Epistemic Closure

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Marc Alspector-Kelly replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

A set is closed under a relation when members of that set only stand in that relation to other members of that set.^[1] The epistemic closure debates concern whether sets of certain beliefs—primarily those that are known, justified, or warranted—are closed under relations that, in one way or another, involve valid deductive implication.

Most—but by no means all—of the discussion has centered on knowledge closure. As we’ll characterize it here (see §1.1 below), knowledge closure is the claim that, if you know \(P\) and believe \(Q\) because it’s deductively implied by \(P\), then you also know \(Q\).^[2] And how could you not? After all, as you’re well aware, \(Q\) has to be true if \(P\) is; and you know that \(P\) is true. So of course you know that \(Q\) is true as well!

The intuition expressed by the “how could you not?” exclamation above is a powerful one, as even closure deniers concede. Some advocates, indeed, view closure as an unassailable epistemological axiom, so that any theory implying closure failure is refuted thereby.^[3] Admittedly, a stance as dismissive of closure denial as this is not as widely endorsed nowadays. But the force of the intuition that closure is obviously true has been, and remains, the most influential consideration in its favor, as a result of which closure’s endorsement is widely regarded as the default position.

Consequently, most of the arguments for closure are really arguments against closure denial, ones that purport to show that the supposed gains that accrue to such denial can be achieved without renouncing closure. Closure deniers, meanwhile, argue that such denial is the linchpin for the resolution of a variety of epistemological quandaries, and that their stance avoids untenable commitments that are forced on the closure advocate.

Closure is central to a wide variety of epistemological issues. These include the nature of knowledge and of justification, skepticism, sensitivity and safety, transmission and transmission failure, fallibilism, contextualism and pragmatic encroachment, bootstrapping and circularity, evidence and probability, and the lottery and preface paradoxes, among others.

• 1. Defining Closure and Closure Denial
  • 1.1 Defining Closure
  • 1.2 Closure Denial
• 2. Sensitivity, Safety, and Skepticism
  • 2.1 Nozick
  • 2.2 Dretske
  • 2.3 Red Barn
  • 2.4 Abominable Conjunctions
  • 2.5 The Spreading Problem
  • 2.6 Safety
  • 2.7 Vacuous Safety
  • 2.8 Lottery Cases
  • 2.9 Closure Failures for Safety
• 3. Closure, Transmission, and Sources of Warrant
  • 3.1 Preservationism: Warrant for \(P\) as Warrant for \(Q\)
  • 3.2 Preservationism: Frontloading
  • 3.3 Sources of Warrant
    • 3.3.1 Warrant by Background Information
    • 3.3.2 Warrant by Entitlement
  • 3.4 Transmissivism
• 4. Multi-Premise Closure
• 5. Justification Closure
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Defining Closure and Closure Denial

1.1 Defining Closure

According to the simplest version of closure—appearing primarily in studies of epistemic logic—if you know \(P\), and \(P\) implies \(Q\), then you know \(Q\). If, however, you have no idea that \(P\) does imply \(Q\), you wouldn’t be expected to nevertheless inevitably know \(Q\), even if you do know \(P\).

What might be called the classic version says that, if you know both \(P\) and that \(P\) implies \(Q\), then you know \(Q\). But it’s consistent with the antecedent that you don’t even believe \(Q\). And, even if you do, you might not believe it because it follows from \(P\) but instead from, say, wishful thinking.

A recent, now-popular alternative forgoes reference to your knowing that \(P\) implies \(Q\):

If you know \(P\) and competently deduce \(Q\) from \(P\), thereby coming to believe \(Q\), while retaining your knowledge of \(P\) throughout, then you know \(Q\) (Hawthorne 2004, 34).

Call this the dynamic version. The “retaining your knowledge throughout” clause is due to the fact that this is a diachronic principle: your deduction of \(Q\) from \(P\) takes up an interval of time, at the end of which you come to believe \(Q\). Since you could lose your knowledge of \(P\) during that interval, the additional clause is required. This contrasts with the classic version, which is synchronic: you know \(P\), that \(P\) implies \(Q\), and \(Q\) at the same time. The dynamic version represents the expansion of knowledge by inference, which its advocates view as the core of the intuition behind closure.^[4]

There are, however, reasons to prefer a synchronic version. A competent deduction could involve a number of inferential steps or just one. If it involves a number of them, then closure will need to apply to each intermediate step. But then we might as well just limit the principle to one-step inferences. But we shouldn’t treat a one-step competent deduction as requiring that you end up believing \(Q\); closure is sometimes appealed to in order to explain retraction phenomena wherein, realizing that \(P\) implies \(Q\), you retract your belief in \(P\) rather than coming to believe \(Q\). But then a one-step competent deduction just seems to involve your recognition, at a time, that \(P\) implies \(Q\) (Alspector-Kelly 2019, 9–10).

It’s also consistent with the antecedent of the dynamic version that, at some point during the interval taken up by the competent deduction, you lose your recognition that \(P\) implies \(Q\), and so arrive at your belief in \(Q\) without any grip on its inferential relation to \(P\). You could, then, believe \(Q\) at that point from wishful thinking, and so not know it. So you need to retain throughout, and so into the moment that you believe \(Q\), not only your knowledge of \(P\), but also your recognition that \(Q\) follows from \(P\). But then we might as well just characterize closure as concerning your epistemic state at that moment from the outset.^[5]

We’ll work with the following synchronic version:

SPC (single-premise closure): necessarily, if you know \(P\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then you know \(Q\).^[6]

The phrase “because it’s implied by \(P\)” does not mean merely that you know that \(P\) implies \(Q\) as per the classic version. You could know this solely by testimony, for example, without any comprehension of the inferential relation.^[7] Rather, you understand, or “see”, that \(P\) implies \(Q\), which understanding somehow grounds your inferential dispositions, and which dispositions are manifested by your believing \(Q\). We won’t attempt to finesse such understanding further here.^[8]

Your believing \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\) is compatible with belief overdetermination: you could believe \(Q\) for other reasons as well. You might, for example, have already believed, before arriving at the department meeting, that the minimum of ten faculty members required for a quorum are present because a colleague, already there, told you as much by phone. Upon arriving and counting twelve faculty members, you then infer that a quorum is indeed present, and believe it for that reason as well.

The “necessarily” operator is needed. If SPC were a material conditional, then it would be true if there just happen not to be cases wherein the antecedent is true and the consequent false, but where that combination is entirely possible. It’s also likely stronger than a subjunctive conditional, which still permits possible scenarios in which the antecedent is true and the consequent false (see note 11). But it’s not logical necessity: the consequent isn’t a logical consequence of the antecedent. So it’s intended as either a metaphysical necessity, reflecting the essential characteristics of knowledge, or a conceptual necessity, reflecting the contours of the concept of knowledge. We won’t try to determine which here.

SPC concerns inferences with only one premise. The multi-premise version runs as follows:

MPC: necessarily, if you know each of \(P, R, S,\ldots\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P, R, S,\ldots\), then you know \(Q\).

Much of the discussion below concerns SPC because what’s said of it will apply to MPC as well and, as we’ll see in §4, there are concerns about MPC that, prima facie at least, don’t apply to SPC.

1.2 Closure Denial

Closure deniers don’t deny that sometimes—indeed, most of the time—when SPC’s antecedent is satisfied, so is its consequent. But they deny that this is an exceptionless generalization: there are, the closure denier insists, cases—possible ones, if not actual—wherein the antecedent is satisfied but the consequent not.

However, there aren’t any closure deniers—at least, no sane ones—in the sense of someone who thinks that no closure principle is true. Some feature \(F\) will systematically distinguish cases wherein SPC succeeds from those wherein it fails. So some version of the following closure principle is true: if you know \(P,\) believe \(Q\) because it follows from \(P,\) and \(F\) is realized, then you know \(Q\). Whether one counts as a closure advocate who is finessing the closure principle or as a closure denier, then, is really a matter of degree: how much is packed into \(F\), and how far does it take us from the underlying intuition motivating closure’s advocacy?^[9]

2. Sensitivity, Safety, and Skepticism

The knowledge closure debate was initially triggered, and subsequently dominated, by two closure-denying theories of knowledge: Robert Nozick’s tracking theory and Fred Dretske’s conclusive reasons account.

2.1 Nozick

Nozick (1981, ch. 3) initially proposed that, for you to know \(P\), if \(P\) were false then you wouldn’t believe it. This subjunctive (or counterfactual or modal) conditional has come to be called the “sensitivity” condition.^[10] Sensitivity is standardly interpreted in possible-worlds format as requiring that, in the nearest world(s) to the actual world in which \(P\) is false, you don’t believe \(P\).^[11]

The view implies closure failure. But, far from regarding this as a disadvantage, Nozick saw it as the key to countering the Cartesian Skeptical Argument (CSA).^[12] Consider the following version of the CSA, where “\(H\)” is “you have hands” and “\(BIV\)” is “you’re a handless brain-in-a-vat”—your brain resides in a vat where it is electrically stimulated to have precisely the same sensory experiences that you now have:

CSA1.

You don’t know \(\neg BIV\).

CSA2.

If you don’t know \(\neg BIV\), then you don’t know \(H\).

CSA3.

So you don’t know \(H\).

Since an argument with the same structure could be run for almost any claim about the external world by substituting that claim for \(H\), the ultimate result is skepticism of the external world.^[13]

If you didn’t have hands, this wouldn’t be because you’re a \(BIV\)—a remote possibility beyond our current technological capacities—but because you lost them in, for example, a car accident. But then you would be well aware that you don’t have hands, and so wouldn’t believe that you do. So \(H\) is sensitive. Assuming that you also meet whatever other conditions knowledge requires, if any, then you know \(H\). However, if you were a \(BIV\) then, since everything would seem to you precisely as it now does, you would still believe that you’re not a \(BIV\); \(\neg BIV\) is insensitive. So you don’t know \(\neg BIV\). So CSA2 is false. CSA2 is the contrapositive of “if you know \(H\), then you know \(\neg BIV\)”, which is an instance of the closure principle that, if you know \(P\) (and \(P\) implies \(Q)\), then you know \(Q\). So that principle is false.^[14]

Here’s a counterexample to the sensitivity condition that Nozick considered (Nozick 1981, 179). A grandmother is visited by her grandson, who appears well. She presumably knows, in virtue of his so appearing, that he is well. But if he were ill, other family members would prevent her from seeing him and would tell her that he is well, so as to avoid distressing her. So she would still believe that he is well. So her belief is insensitive. But she seems, nonetheless, to know that he is well.

Nozick’s response was to appeal to methods: if \(P\) were false then you would not believe \(P\) by the same method you actually used to arrive at belief in \(P\). Grandma’s actual method was visual inspection of her grandson and, if he were ill and so looked it, she wouldn’t believe he was well. So her belief, although insensitive, is method-sensitive. Knowledge, Nozick suggested, requires, not sensitivity, but method-sensitivity.

2.2 Dretske

On Dretske 1971’s conclusive-reasons view, knowledge requires that you wouldn’t have the reason you have for your belief if that belief were false.^[15] In other words, Dretske requires, not that your belief is sensitive, but that your reason is. In the grandmother case, if the grandson were sick she wouldn’t have the same reason—that he looks well—that she actually has, and so his looking that way counts as a conclusive reason.^[16]

Dretske’s conclusive-reasons account and Nozick’s method-relative account arrive at the same judgments about who knows what in, at least, the cases we will be considering.^[17] So we’ll treat them as the same view for our purposes here, calling it the “basis-sensitivity” account, where “basis” is neutral between methods of belief formation and reasons for belief.

In support of his view Dretske offered the now-famous zebra case (Dretske 1970). You’re at the zoo, looking into the zebra paddock at a zebra. Since it looks like a zebra \((LZ)\), you believe, and presumably know, that it is a zebra \((Z). Z\) is basis-sensitive: if it weren’t a zebra it would be, say, a rhino, and so wouldn’t look like a zebra. Since zebras aren’t mules, \(Z\) implies that it’s not a mule disguised to look just like a zebra \((\neg DM)\). You infer \(\neg DM\) from \(Z. \neg DM\) is not basis-sensitive: \(DM\) implies \(LZ\), so you’d still believe \(Z\) and infer \(\neg DM\) from it. It’s obvious, Dretske insists, that you can’t learn \(\neg DM\) by so inferring. But you also don’t know \(\neg DM\) by its appearance, which it would have if \(DM\). Nor have you washed the animal, conducted a DNA test, or done anything else that would indicate \(\neg DM\). So you know \(Z\) but not \(\neg DM\). Closure fails.

Skeptical hypotheses like “I’m a \(BIV\)”, “I’m dreaming”, and the like are wholesale: they are one-size-fits-all hypotheses designed to undermine virtually all external-world knowledge claims. \(DM\) is, instead, a piecemeal skeptical hypothesis, targeting a specific ordinary knowledge claim, with the implied suggestion that similar piecemeal skeptical hypotheses can be wielded against most if not all other external-world knowledge claims.^[18] Skeptical hypotheses of both varieties imply that your grounds for believing the targeted ordinary claims—you seem to have hands, it looks like a zebra—remain (or, at least, seem to do so). Call such ordinary proposition/skeptical hypothesis pairs—where the former implies the denial of the latter—Dretske cases.

Dretske (1970) saw the zebra case as an instance of what he called “penetration failure”: your basis, \(LZ\), for believing \(Z\) doesn’t constitute a basis for \(\neg DM\). He thought that such penetration failures provide an argument for closure failure: if the way in which you come to know the premise isn’t inevitably available as a way to come to know the conclusion, then why think that you must end up knowing the conclusion anyway? However, your basis for the conclusion is that it follows from the premise, which inevitably isn’t your basis for the premise. Closure doesn’t require that the way you know the premise is inevitably a way to know the conclusion. It only requires that, if you do know the premise, and infer the conclusion from it, then you know the conclusion (Klein 1995, Luper 2006; see also §3.1 below).

Dretske (2013) also claimed that closure fails when \(P\) is “lightweight” (an ordinary claim) and \(Q\) is “heavyweight” (a much-disputed philosophical claim): you can’t learn “there are physical objects” by inference from “there are cookies in the jar”, “the past is real” from “I finished breakfast”, and so on, despite the fact that the latter implies the former. However, at least some heavyweight claims are basis-sensitive: if there weren’t any physical objects in the jar, then there wouldn’t be any cookies in there, and so it wouldn’t look to you as though there were (Hawthorne 2013). And at least some lightweight propositions are not basis-sensitive. You know that the ice cubes in the glass of lemonade that you left on the patio for four hours in 95° heat have melted. But if they hadn’t—someone put the glass in the fridge without your knowing—you would still remember having put it outside and so believe that they’ve melted (Vogel 1987).

Others have also argued that closure fails for lightweight-to-heavyweight inferences. Yablo (2014, 2017), for example, suggests that the heavyweight claims introduce subject-matter—whether there is a physical world, you’re a \(BIV\), and so on—that aren’t included in the lightweight claims, and that closure only succeeds from \(P\) to \(Q\) when \(Q\) doesn’t introduce subject-matter not included in \(P\). And Schaffer (2004, 2007) suggests that knowledge ascriptions are implicitly contrastive: you know that those are cookies rather than pickles, but not that they’re cookies rather than cookie-hallucinations. So knowing that they are cookies in the first sense doesn’t require knowing that they’re not hallucinations. Such views introduce restrictions on SPC that, their advocates hope, block lightweight-to-heavyweight inferences without blocking intuitively acceptable inferences.^[19]

2.3 Red Barn

At first glance, basis-sensitivity helps to resolve a well-known counterexample to sensitivity (Kripke 2011). In red-barn country there are both real barns and fake barns that look real; but only real ones are painted red. Knowing none of this, you see a red barn, believe that it’s a red barn, and infer that it’s a barn. “It’s a red barn” is sensitive: if it weren’t a red barn it wouldn’t look like one, so you wouldn’t believe that it is. But “it’s a barn” isn’t sensitive: if it weren’t a barn—and so were a non-red fake barn—it would still look like a barn. So you know that it’s a red barn but not that it’s a barn. This isn’t just an example of closure failure on the sensitivity view; it’s an embarrassing one.

However, both “it’s a red barn” and “it’s a barn” are basis-sensitive. If it weren’t a red barn it wouldn’t look red; so you wouldn’t have the same basis for “it’s a red barn”. And you wouldn’t infer that it’s a barn from “it’s a red barn”. So, since inferring from a different premise presumably constitutes a different basis, you wouldn’t have the same basis for “it’s a barn” (Adams, Barker, and Figurelli 2012).^[20]

But there’s a problem. Red-barn country is a version of fake-barn country (wherein the color is irrelevant), originally offered as a Gettier case: although you’re justified in believing that it’s a barn and it is, you don’t know it (Goldman 1976). But the fact, unbeknownst to you, that the red ones are real in red barn country doesn’t seem to matter. So you don’t know “it’s a barn” in red-barn country either; and similarly for “it’s a red barn”. Basis sensitivity preserves closure in this case, but in the wrong direction.^[21]

2.4 Abominable Conjunctions

Another objection lodged against sensitivity accounts, and one that applies to any closure-denying view, is that closure denial seems to license assertions that are intuitively infelicitous (or “abominable”), such as “I know that I have hands but I don’t know that I’m not a (handless) \(BIV\)”.^[22] According to the “knowledge rule” of assertion—that I should only assert what I know—I can assert \(H\) but not \(\neg BIV\) (Williamson 2000, ch. 11). But it would be bizarre to complacently assert the former and yet steadfastly refuse to assert the latter (Hawthorne 2013). Our commitment to closure, it is claimed, provides the best explanation for these intuitions.

An alternative explanation is, however, available to the closure denier. I initially take myself to know \(H\) and then realize—not that I can’t know \(H\) if I don’t know \(\neg BIV\), as per closure—but that I can’t know \(H\) if I am a \(BIV\). But I can’t affirm “\(\neg BIV\) but I don’t know \(\neg BIV\)”; that’s infelicitous.^[23] So I can only either take myself to know \(\neg BIV\), refuse to express an opinion on the matter, or retract my claim to know \(H\). But I’m convinced that I don’t know \(\neg BIV\), and it would be bizarre to refuse to express an opinion when I am fully aware that I must not be a \(BIV\) if, as I claim, I know \(H\). So I retract my claim to know \(H\).

That doesn’t mean that I don’t know \(H\). I can felicitously assert of someone else that they have hands, and so aren’t a \(BIV\), but don’t know that they’re not; I just can’t felicitously assert this of myself. I might nevertheless have hands, and so not be a \(BIV\), despite not knowing the latter. Correspondingly, I can coherently assert of someone else that they know that they have hands, and so aren’t a \(BIV\), but don’t know that they’re not. I just can’t felicitously assert this of myself either, and for the same reason. I might nevertheless know that I have hands, and so not be a \(BIV\), but not know the latter.

It might be objected that third-person conjunctions are also infelicitous. But, when the relevant cases are carefully described, the infelicity dissipates. My wife and I note that, according to the posted schedule, the train we’re taking leaves in a half-hour. My wife goes to get coffee. While she’s gone it occurs to me that the schedule might have recently changed; I ask the ticket agent, who assures me that it hasn’t. If queried by someone whether my wife knows when the train leaves—they’re worried she won’t get back in time—I would assure them that she does. But I wouldn’t claim that she knows that the schedule hasn’t changed; I investigated that, not her. “Although she doesn’t know it, the schedule hasn’t changed; so she knows that the train leaves in a half-hour” doesn’t seem particularly infelicitous. My knowing that the schedule hasn’t changed makes all the difference (Alspector-Kelly 2019, §10.7).

2.5 The Spreading Problem

Here are three closure principles that are implied by SPC:

Addition Closure (AC): if \(S\) knows \(P\), and believes \((P \vee Q)\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then \(S\) knows \((P \vee Q)\).

Simplification Closure (SC): if \(S\) knows \((P \amp Q)\), and believes \(P\) because it’s implied by \((P \amp Q)\), then \(S\) knows \(P\).

Equivalence Closure (EC): If \(S\) knows \(P, P\) is logically equivalent to \(Q\), and \(S\) believes \(Q\) because it is implied by \(P\), then \(S\) knows \(Q\).

It is widely claimed that renouncing these closure principles is extremely unintuitive (Hawthorne 2013, Holliday 2015, McGlynn 2014a). But we can get to \(\neg BIV\) from \(H\) by a combination of either AC and EC or SC and EC. Here’s the first way:

1. \(H\)
2. So, \(H \lor \neg BIV\) 1, AC
3. So, \(\neg BIV\) 2, EC^[24]

And here’s the second:

1. \(H\)
2. So, \(H \amp \neg BIV\) 1, EC^[25]
3. So, \(\neg BIV\) 2, SC

So both Nozick and Dretske must either deny both SC and AC or deny EC on pain of allowing knowledge of \(\neg BIV\) by inference from \(H\). If a belief is basis-sensitive then so is any belief logically equivalent to it.^[26] So both Nozick and Dretske have to, and did, affirm EC. But Nozick, while denying SC, affirmed AC (Nozick 1981, 228), and so is susceptible to the first way above; and Dretske affirmed both AC and SC, and so is susceptible to both ways (Dretske 1970, 1009). Since both claim that closure fails from \(H\) to \(\neg BIV\), both accounts are, as written, inconsistent.

Any closure denier who repudiates the inference from \(H\) to \(\neg BIV\) will also have to either deny both SC and AC or deny EC, despite the fact that they are all very intuitive principles. In response the closure denier might point out that it is also very intuitive that one can’t learn \(\neg BIV\) by inference from \(H\) by any inferential route.^[27]

There is a host of problems with basis sensitivity that have little to do with closure; the ice-cube case (§2.2) is one such, but there are many others.^[28] And there are a number of more recent sensitivity accounts that either purport to resolve at least some of these problems, or affirm closure, or both (Adams and Clarke 2005, Becker 2012, Baumann 2012, Black 2008, Murphy and Black 2012, DeRose 1995 and 2010, and Roush 2005). But by far the most popular approach renounces sensitivity entirely in favor of an alternative subjunctive conditional, safety.

2.6 Safety

A belief \(P\) is safe if, were you to believe \(P, P\) would be true.^[29] This is the contrapositive of sensitivity. But it’s not equivalent to sensitivity because, unlike material conditionals, the contraposition of a subjunctive conditional isn’t equivalent to the original conditional. The safety conditional is standardly rendered in possible worlds format as requiring that, in nearby worlds in which you believe \(P\), \(P\) is true.^[30]

An oft-advertised advantage of safety over sensitivity is that it preserves closure (Sosa 1999; Luper 1984, 2006; Pritchard 2009a; Williamson 2000). Consider the SCA. There may well be nearby worlds in which \(\neg H\); a hand-maiming car accident, after all, can be caused by the briefest ill-timed glance at your phone. But, in such worlds, you would be well aware that \(\neg H\). So your belief in \(H\) is safe. And your belief in \(\neg BIV\) is safe as well, although for a very different reason: our technological capacities being what they currently are, there’s no nearby world in which \(BIV\). For that reason alone, there’s no nearby world in which \(BIV\) and you believe \(\neg BIV\). So that belief is also safe. So, contrary to both the skeptic and the sensitivity theorist—and assuming that you meet whatever other conditions knowledge requires, if any—you do know \(\neg BIV\), and closure is preserved.^[31]

2.7 Vacuous Safety

In the \(BIV\) case your belief in \(H\) is safe due to the basis that you have for it: in nearby worlds in which it’s false you don’t have the perceptual experiences you actually have that lead you to believe it. However, your belief in \(\neg BIV\) is only safe because the nearest world in which it’s false is too distant to matter; it’s vacuously safe. In general, skeptical hypotheses imply that you have (or, at least, seem to have) the same basis for the ordinary proposition that you actually have. So you will believe the ordinary proposition on that basis in the nearest world in which the skeptical hypothesis is true (since you actually do so), and so in which the ordinary proposition is false. If the nearest such world is nearby, then you’ll believe the ordinary proposition in a nearby world in which it’s false; that belief will be unsafe. So, in order for it to be safe, the skeptical hypothesis must be false in nearby worlds. Your belief that it is false is, therefore, vacuously safe.

A vacuously safe belief is safe no matter what your basis for it might be. So, if you believe it because your astrologer says so, your belief will still be safe. But it’s hard to swallow the claim that you know it on that basis.^[32] The safety theorist can suggest in response that safety is a necessary but not sufficient condition for knowledge.^[33] Since \(Q\) in Dretske cases is vacuously safe, however, it doesn’t matter to its safety that you inferred it from \(P\). But closure enshrines the idea that your inferring \(Q\) from \(P\) ensures that you know \(Q\). It’s odd that a defense of closure appeals to a condition—safety—that makes that inference superfluous.

2.8 Lottery Cases

There are also Dretske cases wherein it’s doubtful that the nearest not-\(Q\) world is distant. The flagship example is Hawthorne 2004’s lottery case. In light of your meager bank balance, you know that you can’t afford to go on an African safari next week. That implies that you won’t win the lottery this week and so be able to afford such a trip despite that meager balance. But it’s widely agreed that you don’t know that you’ll lose the lottery before the draw, despite its being extremely likely that you will.

That agreement puts pressure on probabilist threshold theories of justification and knowledge according to which you are justified in believing \(P\) when \(P\) is sufficiently probable on your evidence—as is, presumably, your belief that you will lose the lottery given the astronomical odds in its favor—and know \(P\) when your belief, in addition to being sufficiently probable, is also true and not a Gettier case, both of which are satisfied by your belief that you will lose the lottery.

But it doesn’t put the same pressure on modal theories, including safety theory. Although improbable, the nearest world in which you win the lottery is very nearby: just a slightly different arrangement of the balls that drop from the cage will do the trick. So the safety theorist can explain that wide agreement: you don’t know that you’ll lose because you’ll still believe that you’ll lose in the nearby world in which you win.^[34]

But, as per §2.7 above, if you win the lottery in a nearby world, then “you can’t afford an African safari” is unsafe. So you don’t know that either, despite intuition to the contrary. The safety theorist is a skeptic to at least this extent: if you have a lottery ticket, then you don’t know any proposition that would be false if you’ll soon have a lot of money.

Perhaps that’s an amount of skepticism we can live with. However, there are any number of analogous “lottery-esque” propositions that make trouble for a much wider swath of ordinary knowledge (Vogel 1990a, Hawthorne 2004). For example: you remember parking your car in parking spot 3b half an hour ago, where it remains. You believe—and, presumably, know—that it’s there now. This implies that it wasn’t stolen in the last half-hour. But you don’t seem to know that it wasn’t. And you know that the Broncos won by reading that in the newspaper. Their winning implies that that report isn’t an erroneous misprint. But you don’t seem to know that it isn’t.

In response, the safety theorist will insist that, for example, if you do know that the car is in 3b, the nearest world in which it is stolen will be distant—the thief detests that model, say—and so, by the safety account, you do know that it isn’t stolen. This contrasts with the eponymous lottery case wherein the nearest world in which you win is nearby. Were, however, the nearest world in which it’s stolen also nearby—the thief covets that model—then you indeed don’t know that it’s in 3b (Pritchard 2007a).

But our being informed that the nearest \(\neg Q\) world is distant in such cases doesn’t seem to shift our intuition that you don’t know \(Q\). (Note that you’re not so informed.) In the lottery case, suppose that a ball with one of your ticket’s numbers on it—and so one that would have to drop in order for you to win—got stuck in the cage’s wire frame, so that only if the cage were forcefully shaken would that ball drop. However, since the cage is firmly affixed to the floor, that’s not something that would easily happen. The nearest world in which you win is now distant. But, intuitively, you—knowing nothing about the ball’s being stuck—still don’t know that you’ll lose.

Instead, that intuition seems to hinge on the fact that your only available evidence in lottery cases is statistical: your case (ticket, parked car, report) is one among many, you have reason to believe that it is, or is likely to be, false in a small number of those cases (a ticket will win, a car will probably be stolen, some report will likely contain a misprint), and you have no reason to think that your case is exceptional (Vogel 1990). Such evidence seems not to deliver knowledge, however distant the nearest \(\neg Q\) world might be. Recall also that, on the safety view, \(Q\) propositions in Dretske cases must be vacuously safe if you know the corresponding \(P\) proposition. So your basis for believing \(Q\) shouldn’t matter.

Since most of our sources of information misfire on occasion, similar cases involving lottery-esque propositions can be constructed for most of our everyday knowledge. The resulting skepticism is very widespread. Such cases are not only a challenge for the safety theorist; they confront any non-skeptical closure-affirming view. Some closure advocates argue that, notwithstanding intuition, you do know that you will lose the lottery, and similarly for other lottery-esque propositions (Cohen 1988, Engel 2021). And some, like the safety theorist, claim that there are crucial differences between the eponymous lottery proposition, which you don’t know, and lottery-esque propositions, which, it’s claimed, you do know (Nelkin 2000, Smith 2010, 2016a, and 2021).

2.9 Closure Failures for Safety

Although the safety account preserves closure in Dretske cases, there are other cases that seem to constitute closure failures on that account. You believe that your Lamborghini is in parking spot 3b because you’re obsessively watching it on a closed-circuit TV monitor, and infer from this that it hasn’t been stolen. Your belief that it’s in spot 3b is safe: since you’re watching it on the monitor, there’s no nearby world in which you believe that it’s in that spot when it isn’t. However, there’s a nearby world in which your friend asks to borrow the car. You agree, and complacently watch him drive off on the monitor. You still believe that your car wasn’t stolen. But it was; your friend is a thief. So your belief that your car is in 3b is safe but your belief that it hasn’t been stolen isn’t. Closure fails.

In response, the safety theorist might claim that knowledge requires, not that your belief is safe, but that your basis is: there’s no nearby world in which you believe it on that basis and it’s false (Luper 1984, Sosa 1999, Pritchard 2007b). They should do this anyway, since Nozick’s grandmother case can be adjusted to count against safety too: just add that, although the grandson is actually well, there’s a nearby world in which he’s sick.^[35]

In the car example above, you believe that your car isn’t stolen, not by inferring this from its being in 3b, but because you thought your friend wouldn’t steal it. Any nearby world in which you believe it’s in 3b by seeing it on the monitor and infer that it’s not stolen is a world in which it is in 3b and not stolen; both beliefs are basis-safe.

However, suppose there’s a nearby world in which the monitor fails. You call your friend, who assures you, while joyriding in your car, that it’s still in 3b. You infer from this that it’s not stolen; but it is. Your belief that it’s in 3b is basis-safe, since there’s no nearby world in which the monitor shows that it’s there when it isn’t. But your belief that it’s not stolen, although still inferred from its being in 3b, is not. And closure fails again (Alspector-Kelly 2011; see also Murphy 2005 and Zhao 2022).

At this point the safety theorist might claim that, when you infer \(Q\) from \(P\), your basis for believing \(Q\) includes, not only that you inferred it from \(P\), but also whatever your basis was for your belief in \(P\) (Williamson 2009a, 2009b). In the last case above, you actually believe that it’s in 3b because you see it on the monitor, whereas in the nearby world you believe this because your friend says so. So, if that claim is right, your basis for believing that it’s not stolen in the actual world is not what it is in the nearby world after all. That belief is basis-safe, and closure is preserved once again. Whether this is a plausible and viable way to individuate bases is controversial (see Goldstein and Hawthorne 2024).

3. Closure, Transmission, and Sources of Warrant

There is a crucial distinction between closure and transmission, one that has come to play an increasingly important role in the closure debate.^[36] The consequent of SPC doesn’t say anything about how you come by your knowledge of Q; it just says that you know it. So it’s compatible with SPC that, although you infer \(Q\) from \(P\) that you know, you nevertheless can’t learn \(Q\) because you so infer; however, in such cases, you inevitably know it by other means. If so, then, although closure is preserved, the following principle is violated:

SPT (Single Premise Transmission): if (i) you know \(P\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then (ii) you know \(Q\) because of (i).

Your knowing \(Q\) because of (i) is compatible with knowledge overdetermination: you could know \(Q\) in other ways as well. You might, for example, have already known, before arriving at the department meeting, that the minimum of ten faculty members required for a quorum are present because a colleague, already there, told you as much by phone. Upon arriving and counting twelve faculty members, you then infer that a quorum is indeed present, and know it that way as well.^[37]

Call ways of knowing warrants.^[38] A warrant is not exhausted by the specific feature that prompts your belief, which we might call your basis; it also includes whatever other conditions, both within your mind and in the external environment, must be in place in order for you to know on that basis. For example, it’s not enough that your colleague told you that a quorum is present. After all, she could have been lying. And even if truthful, she could have hallucinated the twelve faculty that she “saw”, which was, coincidentally, the right number. Or you could have misheard her, thinking she said “quorum” when she actually said “forum”. In any of these cases her testimony doesn’t provide you with a way of knowing—a warrant—that a quorum is present. So having a warrant requires, in addition to whatever the basis for your belief might be, also those internal and external conditions that must be in place in order for you to know in response to that basis.

Your already having a warrant for \(Q\), then, doesn’t prevent your acquiring a second warrant for \(Q\) because you inferred it from \(P\). So, for SPT to be true, you must always acquire a new warrant for \(Q\) whenever its antecedent applies, whether or not you already know \(Q\).

Since the antecedents of SPC and SPT are the same, and the consequent of SPT requires what the consequent of SPC requires and more, transmission implies closure, and closure failure implies transmission failure. But closure doesn’t imply transmission, and transmission failure doesn’t imply closure failure.

There are, as a result, two different kinds of closure advocate. The first endorses closure because they endorse transmission. Call them transmissivists. Transmissivism hews as closely as possible to the knowledge-expansion intuition behind closure advocacy referenced in §1.1 and, indeed, amounts to a formalization of that intuition. The second concedes that transmission occasionally fails but insists that, whenever it does fail, closure is nevertheless preserved. Call them preservationists. We’ll discuss preservationism first.

3.1 Preservationism: Warrant for \(P\) as Warrant for \(Q\)

The preservationist needs to explain why transmission fails and also why, whenever it fails, an alternative warrant for \(Q\) steps in to save the day. One such explanation is that your warrant for \(P\) always also suffices as a warrant for \(Q\) whenever \(P\) implies \(Q\). Another is that, when transmission fails, it does so because you can only have the warrant you have for \(P\) if you are already warranted in believing \(Q\).

On the first explanation, although you can’t acquire a warrant for \(\neg DM\) by inference from \(Z\), for example, \(LZ\)—your basis for \(Z\)—suffices on its own to warrant \(\neg DM\). Probabilistic considerations encourage this idea. Since \(Z\) implies \(\neg DM\), the probability axioms imply that \(p(\neg DM\mid LZ) \ge p(Z\mid LZ)\). On probabilistic threshold conceptions of knowledge, if \(LZ\) suffices for knowing \(Z\) then it also suffices for knowing \(\neg DM\). So you know \(\neg DM\) as well.

However, since \(DM\) implies \(LZ, p(\neg DM\mid LZ) \lt p(\neg DM)\): \(LZ\) lowers, rather than raises, \(\neg DM\)’s initial probability.^[39] On a popular view, evidence only counts as such if it raises the probability of the hypothesis it supports. So, on that view, \(LZ\) counts against, rather than for, \(\neg DM\) (White 2006).^[40] More generally, \(LZ\) presumably doesn’t count against \(DM\) when \(DM\) implies, and so predicts, \(LZ\). But \(LZ\) can only be evidence for \(\neg DM\) if it’s evidence against \(DM\). So it’s not evidence for \(\neg DM\).

It remains true that, since \(Z\) implies \(\neg DM, p(\neg DM\mid LZ) \ge p(Z\mid LZ)\). Since \(p(\neg DM\mid LZ) \lt p(\neg DM), p(\neg DM) \gt p(Z\mid LZ)\): the prior probability of \(\neg DM\) is higher than the probability of \(Z\) given \(LZ\). So, if \(LZ\) confers a sufficiently high probability for knowledge on \(Z\), then \(\neg DM\) must already be sufficiently probable in light, presumably, of background evidence \((BE)\).^[41] Such evidence might, say, indicate that reputable zoos are unlikely to disguise their animals.^[42] So transmission fails: you don’t learn \(\neg DM\) by inference from \(Z\), but from \(BE\). But closure is still preserved (Klein 1995).

However, since \(p(Q) \ge p(P)\) whenever \(P\) implies \(Q\), your inferring \(Q\) from \(P\) is, on this approach, not only irrelevant in Dretske cases, but in all cases. Even if, unlike Dretske cases, your evidence \(E\) for \(P\) raises \(Q\)’s antecedent probability provided by \(BE\) above the threshold required for knowledge, the warrant you have for \(Q\) is still provided by the combined evidence \((E \amp BE)\). And you have that warrant as soon as you acquire \(E\), and so before you infer \(Q\) from \(P\). That inference delivers no more evidence than you already have.

But transmission requires that you acquire a new warrant because you infer \(Q\) from \(P\). So transmission fails in every case. But transmission was only supposed to fail in Dretske cases (Alspector-Kelly 2019, §5.5). More generally, if your warrant for \(P\) inevitably suffices as a warrant for \(Q\) whenever \(P\) implies \(Q\), then this counts against, rather than in favor of, transmission: it implies that transmission always fails or, at least, that it is aways superfluous (see Moretti and Piazza 2023’s “indirectness template” for transmission failure).^{[43], [44]}

3.2 Preservationism: Frontloading

The second explanation for why you inevitably end up knowing \(Q\) when transmission fails is that, in Dretske cases at least, you need to already know \(Q\) in order to learn \(P\), given the way that you learned \(P\). In order to learn \(Z\) on the basis of \(LZ\), for example, you need to know \(\neg DM\). Call this frontloading.^[45] One line of reasoning for this is that, without knowing \(\neg DM\), all you’ll be in a position to learn from \(LZ\) is the disjunction “\(Z\) or \(DM\)”, since both predict \(LZ\).^[46]

Another such line is that the inference from \(Z\) to \(\neg DM\) is viciously circular. That inference only delivers knowledge of \(\neg DM\) if you know \(Z\). But a condition of your knowing \(Z\) on the basis of \(LZ\) is that the animal isn’t disguised to look like a zebra and, so, isn’t a mule disguised to look that way: precisely \(\neg DM\). So, if you initially don’t know \(\neg DM\), then you don’t know that \(LZ\) warrants \(Z\), and so can’t appeal to \(Z\) in support of \(\neg DM\).^[47]

On either reasoning, the story goes, transmission fails: you can’t acquire a new warrant for the conclusion when you needed one already in order to learn the premise.^[48]

This last step—if frontloading is required then transmission fails—is virtually universally assumed. But it’s not clear why. True, you can’t acquire your first warrant by the inference from \(Z\) to \(\neg DM\), since the latter must be already warranted. But recall that you can have multiple warrants for the same proposition. Of course, if your only putative warrant for \(\neg DM\) is by inference from \(Z\), then transmission clearly fails: you need that warrant to start with, but won’t get it until you’ve finished. But so long as you start out with a prior warrant for \(\neg DM\) that doesn’t depend on this inference, it’s not obvious why the inference can’t deliver another one (White 2006, Silins 2005, and Alspector-Kelly 2019; for possible examples of cases where frontloading is required but transmission succeeds, see the latter, §6.7.2).

It’s also widely assumed that, if frontloading is not required, then transmission succeeds. But there are other accounts of transmission failure that don’t require antecedent knowledge of \(Q\), and so that are compatible with closure denial.

For example: \(DM\) implies \(LZ\). So your method for evaluating \(\neg DM\)—namely, determining whether \(\neg DM\) by inference from what you take yourself to learn when you look in the paddock—will inevitably deliver \(\neg DM\) whenever \(DM\). You can, in fact, recognize this before you look in the paddock: knowing what you’ll do if \(LZ\), and knowing that \(DM\) implies \(LZ\), you know that you’ll arrive at \(\neg DM\) if \(DM\). Moreover, if \(LZ\) is false, you’ll still arrive at \(\neg DM\), since \(\neg LZ\) implies \(\neg DM\). So you can know before you look that, no matter what you see, and no matter what’s there, your method will deliver \(\neg DM\). It’s very plausible that no such method can deliver a warrant for \(\neg DM\). But this explanation of transmission failure, while compatible with your knowing \(Z\) on \(LZ\), doesn’t require that you initially know \(\neg DM\), and so is compatible with closure failure (White 2006 and Alspector-Kelly 2019, ch. 4).^[49]

Since both lines of reasoning for frontloading appear to apply to any skeptical hypothesis, front-loading requires prior knowledge of the falsehood of every such hypothesis, both wholesale and piecemeal. Since knowledge is widely taken to require belief and proper basing, you would also have to believe that they are false on appropriate bases.^[50] But some will likely mobilize concepts—hitherto undreamt-of animal-disguising technology, for example—that you don’t even understand.

The frontloader might suggest that you don’t actually need to know the denial of skeptical hypotheses; you only need a warrant for them. But then frontloading won’t preserve SPC. SPC’s antecedent is compatible with your only believing \(\neg DM\), for example, because it’s implied by \(Z\). But, we’re assuming, you don’t acquire a warrant that way. So, although you do have a prior warrant for \(\neg DM\), you don’t believe \(\neg DM\) on the basis of that warrant, which is the only one you have. So you don’t know \(\neg DM\); SPC fails (Silins 2005).

The frontloader can, however, endorse this alternative version of closure:

SPWC: if (i) you know \(P\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then either (ii) you know \(Q\) because of (i) or (iii) you have a different warrant for \(Q\).^[51]

But frontloading may still be too demanding. Note that the arguments for frontloading wouldn’t apply if \(LZ\) implied \(Z\). But, since \(LZ\) is a fallible basis for \(Z\)—\(LZ \amp \neg Z\) is possible, as in \(DM\)—you need an antecedent warrant for \(\neg DM\). The basis, \(B_2\), that delivers that warrant is itself either fallible or infallible. If the former, you also need a prior warrant for \(\neg(B_2 \amp DM)\). The basis for that warrant, \(B_3\), is also either fallible or not. If the former, then you also need a warrant for \(\neg(B_3 \amp (B_2 \amp DM))\). And if that basis, \(B_4\), is fallible…. This sequence can only terminate in infallible bases. So our beliefs are only warranted if they have infallible bases. But, arguably, the bases for almost all of our beliefs are fallible. Skepticism threatens (Alspector-Kelly 2019, §§6.4–6.6).

3.3 Sources of Warrant

If frontloading is required, the Cartesian skeptical argument takes on a different cast. The second premise is “if you don’t know \(\neg BIV\) then you don’t know \(H\)”. In §2.1 this was understood to derive from closure. But now this means “if you don’t already know \(\neg BIV\) then you don’t know \(H\)”. One might indeed wonder whether the force of the argument comes from an intuition, not that ordinary knowledge would implausibly put you in a position to learn that the skeptical hypothesis is false, but instead that we need to know the denials of skeptical hypotheses in order to acquire ordinary knowledge in the first place.

To avoid this version of the skeptical argument, the frontloader needs sources of warrant against every skeptical hypothesis whose denial is implied by the mundane knowledge claims that they want to endorse. There are two possible sources.^[52] First, background information might provide such a warrant. Second, you might have a default warrant, or “entitlement”.

3.3.1 Warrant by Background Information

One might claim that background information—we don’t yet have the technology to envat a brain, for example—provides you with a warrant for believing \(\neg BIV\), as well as the denials of other wholesale skeptical hypotheses (Leite 2015, 207). An objection is that, if you’re a \(BIV\), you don’t just seem to have hands; your total experience, and so what you take to be your background information, remains in place. So if you’re in no position to infer \(\neg BIV\) from \(H\), you’re in no more a position to infer it from putative background information.

But the fact that it wouldn’t be information if you were a \(BIV\) doesn’t imply that it isn’t information if you’re not. On certain externalist views of evidence, your evidence in the “good” \(\neg BIV\) case is much richer than it is in the “bad” \(BIV\) case, and the former may well provide you with the wherewithal to know \(\neg BIV\).^[53] However, that evidence will also certainly include \(H\). So you don’t need a warrant for \(\neg BIV\) in order to acquire your warrant for \(H\) after all; the frontloading claim is false. And that seems to allow transmission from \(H\) to \(\neg BIV\). Closure-preserving externalist views of evidence sit more comfortably with transmissivism than with frontloading (see §3.4 below).^[54]

The situation is quite different with respect to piecemeal skeptical hypotheses. \(DM\), for example, doesn’t incorporate whatever background information that you might have against it (to the effect that reputable zoos aren’t likely to deceive the public, say). However, it remains intuitive, not just that you can’t learn that it’s not a disguised mule by inference from “it’s a zebra”—which intuition the frontloader endorses—but also that, given your circumstances, you don’t know it at all.

That intuition is particularly strong with respect to lottery propositions. Perhaps background evidence suffices to warrant “most people lose the lottery”, “cars aren’t often stolen”, “this report is likely not a misprint”, and the like. But you need a warrant for the specific claim that this particular ticket, car, or report isn’t one of the exceptions. And it’s difficult to see how merely statistical information—the only kind you seem to have in these cases—suffices for that purpose when you know that such exceptions exist and nothing that you’re aware of distinguishes your case from any other (Sharon and Spectre 2017a, 24–27).

So the frontloader needs to explain these intuitions. One popular approach is that of the contextualist.

The standards for knowledge, according to the contextualist, can vary from one context of attribution to another. In ordinary contexts, wherein the standards are relatively low, you count as knowing both the ordinary claim \(P\) and the denial of the skeptical hypothesis \(Q\). But when the person who attributes knowledge (who may or may not be you) contemplates \(Q\), doing so typically raises the standards applicable in their context to the point where you count as knowing neither \(P\) nor \(Q\). So, when the attributor intuits that you don’t know \(Q\), they’re right; but that’s only because they’re contemplating it. In ordinary contexts, when they’re not contemplating \(Q\), you do know it. In neither context is closure false. The contextualist applies this explanation of our intuitions, not just to lottery propositions, but to all piecemeal and wholesale skeptical hypotheses (Cohen 1988, DeRose 2009, Lewis 1996; see also the entry on epistemic contextualism).

Contextualism does not, however, require that closure is true. Heller 1999 claims that, although you know neither \(P\) nor \(Q\) in high-standards contexts, you know \(P\) but not \(Q\) in ordinary, low-standards contexts, so that closure fails in the latter contexts. The closure-affirming contextualist needs to explain both why we need to attribute knowledge of the denials of skeptical hypotheses in ordinary cases and where that knowledge comes from.

With respect to the latter question, the contextualist isn’t likely to claim that knowledge of \(Q\) in ordinary contexts is acquired by transmission since it’s wildly unlikely that people in ordinary (or any other) contexts believe \(Q\) in Dretske cases because they’ve inferred it from \(P\). So the closure-preserving contextualist is presumably a frontloader: even in ordinary contexts, you need to know \(Q\) in order to acquire your knowledge of \(P\).

But while it’s plausible that, in high-standards contexts wherein \(Q\) is salient, you need to know \(Q\) in order to know \(P\), it’s far from clear why that would be so in ordinary contexts as well. Why, for example, would you need to know that your car isn’t stolen (as well as the denial of every other wholesale and piecemeal skeptical hypothesis), which possibility hasn’t crossed your mind (or that of the attributor, if different), in order to know that it’s in 3b where you left it, so long as, in fact, it isn’t stolen?

The obvious answer is that requiring knowledge of \(Q\) preserves closure in ordinary contexts. But if the contextualist affirms closure because of, for example, the abominable conjunction objection, contextualism already addresses that objection without requiring closure.^[55] In my high-standards context in which I contemplate “your car is stolen”, “you know your car is in 3b but not that it’s not stolen” is infelicitous because you know neither, and so don’t know that your car is in 3b. It’s entirely compatible with this that, in low-standards contexts wherein I’m not contemplating car thefts, “you know that it’s in 3b but not that it’s not stolen” is true. And any inclination to think that the conjunction is abominable in ordinary contexts as well is explicable as an instance of the “semantic blindness” tendency to fail to notice that standards that apply in high-standards contexts don’t apply in low-standards contexts. So this objection to closure denial, at least, doesn’t discriminate between closure-affirming and closure-denying contextualism (Alspector-Kelly 2019, §§10.3–10.4).^[56]

3.3.2 Warrant by Entitlement

An increasingly popular view is that we possess default warrants—warrants “by entitlement”—for the denials of wholesale skeptical hypotheses, which warrants require no evidence. There are a number of variations on the theme, but the essential idea is that these “cornerstone” propositions constitute an essential backdrop against which our intellectual exchange with the world takes place; they are the “hinges” upon which empirical inquiry turns (Wittgenstein 1969). So they can’t themselves be subject to such inquiry. But they also can’t be coherently repudiated since, without them, there would be no inquiry at all. Such cornerstones include, not only the denial of wholesale skeptical hypotheses, but also “my senses are reliable”, “the future will be like the past”, “there is a material world”, and a number of others (Wright 2004 and 2014, Pritchard 2016 and 2018, and Coliva 2014 and 2015).

One problem with the entitlement strategy is that of leaching (Wright 2004). Since \(H\) implies \(\neg BIV\), if \(\neg BIV\) is false then so is \(H\). So any risk that \(\neg BIV\) is false—that you are a \(BIV\)—is inherited by \(H\), notwithstanding your evidence for \(H\). But, having no evidence for \(\neg BIV\), you have no epistemic safeguards against that risk: your entitlement for \(\neg BIV\) has nothing to do with whether it’s true, or likely so, but only reflects your being constrained to rely on it. So your belief in \(H\) is equally at risk, and so isn’t known (or justified). See Wright 2004, 2012 and 2014, and Moretti and Wright 2023 for responses.

A related problem is that of alchemy (McGlynn 2014a). Suppose that, in light of your entitlement to \(\neg BIV\), it’s seeming to you as though you have hands provides you with an evidential warrant for \(H\). Since \(H\) implies \(\neg BIV\), closure seems to require that you have, not merely an entitlement, but also an evidential warrant for \(\neg BIV\).

In response Wright concedes that closure for evidential warrants fails, but insists that closure for warrants per se, which may be evidential or not, is still preserved (Wright 2004). But the denials of wholesale skeptical hypotheses, and most other cornerstones, are contingent; and the idea that we could enjoy warrants for belief in contingent propositions without any evidence is, to many, doubtful. Wright suggests that we don’t believe cornerstones, but only trust or accept them. But knowledge is also standardly taken to require, not mere acceptance or trust, but also belief. And even if the attitude that knowledge requires is expanded to include acceptance or trust, knowledge is also standardly understood to require proper basing. But it’s not clear how your acceptance/trust in \(Q\) can be based on a default entitlement.^[57]

Admittedly, the consequent of SPWC—the version of closure that the frontloader can endorse—only requires that you have a warrant for \(Q\), not that you know it. But the idea that you can have a warrant—which we’ve understood here to be a way of knowing—for a proposition that you can’t know is, at least, odd.^[58]

The entitlement strategy won’t apply to piecemeal skeptical hypotheses since ordinary empirical evidence is obviously possible for “it’s not a disguised mule”, “I will lose the lottery”, “my car isn’t stolen”, and the like. The frontloader who mobilizes the entitlement strategy will, then, need another way to handle such hypotheses.

3.4 Transmissivism

Since §3.1 we’ve been pursuing the preservationist option, according to which transmission sometimes fails—in Dretske cases, at least—but, when it does fail, something ensures that the conclusion ends up being known anyway, so that closure is preserved. In this section we’ll explore the transmissivist option, according to which transmission (and, therefore, closure) succeeds, if not always, then at least in some Dretske cases.

According to dogmatism, its perceptually seeming to you as though \(H\) suffices on its own, in the absence of defeaters, to warrant the belief that \(H\) (Pryor 2000, 2004, and 2012).^[59] According to disjunctivism, in ordinary, non-skeptical scenarios your evidence doesn’t merely consist in your seeming to have hands (as it would if you were a \(BIV)\), but in your seeing that you have them, where “seeing” is factive: you can only see that you have hands if you have them (McDowell 1986 and 1995, Pritchard 2012). And according to \(E = K\), your evidence is all and only that which you know. Since, in the “good”, non-skeptical case, you know \(H, H\) constitutes evidence that you can then wield against skeptical hypotheses (Williamson 2000).

Frontloading is false on each of these views, at least with respect to wholesale skeptical hypotheses: you don’t need to know \(\neg BIV\) in order to acquire your knowledge of \(H\). As a result, it seems, nothing stands in the way of learning, in the style of G. E. Moore, \(\neg BIV\) by inferring it from \(H\) (Moore 1939 [1959]). Correspondingly, advocates of these views very typically endorse that Moorean inference.^[60]

These views confront the robust intuition that the Moorean inference doesn’t transmit. One explanation for this is that we’re confusing the question whether an argument can rationally resolve initial open-mindedness about the conclusion with whether warrant transmits. If you are, like the skeptic, initially open-minded about whether \(\neg BIV\) is true, then you are indeed rationally obliged to discount your putative visual evidence for \(H\) (since it isn’t probative if you are a \(BIV)\), and so can’t resolve your initial open-mindedness concerning \(\neg BIV\) by inferring it from \(H\). Since this only applies if you are initially open-minded, that inability is a dialectical failing (even if the dialectic is, as it were, in your head) and varies depending on the audience.

Warrant transmission, however, is an epistemic, not a dialectical, matter, and doesn’t so vary. If you can acquire a warrant for \(H\) solely on the basis of its seeming that \(H\), as per the dogmatist, or on the basis of your seeing that \(H\), as per the disjunctivist, then you can acquire a warrant for \(\neg BIV\) by inference from \(H\) whether or not doing so resolves antecedent open-mindedness about the conclusion (Pryor 2004; see also Brown 2005). (Simion 2023 criticizes this explanation of our intuition but offers a different explanation in defense of transmissivism.)

One problem with this explanation is that virtually everyone thinks that they’re not \(BIV\)s, and so aren’t open-minded on the issue, but still intuit that there’s something wrong with the Moorean inference. The transmissivist can, however, respond that we’re intuiting, not that the argument doesn’t work for us, but that it would beg the question against a skeptic. (Kelp 2023, however, argues that you can’t come to know a proposition by means of a question-begging argument.)

It’s unclear, however, what purpose the Moorean inference serves. Skeptical hypotheses are of little intrinsic interest aside from the skeptic’s wielding such hypotheses against ordinary knowledge. But, according to the transmissivist, we don’t need to know beforehand that skeptical hypotheses are false in order to acquire ordinary knowledge. So ordinary knowledge is secure whatever the fortunes of skeptical hypotheses might be; the Moorean inference can play no coherent role in the defense of that knowledge. At best, it can show that closure can also be preserved. But transmissivists are precisely those who believe in SPC because they believe in SPT. So this amounts to showing that if we endorse transmissivism we’ll preserve transmission (see Alspector-Kelly §5.1).

Two problems for transmissivism have already been canvassed above. First, it countenances knowledge acquisition through inferences from \(P\) to \(Q\) in Dretske cases, wherein evidence \(E\) favoring \(P\) lowers the probability of \(Q\). It’s at least odd to think that you can nevertheless learn \(Q\) by means of such an inference (see §3.1). Second, you can recognize beforehand that, in Dretske cases, your method for evaluating \(Q\) will deliver \(Q\) whether or not \(Q\) is true (see §3.2). It’s very implausible that such inferences transmit.

A third problem is that transmissivism appears to license bootstrapping. You look at a series of colored cards. In each case you note the color the card appears to be, believe that it is that color, and conjoin these: “card 1 appears red and is red”, for example. You do the same for the rest of the 1000 cards, and infer from the 1000 propositions that \(A\), your color vision has been accurate 1000 times. Finally, you inductively infer from \(A\) that \(R\), your color vision is reliable.

As a warrant for \(R\), this is intuitively absurd. But it’s difficult for the transmissivist to say why. Only skeptics will deny that you can learn the color of something by noting the color it appears to have. And the subsequent inferences to \(A\) are instances of MPC. The transmissivist could resist the inference from \(A\) to \(R\), which is inductive. But A seems to constitute excellent inductive grounds for \(R\).^[61]

You can also recognize that, before you get started, you will inevitably end up endorsing \(R\) (and \(A)\) whether or not it is true. But, as with Dretske cases, if you know this beforehand, there’s no point in your going through the motions. (See Bergmann 2004, Cohen 2005, Markie 2005, and Pryor 2004 for closure-preserving responses to bootstrapping, and Alspector-Kelly 2019, §11.1.2. for a closure-denying response.)^[62]

A fourth concern is that transmissivism seems to license a pernicious resistance to evidence.^[63] It follows from \(P\) that any future evidence against \(P\) must be misleading. Suppose you know \(P\) and infer the latter from it. If transmissivism is true, then you know the latter. But, surely, you shouldn’t discount future evidence against \(P\) (Harman 1973, attributing the problem to Saul Kripke). Audi 1988 argues that closure fails in light of this problem. Feldman 1995 responds to Audi’s argument; Audi replies in his 1995. Harman 1973, Sorensen 1988 and Veber 2004 offer closure-preserving responses.

Neither dogmatism nor disjunctivism will apply to many Dretske cases involving piecemeal hypotheses: it doesn’t perceptually seem as though you can’t afford an African safari, or that your car is in 3b (remember that you’re not currently looking at it); and you don’t see that these claims are true. So some other source of warrant—most plausibly, background information—will be needed for “I’ll lose the lottery”, “my car isn’t stolen”, and the like. The extent to which the \(E = K\) advocate will apply the transmissivist response to piecemeal skeptical hypotheses isn’t clear, since one could know that those hypotheses are false by other means than by inference from ordinary propositions.^[64]

4. Multi-Premise Closure

The discussion to this point has entirely concerned SPC. This is because there are issues that only affect MPC (or so it seems at first glance).

Recall from §2.8 that, on the probabilistic threshold conception, you’re justified in believing \(P\) when the probability of \(P\) on your evidence is above some high threshold, and know \(P\) when your belief, in addition to being sufficiently probable, is also true and not a Gettier case. Since the probability of your beliefs given your evidence is rarely 1, that threshold is standardly understood to be less than 1 in order to avoid skepticism. But if the probability of two or more premises is, while above that threshold, less than 1, the probability of their conjunction can drop below that threshold. And that allows the probability of the conclusion to also fall below that threshold, since its probability need only be at least as high as the probability of that conjunction. So MPC can fail on the threshold view. This doesn’t affect SPC, since if \(P\) implies \(Q\) then \(p(Q) \ge p(P)\).

A classic illustration is the lottery paradox (Kyburg 1961). It’s highly probable, of each ticket in a typical lottery, that it will lose. Suppose that—like many real lotteries—although it’s probable that there’s a winning ticket in a particular lottery, it’s not guaranteed; and, as it turns out, there isn’t a winner this time around. If you believe, of each ticket, that it will lose, those beliefs will all be true. And they don’t exhibit any of the characteristics of Gettier cases. So, on the threshold view, you know, of each ticket, that it will lose. Those propositions together imply that all the tickets will lose (equivalently, that the conjunction of the many “ticket x will lose” propositions is true).^[65] But you don’t know the latter, since it’s improbable. MPC fails.

One can deny, as many do, that you know, of each losing ticket, that that ticket will lose, however probable its losing might be. Perhaps, for example, knowing \(P\) requires, not only that \(P\) is probable on your evidence, but also that your belief in \(P\) is safe, which, as per §2.8 above, these beliefs are not. But suppose that you do in fact know every one of the thousands of individual claims you’ve made in your book, each of which is, then, both safe and probable on your evidence. Those claims together imply their conjunction. However, as you modestly concede, it’s likely that at least one claim in the book is wrong. That conjunction is therefore improbable. On the view we’re considering, then, you don’t know it, and MPC fails.^[66] Preserving MPC in this case requires, not that high probability is not sufficient for knowledge, but that it isn’t necessary: your belief can count as known even if its probability on your evidence is very low. Even those who don’t endorse high probability as sufficient for knowledge might balk at the idea that you can know \(P\) despite \(P\)’s being highly improbable on your evidence (but see Williamson 2009a and 2014, and Smith 2016a and 2025).

A compromise is to endorse SPC and reject MPC. But one problem with doing so is that the intuitions supporting SPC seem to equally support MPC. A purported cost of closure denial discussed in §2.5 above is that closure deniers are forced to reject highly intuitive closure principles like addition closure, simplification closure, or equivalence closure. But many simple multi-premise closure principles—employing conjunction introduction, modus ponens, modus tollens, disjunctive syllogism, etc.—are equally highly intuitive, and are all susceptible to the risk-accrual problem. Moreover, “I know \(P\) and I know \(Q\), but I don’t know \(P \amp Q\)” (for example) seems as abominable as any single-premise version.

Another concern with the compromise is that our inferential dispositions aren’t infallible: you could believe \(Q\) because, you think, it follows from \(P\) when, in fact, it doesn’t. So the risk that the conclusion could be false is a function, not only of the risk that the premises are false, but also that the inference is faulty. These can combine, so that the risk that the conclusion is false is too high for it to count as known (Lasonen 2008).

This can happen even if there is no risk that the premise is false. Suppose that you perform an extremely long sequence of single-premise deductions from a certain mathematical truth. For each step there is a small chance that you’ve reasoned incorrectly. Those chances can accumulate so that your putative knowledge of the final conclusion is defeated by that accumulated risk (Lasonen 2008, Schechter 2013, and Brown 2018, chs. 5 & 6; but see Tang 2018 and Montessori 2025).^[67]

5. Justification Closure

The discussion to this point has only concerned knowledge closure. But there is also a robust debate concerning whether justification is closed.

Consider the following principle:

SPJC: If you are justified in believing \(P\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then you are justified in believing \(Q\).

Assuming that justified false beliefs are possible, neither sensitivity nor safety (nor basis-relative versions of them) can be justification, since both are factive.^[68] But much of the discussion from §§3–4 above applies also to justification. If SPJC is true, is that because transmission of justification succeeds? If so, then the following is also correct:

SPJT: if (i) you are justified in believing \(P\), and believe \(Q\) because it’s implied by \(P\), then (ii) you are justified in believing \(Q\) because of (i).

It is, however, as unintuitive that SPJT is true in Dretske cases as it is that SPT is true in those cases. If, instead, SPJT is false in such cases but SPJC is preserved, then much the same questions can be posed concerning the source of justification as were asked about the source of warrant: does your justification for \(P\) suffice on its own as a justification for \(Q\)? Or is justification for \(Q\) a precondition for your justification for \(P\)? If the latter, is the requisite justification for \(Q\) provided by background knowledge? Or is \(Q\) justified by default?

In fact, a significant proportion of the literature on these issues expressly concerns either justification or, confusingly, “warrant”, but where the latter term typically means, not ways of knowing, but either justification or something similar to it (see note 48). The debate concerning knowledge and that concerning justification/warrant are not always carefully distinguished. This is unfortunate, since a view ensuring that justification is closed doesn’t thereby ensure that knowledge is closed as well. It is, for example, more plausible that purely statistical information concerning the likelihood of losing the lottery delivers justification for “I will lose” than that it delivers knowledge. It’s also at least somewhat more plausible that non-evidential entitlements can justify cornerstone propositions than that such entitlements deliver knowledge of them.

If the justification for your belief is a function of its probability on your evidence, then you would be justified in believing, for each ticket in a lottery, that it will lose—including the one that will win if there is one, assuming justification isn’t factive—but not that they all will. So, for the same reasons canvassed in §4, SPJC will succeed but the multi-premise version, MPJC, will fail. And the arguments extending those concerns to SPC still apply, thereby threatening SPJC as well.

Other conceptions of justification are not similarly threatened. If justification is knowledge then, if you are justified in believing the premises, you know them. And if \(E = K\), the probability of each premise on your evidence—on, that is, that very premise—is 1. And since the premises together imply the conclusion, the probability of the conclusion is also 1.

There are other non-probabilistic accounts of justification that preserve both SPJC and MPJC without the radical identification of justification and knowledge. For example, on Martin Smith’s normic account, you have a justification for believing \(P\) when \(P\) is normically supported by your evidence (Smith 2010 and 2016a). “A body of evidence \(E\) normically supports a proposition \(P\) just in case the circumstance in which \(E\) is true and \(P\) is false requires more explanation than the circumstance in which \(E\) and \(P\) are both true” (Smith 2016a, 40; see Goodman and Salow 2023 for a similar view).

Although improbable, there’s nothing abnormal about your winning the lottery given your statistical evidence. So that evidence doesn’t justify your believing that you will lose the lottery (call this case \(A)\). However, if you watch the draw on TV and the winning numbers you see on screen don’t match those on your ticket then, if you nevertheless won, that would be abnormal, and would call for explanation: your eyesight failed you, you’re hallucinating, the studio is broadcasting the wrong lottery, and so on. Since the most normal worlds wherein you have the same evidence are those in which these aberrations don’t occur, and so in which you have indeed lost, your belief that you lost is justified (case \(B)\).

Since you’re not justified in believing that you will lose the lottery given only that you’re very likely to lose, Smith concedes that you’re not justified in believing that you won’t be able to afford an African safari. However, he suggests, this skepticism doesn’t extend to lottery-esque propositions: you are justified in believing, for example, that your car hasn’t been stolen, because its being stolen would be abnormal and so call for explanation. So you’re justified in believing both that your car is in spot 3b where you parked it and that it wasn’t stolen; and similarly for other lottery-esque cases. SPJC is preserved (Smith 2016a, 56–58).^[69]

MPJC is also preserved. You’re not justified in believing, of each lottery ticket, that it loses solely on the basis of the probability of its doing so, so MPJC doesn’t imply that you’re justified in believing that they’ll all lose. And if you’re justified in believing every sentence in your book then, if one of those is in fact false, some explanation of its being so is called for. But the conjunction of those sentences is only false if one or more of them is false. So the conjunction is only false if an explanation of its being false is called for. So you’re justified in believing that the conjunction is true, and so not justified in believing its negation, that at least one of those claims is false (Smith 2016a and 2022; but see Littlejohn and Dutant 2020 and Backes 2026).

In general, there’s much yet to explore concerning the relationship between closure and recent accounts of justification now on the market.^[70]

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Other Internet Resources

• Epistemic Closure Principles, entry by John M. Collins at Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy
• Luper, Steven, “Epistemic Closure”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2026 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2026/entries/closure-epistemic/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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