labor) may conflict with women’s equality and emancipation from patriarchy, feminism faces the difficult challenge of finding ways to promote the recognition and valorization of socially necessary domestic labor, without however contributing to the relegation of women to the domestic sphere. Hence the long-standing debate between those who defend wages for housework (e.g. Dalla Costa 1972; Federici 1975; Fraser 1994) and those who, instead, argue for the socialization of care labor, including childcare (e.g. Davis 1981). (For a review of these debates and recent contributions in political theory to the social reproduction debate, see Forrester 2022; Battistoni 2025b.) Feminists have also expanded their critique of capitalism, by denouncing capitalism’s tendency towards the “feminization of labor,” as well as the racialization of care work (Ehrenreich and Ehrenreich 1973). By “femininization” is meant the increasing expansion of forms of employment and service jobs that, because of their precarious, low-wage and care-related character, share many of the exploitative features of forms of domestic labor traditionally performed by women (see also Forrester 2022).

3.8 Racial capitalism

Recently, there has been growing attention to the interrelation between capitalism and white supremacy, and to what has become known as “racial capitalism.” In its stronger version, racial capitalism indicates a non-contingent, necessary and inherent relationship between capitalism and white supremacy. According to Jodi Melamed (2015: 24), for example, “the term ‘racial capitalism’ requires us to recognize that capitalism is racial capitalism” insofar as, capital “can only be accumulated by producing and moving through relations of severe inequality among human groups … Procedures of racialization and capitalism are ultimately never separable from each other.”

On its weaker variant, racial capitalism indicates a mutually supportive, although not inherent or necessary, relationship between, on the one hand, racial hierarchies and racial segregation, and, on the other hand, the capitalist mode of production and the process of capital accumulation. For example, Dawson and Katzenstein (2019) understand capitalism and white supremacy as “articulated systems of domination.” They point to two mechanisms through which white supremacy has been mobilized in support of capitalist reproduction. First, state-sanctioned racial segregation, such as Jim Crow, was used to enable the dispossession of black communities, and the resulting capital accumulation by dominant racial groups. Second, the exclusion of black individuals from large segments of the market (e.g. credit markets and organized labor) has provided capital with a particularly vulnerable reserve army of labor who could be exploited at higher rates. Beyond such mechanisms, there has also been increasing attention to the ways in which capitalism has relied on imperial expansion, along racialized lines (Valdez 2023). Some have, however, argued that the relationship between white supremacy and capitalism is more complex and not necessarily one of direct mutual support, as racial policies have sometimes frustrated the interests of capital (Barrera 1979).

3.9 Capitalism and nature

Beyond workers, domestic laborers, and members of racialized groups, scholars have argued that capitalism exploits and dominates nature, too (Fraser 2014, 2022; Saito 2017; Battistoni 2025a). The capitalist economy is said to be premised on a large fund of “free gifts” from non-human nature. Nature provides the raw materials that are then transformed by human labor, the energy that machines need to produce commodities, the food that sustains the bodies of workers and thus the process of production, and more. Without certain natural and ecological preconditions there could be no capitalism. Yet capitalism treats such preconditions as free or cheap gifts (Moore 2015). It extracts from nature without replenishing it. An interesting question is whether the exploitation of nature can be wrongful and, if so, whether nature can itself be the wronged party. This question links the problem of the exploitation of nature to the broader questions of whether natural elements have rights, whether moral or legal, that can be wrongfully violated – the so-called question of the “rights of nature” (see Stone 2010).

More recently, some scholars have also reconceptualized humanly-caused natural phenomena such as climate change as a component of capitalism’s structural domination (Battistoni 2026). While some accuse traditional critiques of capitalism, including Marxism, of being indifferent to the exploitation of nature, others have read Marx himself as an ecological thinker. Kohei Saito (2017: 142), for example, writes that “Marx came to see the plunder of the natural environment as a manifestation of the central contradiction of capitalism.” While some scholars (e.g. Stiglitz 2012) believe that the tension between capitalism and environmental concerns can be solved by a more “green” capitalism, others argue for an exit from capitalism, for example, in the form of a degrowth ecological communism, which regulates the use of land and imposes strict constraints on production and consumption in order to achieve a state of sustainable production (Saito 2017; see also Stanczyk 2026). Overall, the question of the extent to which capitalism is compatible with environmental sustainability remains a point of contention and a fruitful venue for further research.

4. Further topics

Beyond arguments for and against capitalism, the contemporary philosophical literature has focused on a set of narrower questions that touch upon particular aspects of the capitalist economy. Such questions include, among others:

  1. the normative status and social responsibilities of business corporations (e.g. Ciepley 2013; Singer 2019; Hussain 2012; Christiano 2010; for a review of the literature see Claassen 2023)
  2. the right to strike (e.g. Gourevitch 2018)
  3. the value and future of work (for a review of the literature see Rose 2024)
  4. the role of trade unions (e.g. O’Neill and White 2018)
  5. workplace democracy (for a review see Frega, Herzog, and Neuhäuser 2019)
  6. the existence of a right to credit (Meyer 2018)
  7. the wrong of private debt markets (Herzog 2017)
  8. fairness in sovereign debt (Barry and Timitova 2007; Viehoff 2018)
  9. the justice of financial markets and the limits of capital mobility (Herzog 2017; Wollner 2014; Cordelli and Levy 2022; James 2012; Dietsch 2015, 2018)
  10. monetary policy and the legitimacy of central banks (van ’t Klooster 2019; Downey 2024; Eich 2022)
  11. the wrong of privatization (Knight and Schwartzberg 2018; Heath 2023; Cordelli 2020; Dorfman and Harel 2013)
  12. whether justice demands economic growth (Rose 2016)
  13. whether there should be absolute, upper limits to the accumulation of wealth (Robeyns 2025)

This summary list remains necessarily limited, as it would be impossible to provide an in-depth survey of all the questions and topics surrounding the capitalist economy. At the same time, it suffices to attest to the growing interest in philosophical questions concerning capitalism and to point at promising venues for further research.

This entry has provided an overview of the many complexities involved in the theorization of capitalism, privileging those accounts of capitalism that have directly influenced contemporary debates in political theory and philosophy. It has shown how a plurality of values and principles ground the normative cases for and against capitalism. The entry has also clarified how many defenses and critiques of capitalism are ultimately only defenses and critiques of some of its aspects, and that what counts as a distinctive normative critique of capitalism remains unsettled. Overall, the entry demonstrates that there is a growing interest in capitalism as an object of normative analysis and critique.

Bibliography

Cited work

  • Acemoglu, Daron and James A. Robinson, 2015, “The Rise and Decline of General Laws of Capitalism,” Journal of Economic Perspectives, 29(1): 3–28. doi:10.1257/jep.29.1.3
  • Althusser, Louis, 1995 [2014], Sur la reproduction, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France; translated by G. M. Goshgarian as On the Reproduction of Capitalism: Ideology and Ideological State Apparatuses, London: Verso, 2014.
  • Anderson, Elizabeth, 1993, Value in Ethics and Economics, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 2019, Private Government, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Arneson, Richard, 2016, “Exploitation, Domination, Competitive Markets, and Unfair Division,” Southern Journal of Philosophy, 54(S1): 9–30.
  • Arnold, Samuel, 2013, “Right-Wing Rawlsianism: A Critique,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 21(4): 382–404.
  • –––, 2017, “Capitalism, Class Conflict, and Domination,” Socialism and Democracy, 31(1): 106–124. doi:10.1080/08854300.2016.1215810
  • Barrera, Mario, 1979, Race and Class in the Southwest: A Theory of Racial Inequality, Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Barry, Christian and Lydia Tomitova, 2007, “Fairness in Sovereign Debt,” Ethics & International Affairs, 21(S1): 41–79. doi:10.1111/j.1747-7093.2007.00084.x
  • Battistoni, Alyssa, 2025a, Free Gifts: Capitalism and the Politics of Nature, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2025b, “Ideology at Work? Rethinking Reproduction,” American Political Science Review, 119(3): 1205–1218. doi:10.1017/S0003055424000868
  • –––, 2026, “Domination in the Age of the Externality,” in Chiara Cordelli and Melissa Lane (eds.), NOMOS LXVII: Climate Change, New York: New York University Press.
  • Benjamin, Walter, 1936 [1969], “L’oeuvre d’art à l’époque de sa reproduction mécanisée,” Zeitschrift für Sozialforschung, 5(1): 40-68; translated by Harry Zohn as “The Work of Art in the Age of Mechanical Reproduction,” edited by Hannah Arendt, Illuminations, New York: Schocken Books, pp. 217–251, 1969.
  • Block, Fred L. and Margaret R. Somers, 2014, The Power of Market Fundamentalism: Karl Polanyi’s Critique, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Blyth, Mark, 2013, Austerity: The History of a Dangerous Idea, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Brennan, Jason, 2014, Why Not Capitalism? New York: Routledge.
  • Brixel, Pascal, 2024, “The Unity of Marx’s Concept of Alienated Labor,” Philosophical Review, 133(1): 33–71. doi:10.1215/0031810810935339
  • Brown, Wendy, 2017, Undoing the Demos: Neoliberalism’s Stealth Revolution, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Bryan, Alexander, 2023, “Structural Domination and Freedom in the Labor Market: From Voluntariness to Independence,” American Political Science Review, 117(2): 692–704. doi:10.1017/S0003055422000922
  • Christiano, Thomas, 2010, “The Uneasy Relationship Between Democracy and Capital,” Social Philosophy and Policy, 27(1): 195–217.
  • Cicerchia, Lillian, 2022, “Structural Domination in the Labor Market,” European Journal of Political Theory, 21(1): 4–24. doi:10.1177/1474885119851094
  • Ciepley, David, 2013, “Beyond Public and Private: Toward a Political Theory of the Corporation,” American Political Science Review, 107(1): 139–158. doi:10.1017/s0003055412000536
  • Claassen, Rutger, 2023, “Political Theories of the Business Corporation,” Philosophy Compass, 18(1): e12892. doi:10.1111/phc3.12892
  • Coase, Ronald H., 1937, “The Nature of the Firm,” Economica, 4(16): 386–405. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0335.1937.tb00002.x
  • Cohen, G. A., 1978, Karl Marx’s Theory of History: A Defense, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 1979, “The Labor Theory of Value and the Concept of Exploitation,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 8(4): 338–360.
  • –––, 1983, “The Structure of Proletarian Unfreedom,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 12(1): 3–33.
  • –––, 1995, Self-Ownership, Freedom, and Equality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Cohen, Joshua, 1989, “The Economic Basis of Deliberative Democracy,” Social Philosophy and Policy, 6(2): 25–50. doi:10.1017/S0265052500000625
  • Cordelli, Chiara, 2020, The Privatized State, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2024, “Privatization, Structural Dependence, and the Problem of Legitimacy,” Erasmus Journal for Philosophy and Economics, 16(2): 66–84.
  • –––, 2025, “What is the Wrong of Capitalism?” American Political Science Review, 119(4): 1806-1821. doi:10.1017/S000305542500005X
  • Cordelli, Chiara and Jonathan Levy, 2022, “The Ethics of Global Capital Mobility,” American Political Science Review, 116(2): 439–452. doi:10.1017/S0003055421000964
  • Corneo, Giacomo, 2017, Is Capitalism Obsolete? A Journey through Alternative Economic Systems, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Corvino, Fausto, 2019, “Republican Freedom in the Labour Market: Exploitation Without Interpersonal Domination,” Theoria, 66(158): 103–131.
  • Crotty, James R., 2019, Keynes Against Capitalism: His Economic Case for Liberal Socialism, London and New York: Routledge.
  • Dalla Costa, Mariarosa, 1972, “Women and the Subversion of the Community,” Radical America, 6(1): 23–69.
  • Davis, Angela, 1981, Women, Race and Class, New York: Random House.
  • Dawson, Michael C. and Emily A. Katzenstein, 2019, “Survey Article: Articulated Darkness: White Supremacy, Patriarchy, and Capitalism in Shelby’s Dark Ghettos,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 27(2): 252–268.
  • Devine, Pat, 1989, Democracy and Economic Planning: The Political Economy of a Self-Governing Society, New York: Routledge, 2020. doi:10.4324/9780429033117
  • Dietsch, Peter, 2015, Catching Capital: The Ethics of Tax Competition, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780190251512.001.0001
  • –––, 2018, “The State and Tax Competition: A Normative Perspective,” in Martin O’Neill and Shepley Orr (eds.), Taxation: Philosophical Perspectives, Oxford: Oxford University Press, ch. 12.
  • Dorfman, Avihay and Alon Harel, 2013, “The Case Against Privatization,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 41(1): 67–102.
  • Downey, Leah, 2024, Our Money, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Ehrenreich, Barbara and John Ehrenreich, 1973, “Hospital Workers: A Case Study in the ‘New Working Class’,” Monthly Review, 24: 12–25.
  • Eich, Stefan, 2022, The Currency of Politics: The Political Theory of Money from Aristotle to Keynes, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Elster, Jon and Karl Ove Moene (eds.), 1989, Alternatives to Capitalism, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Estlund, David, 2024, “What’s Unjust about Structural Injustice?” Ethics, 134(3): 333–359.
  • Federici, Silvia, 1975, Wages against Housework, London and Bristol: Power of Women Collective and Falling Wall Press.
  • –––, 2012, Revolution at Point Zero: Housework, Reproduction and Feminist Struggle, Oakland, CA: MP Press.
  • Fitzgibbons, Athol, 1997, Adam Smith’s System of Liberty, Wealth, and Virtue: The Moral and Political Foundations of The Wealth of Nations, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Fraser, Nancy, 1994, “After the Family Wage,” Political Theory, 22(4): 591–618.
  • –––, 2009, “Feminism, Capitalism and the Cunning of History,” New Left Review, 56: 97–117. [Fraser 2009 available online]
  • –––, 2014, “Behind Marx’s Hidden Abode: For an Expanded Conception of Capitalism,” New Left Review, 86: 55–72. [Fraser 2014 available online]
  • –––, 2022, Cannibal Capitalism, London: Verso Books.
  • Freeman, Samuel, 2011, “Capitalism in the Classical and High Liberal Traditions,” Social Philosophy and Policy, 28(2):19–55. doi:10.1017/S0265052510000208;
  • –––, 2013, “Property-Owning Democracy and the Difference Principle,” Analyse and Kritik, 35: 9–36.
  • Frega, Roberto, Lisa Herzog, and Christian Neuhäuser, 2019, “Workplace Democracy: The Recent Debate”, Philosophy Compass, 14(4): e12574. doi:10.1111/phc3.12574
  • Friedman, Milton, 1962, Capitalism and Freedom, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Forrester, Katrina, 2022, “Feminist Demands and the Problem of Housework,” American Political Science Review, 116(4): 1278–1292.
  • Gardiner, Jean, 1976, “The Political Economy of Domestic Labour in Capitalist Societies,” in Diana Leonard, Sheila Allen, and Diana Leonard Barker (eds.), Dependence and Exploitation in Work and Marriage, London: Longman, pp. 109–120.
  • Gerstein, Ira, 1973, “Domestic Work and Capitalism,” Radical America, 7(4/5): 101–128.
  • Gilabert, Pablo, 2023, Human Dignity and Social Justice, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780192871152.001.0001
  • Gonzalez-Ricoy, Inigo, 2014, “The Republican Case for Workplace Democracy,” Social Theory and Practice, 40(2): 232–254.
  • Gould, Carol, 1988, Rethinking Democracy: Freedom and Social Cooperation in Politics, Economy, and Society, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Gourevitch, Alex, 2013, “Labor Republicanism and the Transformation of Work,” Political Theory, 41(4): 591–617. doi:10.1177/0090591713485370
  • –––, 2018, “The Right to Strike: A Radical View,” American Political Science Review, 112(4): 905–917.
  • Gourevitch, Alex and Lucas Stanczyk, 2018, “The Basic Income Illusion,” Catalyst, 1(4): 151–177.
  • Gray, John, 1981, “Hayek on Liberty, Rights, and Justice,” Ethics, 92(1): 73–84.
  • Habermas, Jurgen, 1984, The Theory of Communicative Action, translated by Thomas McCarthy, Boston: Beacon Press.
  • Harvey, David, 2003, The New Imperialism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2010, The Enigma of Capital and the Crises of Capitalism, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Hayek, Friedrich, 1944, The Road to Serfdom, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 1945, “The Use of Knowledge in Society,” American Economic Review, 35: 519–530.
  • –––, 1960, The Constitution of Liberty, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 1973/1976/1979, Law, Legislation, and Liberty, 3 vols., Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Heath, Joseph, 2023, “Anodyne Privatization,” Erasmus Journal for Philosophy and Economics, 16(2): 25–65.
  • Heinrich, Michael, 2012, An Introduction to the Three Volumes of Karl Marx’s Capital, translated by Ernest O’Connor, New York: Monthly Review Press.
  • Herzog, Lisa (ed.), 2017, Just Financial Markets? Finance in a Just Society, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Horkheimer, Max and Theodor W. Adorno, 1947 [2002], Dialectic of Enlightenment, translated by Edmund Jephcott, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2002.
  • Hussain, Waheed, 2012, “Corporations, Profit Maximization, and the Personal Sphere,” Economics and Philosophy, 28(3): 311–331.
  • –––, 2020, “Pitting People Against Each Other,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 48(1): 79–113. doi:10.1111/papa.12158
  • –––, 2023, Living with the Invisible Hand: Markets, Corporations, and Human Freedom, edited by Arthur Ripstein and Nicholas Vrousalis, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Jaeggi, Rahel, 2014, Alienation, edited by Frederick Neuhouser, with a foreword by Axel Honneth, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • –––, 2016, “What (if Anything) Is Wrong with Capitalism? Dysfunctionality, Exploitation and Alienation: Three Approaches to the Critique of Capitalism,” Southern Journal of Philosophy, 54(1): 44–65.
  • James, Aaron, 2012, Fairness in Practice: A Social Contract for a Global Economy, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Julius, A. J., 2013, “The Possibility of Exchange,” Politics, Philosophy & Economics, 12(4): 361–374. doi:10.1177/1470594x13496068
  • Kandiyali, Jan, 2020, “The Importance of Others: Marx on Unalienated Production,” Ethics, 130(4): 555–587. doi:10.1086/708536
  • Keynes, John Maynard, 1936 [2012], The General Theory of Employment, Interest, and Money, London: Macmillan. Edited by Elizabeth Johnson and Donald Moggridge, The Collected Writings of John Maynard Keynes, vol. 7, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012.
  • Klein, Steven, 2017, “Fictitious Freedom: A Polanyian Critique of the Republican Revival,” American Journal of Political Science, 61(4): 852–863. doi:10.1111/ajps.12317
  • Knight, Jack and Melissa Schwartzberg (eds.), 2018, NOMOS LX: Privatization, New York: New York University Press.
  • Landemore, Hélène and Isabelle Ferreras, 2016, “In Defense of Workplace Democracy: Towards a Justification of the Firm–State Analogy,” Political Theory, 44(1): 53–81. doi:10.1177/0090591715600035
  • Leipold, Bruno, 2014, Citizen Marx: Republicanism and the Formation of Karl Marx’s Social and Political Thought, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Levy, Jonathan, 2021, Ages of American Capitalism, New York: Random House.
  • –––, 2025, The Real Economy: History and Theory, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Lukács, György, 1923 [1971], “Az eldologiasodás és a proletáriátus osztálytudata,” Törtérelem еs osztálytudat; translated by Rodney Livingstone as “Reification and the Consciousness of the Proletariat,” History and Class Consciousness, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, pp. 83–222, 1971.
  • Luxemburg, Rosa, 1913 [1951], Die Akkumulation des Kapitals, Berlin: Paul Singer; translated by Agnes Schwarzschild as The Accumulation of Capital, London: Routledge, 1951, new edition 2003.
  • MacGilvray, Eric, 2011, The Invention of Market Freedom, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Mack, Eric, “Robert Nozick’s Political Philosophy,” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2024 Edition), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2024/entries/nozick-political/>
  • Maguire, Barry, 2022, “Efficient Markets and Alienation,” Philosophers’ Imprint, 22: 14. doi:10.3998/phimp.545
  • Malleson, Tom, 2014, After Occupy: Economic Democracy for the 21st Century, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199330102.001.0001
  • Marx, Karl, 1844 [1978], “Economic and Philosophic Manuscript of 1844,” in R. Tucker (ed.), The Marx-Engels Reader, second edition, New York: Norton, pp. 66–125.
  • –––, 1867 [1990], Capital, volume 1, translated by Ben Fowkes, London: Penguin, 1990.
  • Mau, Søren, 2023, Mute Compulsion: A Marxist Theory of the Economic Power of Capital, London: Verso.
  • Melamed, Jodi, 2015, “Racial Capitalism,” Critical Ethnic Studies, 1: 76–85.
  • Meyer, Marco, 2018, “The Right to Credit,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 26(3): 304–326.
  • Moore, Jason W., 2015, Capitalism in the Web of Life: Ecology and the Accumulation of Capital, London: Verso.
  • Neal, Larry and Jeffrey G. Williamson (eds.), 2014, The Cambridge History of Capitalism, Volume I: The Rise of Capitalism: From Ancient Origins to 1848, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • North, Douglass C., 1992, “Institutions and Economic Theory,” The American Economist, 36(1): 3–6. doi:10.1177/056943459203600101
  • Nozick, Robert, 1974, Anarchy, State, and Utopia, New York: Basic Books; new edition, 2006.
  • Offe, Claus, 2008, “Political Disaffection as an Outcome of Institutional Practices? Some Post-Tocquevillean Speculations,” in A. Brodocz, M. Llanque, G. S. Schaal (eds.), Bedrohungen der Demokratie, VS Verlag für Sozialwissenschaften, pp. 42–60. doi:10.1007/978-3-531-91156-4_3
  • O’Neill, Martin, 2012, “Free (and Fair) Markets without Capitalism. Political Values, Principles of Justice, and Property-Owning Democracy,” in O’Neill and Williamson (eds.) 2012: 75–100.
  • –––, 2020, “Social Justice and Economic Systems: On Rawls, Democratic Socialism, and Alternatives to Capitalism,” Philosophical Topics, 48(2): 159–202. doi:10.5840/philtopics202048219
  • O’Neill, Martin and Stuart White, 2018, “Trade Unions and Political Equality,” in Hugh Collins, Gillian Lester, and Virginia Mantouvalou (eds), Philosophical Foundations of Labour Law, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • O’Neill, Martin and Thad Williamson (eds.), 2012, Property-Owning Democracy: Rawls and Beyond, Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell. doi:10.1002/9781444355192
  • O’Shea, Tom, 2019, “Are Workers Dominated?” Journal of Ethics and Social Philosophy, 16(1): 1–24.
  • –––, 2020, “Socialist Republicanism,” Political Theory, 48(5): 548–572. doi:10.1177/0090591719876889
  • Ostrom, Elinor, 1990, Governing the Commons: The Evolution of Institutions for Collective Action, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Patten, Alan, 2014, “Are the Economic Liberties Basic?” Critical Review, 26(3/4): 362–374. doi:10.1080/08913811.2014.947745
  • Pettit, Philip, 2006, “Freedom in the Market,” Politics, Philosophy & Economics, 5(2): 131–149. doi:10.1177/1470594X06064218
  • Piketty, Thomas, 2020, Capital and Ideology, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Polanyi, Karl, 1944 [2001], The Great Transformation: The Political and Economic Origins of Our Time, New York: Rinehart; reprint, Boston: Beacon Press, 2001.
  • Postone, Moishe, 1993, Time, Labor, and Social Domination: A Reinterpretation of Marx’s Critical Theory, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Rand, Ayn, 1964, The Virtue of Selfishness: A New Concept of Egoism, New York: New American Library.
  • Rawls, John, 1996, Political Liberalism, paperback second edition, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • –––, 2001, Justice as Fairness: A Restatement, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Reiman, Jeffrey, 1987, “Exploitation, Force, and the Moral Assessment of Capitalism: Thoughts on Roemer and Cohen,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 16(1): 3–41.
  • Ripstein, Arthur, 2009, Force and Freedom: Kant’s Legal and Political Philosophy, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Roberts, William C., 2018, Marx’s Inferno: The Political Theory of Capital, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Robeyns, Ingrid, 2025, Limitarianism, London: Penguin Books.
  • Robinson, Cedric, 1983, Black Marxism: The Making of the Black Radical Tradition, London: Zed Press; reprint, Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina Press, 2000.
  • Roemer, John, 1982a, A General Theory of Exploitation and Class, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 1982b, “Property Relations vs. Surplus Value in Marxian Exploitation,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 11(4): 281–313.
  • –––, 1982c, “New Directions in the Marxian Theory of Exploitation and Class,” Politics & Society, 11(3): 253–287.
  • –––, 1985, “Should Marxists Be Interested in Exploitation?” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 14: 30–65.
  • –––, 2017, “Socialism Revised,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 45(3): 261–315. doi:10.1111/papa.12089
  • Ronzoni, Miriam, 2009, “The Global Order: A Case of Background Injustice? A Practice-Dependent Account,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 37: 229–256.
  • Rose, Julie L., 2016, Free Time, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2024, “The Future of Work? The Political Theory of Work and Leisure,” Annual Review of Political Science, 27: 283–300.
  • Saito, Kohei, 2017, Karl Marx’s Ecosocialism: Capital, Nature, and the Unfinished Critique of Political Economy, New York: Monthly Review Press.
  • Satz, Debra, 2010, Why Some Things Should Not Be for Sale: The Moral Limits of Markets, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Schumpeter, Joseph A., 1942, Capitalism, Socialism, and Democracy, New York: Harper & Brothers.
  • Schweickart, David, 2002, After Capitalism, Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield; second edition, 2011.
  • Smith, Adam, 1776, An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations, London: Printed for W. Strahan and T. Cadell. Reprinted in R. H. Campbell, A. S. Skinner, and W. B. Todd (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1976.
  • Singer, Abraham, 2019, The Form of the Firm: A Normative Political Theory of the Corporation, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Stanczyk, Lucas, 2026, “On the Moral Challenge of the Climate Crisis,” NOMOS LXVII: Climate Change, edited by Chiara Cordelli and Melissa Lane, New York: New York University Press.
  • Stiglitz, Joseph E., 2012, The Price of Inequality: How Today’s Divided Society Endangers Our Future, Norton.
  • Stilz, Anna, 2016, “The Value of Self-Determination,” Oxford Studies in Political Philosophy, (2): 98–127.
  • Streeck, Wolfgang, 2016, How Will Capitalism End? Essays on a Failing System, London: Verso Books.
  • Stone, Christopher D., 2010, Should Trees Have Standing? Law, Morality, and the Environment, third edition, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Thomas, Alan, 2017, Republic of Equals, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Tomasi, John, 2012, Free Market Fairness, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Valdez, Ines, 2023, Democracy and Empire: Labor, Nature, and the Reproduction of Capitalism, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Van Parijs, Philippe, 1984. “What (If Anything) Is Intrinsically Wrong with Capitalism?” Philosophica, 34 (2): 85–102.
  • –––, 1995, Real Freedom for All: What (If Anything) Can Justify Capitalism? Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/0198293577.001.0001
  • van’t Klooster, J., 2019, “Central Banking in Rawls’s Property-Owning Democracy,” Political Theory, 47(5): 674–698. doi:10.1177/0090591718810377
  • Veblen, Thorstein, 1904, The Theory of Business Enterprise, New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons; reprint, New York: Scribner, 1915.
  • Viehoff, Juri, 2018, “Eurozone Justice,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 26(3): 388–414.
  • Vogel, Lise, 1983, Marxism and the Oppression of Women: Toward a Unitary Theory, New Brunswick, NJ: Rutgers University Press.
  • Von Platz, Jeppe, 2014, “Are Economic Liberties Basic Rights?” Politics, Philosophy & Economics, 13(1): 23–44. doi:10.1177/1470594X13483466
  • –––, 2020, “Democratic Equality and the Justification of Welfare-State Capitalism,” Ethics, 131(1): 4–33.
  • Vrousalis, Nicholas, 2013, “Exploitation, Vulnerability, and Social Domination,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 41(2): 131–157. doi:10.1111/papa.12013
  • –––, 2018, “Exploitation: A Primer,” Philosophy Compass, 13(2): e12486. doi:10.1111/phc3.12486
  • –––, 2021a, “Socialism Unrevised: A Reply to Roemer on Marx, Exploitation, Solidarity, Worker Control,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 49(1): 8–109.
  • –––, 2021b, “The Capitalist Cage: Structural Domination and Collective Agency in the Market,” Journal of Applied Philosophy, 38(1): 40–54.
  • –––, 2022, Exploitation as Domination: What Makes Capitalism Unjust, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Walzer, Michael, 1983, Spheres of Justice: A Defense of Pluralism and Equality, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Weale, Albert, 2013, “The Property-Owning Democracy versus the Welfare State,” Analyse und Kritik, 35: 37–54.
  • Weber, Max, 1904/1905 [2002], “Die protestantische Ethik und der ‘Geist’ des Kapitalismus, Archiv für Sozialwissenschaft und Sozialpolitik,” 20: 1–54; 21: 1–110, Tübingen: J. C. B. Mohr (Paul Siebeck); translated and edited by Peter Baehr and Gordon C. Wells as The Protestant Ethic and the “Spirit” of Capitalism: and Other Writings, New York: Penguin.
  • Wells, Thomas R., 2013, “Adam Smith on Morality and Self-Interest,” in Christopher Luetege (ed.), Handbook of the Philosophical Foundations of Business Ethics, Berlin: Springer, pp. 281–296.
  • White, Stuart, 2011, “The Republican Critique of Capitalism,” Critical Review of International Social and Political Philosophy, 14(5): 561–579. doi:10.1080/13698230.2011.617119
  • Williamson, Oliver E., 1985, The Economic Institutions of Capitalism, New York: Simon & Schuster.
  • Wollner, Gabriel, 2014, “Justice in Finance: The Normative Case for an International Financial Transaction Tax,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 22(4): 458–485. doi:10.1111/jopp.12016
  • –––, 2019, “Anonymous Exploitation: Non-Individual, Non-Agential and Structural,” Review of Social Economy, 77(2): 143–162.
  • Ypi, Lea, 2024, “Freedom, Progress, and Capitalism,” in Democracy: Eleven Writers and Leaders on What It Is and Why It Matters, London: Profile Books, pp. 36–53.

Other important work

  • Adorno, Theodore W., 1951 [2005], Minima moralia: Reflexionen aus dem beschädigten Leben, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp; translated by Edmund Jephcott as Minima Moralia: Reflections from Damaged Life, London: Verso, 2005.
  • –––, 1966 [1973], Negative Dialektik, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp; translated by E. B. Ashton as Negative Dialectics (A Continuum Book), New York: Seabury Press, 1973.
  • Boldizzoni, Francesco, 2020, Foretelling the End of Capitalism: Intellectual Misadventures since Karl Marx, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Braudel, Fernand, 1967, Civilisation matérielle et capitalisme, Paris: Librairie Armand Colin; translated by Siân Reynolds as Civilization and Capitalism, 15th-18th Century, Berkeley: University of California Press, 1992.
    • 1967, Vol. I: Les structures du quotidien, The Structure of Everyday Life.
    • 1979a, Vol. II: Les jeux de l’échange, The Wheels of Commerce.
    • 1979b, Vol. III: Le temps du monde, The Perspective of the World.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius, 1975 [1998], L’institution imaginaire de la société, Paris: Éditions du Seuil; translated by Kathleen Blamey as The Imaginary Institution of Society, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press, 1998.
  • Commons, John R., 1924, Legal Foundations of Capitalism, New York: Macmillan.
  • Deleuze, Gilles and Felix Guattari, 1972 [1983], Capitalisme Et Schizophrénie 2: Mille Plateaux, Paris: Les Éditions De Minuit; translated by Robert Hurley, Mark Seem and Helen R. Lane as Anti-Oedipus: Capitalism and Schizophrenia, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1983.
  • Fraser, Nancy and Rahel Jaeggi, 2018, Capitalism, Cambridge, UK: Polity.
  • Galbraith, John Kenneth, 1952, American Capitalism: The Concept of Countervailing Power, Boston: Houghton-Mifflin.
  • Gramsci, Antonio, 1971, Selections from the Prison Notebooks, Quintin Hoare and Geoffrey Nowell Smith (eds. and trans.), New York City: International Publishers.
  • Harvey, David, 1982, The Limits to Capital, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Hayek, Friedrich, 1931, Prices and Production, London: Routledge.
  • –––, 1948, Individualism and Economic Order, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 1952, The Counter-Revolution of Science, Glencoe, IL: Free Press.
  • –––, 1958, “Freedom, Reason, and Tradition,” Ethics, 68: 229–45.
  • –––, 1968 [2002], “Der Wettbewerb als Entdeckungsverfahren,” Kieler Vorträge, Neue Folge 56, Kiel: Institut für Weltwirtschaft an der Universität Kiel; translated by Marcellus S. Snow as “Competition as a Discovery Procedure”, Quarterly Journal of Austrian Economics, 5(3): 9–23, 2002.
  • –––, 1969, Studies in Philosophy, Politics, and Economics, London: Routledge.
  • –––, 1974, “Pretense of Knowledge,” American Economic Review, 79(6): 3–7.
  • –––, 1988, The Fatal Conceit: The Errors of Socialism, W. W. Bartley III (ed.), The Collected Works of F. A. Hayek, vol. 1, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Herzog, Lisa, 2016, “What Could Be Wrong with a Mortgage? Private Debt Markets from a Perspective of Structural Injustice,” Journal of Political Philosophy, 25(4): 411–434.
  • Hilferding, Rudolf, 1910, Finance Capital: A Study of the Latest Phase of Capitalist Development, Morris Watnick and Sam Gordon (trans.), Tom Bottomore (ed.), London: Routledge, 1981.
  • Hobson, J. A., 1902, Imperialism: A Study, London: James Nisbet & Co., Limited; reprint, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2011.
  • Hodgson, Geoffrey M., 2015, Capitalism: Institutions, Evolution, Future, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Kalecki, Michal, 1972, The Last Phase in the Transformation of Capitalism, New York: Monthly Review Press.
  • Kandiyali, Jan, 2023, “Sharing Burdensome Work,” Philosophical Quarterly, 73(1): 143–163. doi:10.1093/pq/pqac023
  • Keynes, John Maynard, 1930 [2010], “Economic Possibilities for Our Grandchildren,” The Nation and Athenaeum; reprinted in his Essays in Persuasion, 1931, London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2010, pp. 321–332. doi:10.1007/978-1-349-59072-8_25
  • –––, 1936, The Collected Writings of John Maynard Keynes, London: Macmillan; reprint, Elizabeth Johnson and Donald Moggridge (eds.), The General Theory, vol. 7, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2013. doi:10.1017/UPO9781139524278
  • Lenin, V. I. , 1917 [1963], Империализм, как новейший этап капитализма, Petrograd: Zhizn’ i znanie; translated as Imperialism, the Highest Stage of Capitalism, in Selected Works, vol. 1, Moscow: Progress Publishers, 1963, pp. 667–766.
  • Liu, Glory M., 2022, Adam Smith’s America: How a Scottish Philosopher Became an Icon of American Capitalism, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Marcuse, Herbert, 1964, One-Dimensional Man: Studies in the Ideology of Advanced Industrial Society, Boston: Beacon Press.
  • Marx, Karl, 1857–8 [1973], Grundrisse der Kritik der politischen Ökonomie, Moscow: Verlag für fremdsprachige Literatur; translated by Martin Nicolaus as Grundrisse: Foundations of the Critique of Political Economy, London: Penguin, 1973.
  • –––, 1844 [2000], “Auszüge aus James Mills Buch Éléments d’économie politique,” first published in German in 1968, Berlin: Dietz; translated as “On James Mill,” in D. McLellan (ed.), Karl Marx: Selected Writings, revised edition, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000, pp. 124–133.
  • –––, 1875 [1978], “Randglossen zum Programm der deutschen Arbeiterpartei” first published as “Zur Kritik des sozialdemokratischen Parteiprogramms,” Die Neue Zeit, 9(1), 18: 561–575; translated as “Critique of the Gotha Program,” in R. Tucker (ed.), The Marx-Engels Reader, second edition, New York: Norton, 1978, pp. 525–541.
  • –––, 1894 [1991], Das Kapital: Kritik der politischen Oekonomie, Dritter Band: Der Gesammtprocess der kapitalistischen Produktion, Friedrich Engels (ed.), Hamburg: Verlag von Otto Meissner; translated by David Fernbach as Capital, volume 3, Friedrich Engels (ed.), London: Penguin, 1991.
  • Marx, Karl and Friedrich Engels, 1975–2005, Collected Works, 50 vols, New York: International Publishers.
  • Minsky, Hyman, 1986, Stabilizing an Unstable Economy, New York: McGraw-Hill Professional.
  • Piketty, Thomas, 2014, Capital in the Twenty-First Century, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Pollock, Friedrich, 1941, “State Capitalism: Its Possibilities and Limitations,” Studies in Philosophy and Social Science, 9: 200–225.
  • Robinson, Joan, 1942, An Essay on Marxian Economics, London: Macmillan; second edition, 1966.
  • Saito, Kohei, 2023, Marx in the Anthropocene: Towards the Idea of Degrowth Communism, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2024, Slow Down: How Degrowth Communism Can Save the Earth, London: Weidenfeld & Nicholson.
  • Schumpeter, Joseph A., 1908 [2010], Das Wesen und der Hauptinhalt der theoretischen Nationalökonomie, Leipzig: Duncker & Humblot; translated by Bruce A. McDaniel as The Nature and Essence of Economic Theory, London: Routledge, 2010.
  • –––, 1928, “The Instability of Capitalism,” Economic Journal, 38(151): 361–386.
  • –––, 1939 [2014], Business Cycles: A Theoretical, Historical, and Statistical Analysis of the Capitalist Process, 2 vols., New York and London: McGraw-Hill; reprint, Eastford, CT: Martino Fine Books, 2014.
  • Sehon, Scott R., 2024, Socialism: A Logical Introduction, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Sombart, Werner, 1911 [2001], Die Juden und das Wirtschaftsleben, Leipzig: Duncker & Humblot; translated by M. Epstein, Kitchener as The Jews and Modern Capitalism, ON: Batoche Books, 2001.
  • –––, 1913 [1967], Der Bourgeois: Zur Geistesgeschichte des modernen Wirtschaftsmenschen, Munich: Duncker & Humblot; translated and edited by M. Epstein as The Quintessence of Capitalism: A Study of the History and Psychology of the Modern Businessman, New York: Howard Fertig, 1967.
  • –––, 1928 [1987], Der moderne Kapitalismus: Historisch-systematische Darstellung des gesamteuropäischen Wirtschaftslebens von seinen Anfängen bis zur Gegenwart, Munich: Deutscher Taschenbuch Verlag, 1987.
  • –––, 1930, “Capitalism,” in Edwin R. Seligman and Alvin Johnson (eds.), Encylcopedia of the Social Sciences, vol. 3, New York: Metropolitan Company, pp. 195–208.
  • –––, 1967, Luxury and Capitalism, translated by W. R. Dittmar, Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press.
  • Sonenscher, Michael, 2022, Capitalism: The Story Behind the Word, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Thompson, Edward Palmer, 1963 [1968], The Making of the English Working Class, London: Gollancz; published with revisions, New York: Penguin Books, 1968.
  • Tribe, Keith, 2019, “Capitalism and its Critics,” in Gregory Claeys (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Nineteenth-Century Thought, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 123–140.
  • Trotsky, Leon, 1930, History of the Russian Revolution, translated by Max Eastman, Chicago: Haymarket Books, 2008.
  • Wallerstein, Immanuel, 1983, Historical Capitalism with Capitalist Civilization, London: Verso; reprint, 2011.
  • Weber, Max, 1909 [2013], “Agrarverhältnisse im Altertum,” Handwörterbuch der Staatswissenschaften, 1: 52–188; translated by R. I. Frank as Agrarian Sociology and Ancient Civilizations, London: Verso, 2013.
  • –––, 1921 [2019], Wirtschaft und Gesellschaft, Tübingen: J. C. B. Mohr (Paul Siebeck); translated and edited by Keith Tribe as Economy and Society, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2019.
  • Veblen, Thorstein, 1898a, “Why Is Economics Not an Evolutionary Science?” Quarterly Journal of Economics, 12(4): 373–97.
  • –––, 1898b, “The Beginnings of Ownership,” American Journal of Sociology, 4(3): 352–365.
  • –––, 1899a, “The Preconceptions of Economic Science, I,” Quarterly Journal of Economics, 13: 122–123.
  • –––, 1899b, “The Preconceptions of Economic Science: II,” Quarterly Journal of Economics, 13: 396–426.
  • –––, 1899c, The Theory of the Leisure Class, New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
  • –––, 1900, “The Preconceptions of Economic Science: III,” Quarterly Journal of Economics, 14: 240–269.
  • –––, 1901, “Industrial and Pecuniary Employments,” Publications of the American Economic Association, 3(3): 190–235.
  • –––, 1914, The Instinct of Workmanship and the State of the Industrial Arts, New York: Macmillan.
  • –––, 1918 [2015], The Higher Learning in America: A Memorandum on the Conduct of Universities by Business Men, New York: B. W. Huebsch; annotated edition, Richard F. Teichgraeber III (ed.), Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 2015.

Other Internet Resources

  • “Capitalism”, entry in Encyclopædia Britannica, Authors: Robert L. Heilbroner, Norman Thomas Professor Emeritus of Economics at the New School for Social Research, and Peter J. Boettke, Associate Professor of Economics at George Mason University.

Copyright © 2026 by
Chiara Cordelli <cordelli@uchicago.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free