Paul Feyerabend

First published Tue Aug 26, 1997; substantive revision Sun Feb 23, 2025

Paul Feyerabend (1924–1994) initially made a name for himself in the foundations of quantum theory and as an ardent supporter of Karl Popper’s critical rationalism. He argued that good science should be an attempt to re-interpret experience according to our best scientific theories, which should be used to correct common knowledge and everyday language to promote progress. His early work resulted from a critical synthesis of Popper’s views on empiricism with Wittgenstein’s insights on meaning. Specifically, Feyerabend combined Popper’s views on testability with Wittgenstein’s insight that theories determine the meanings of observation sentences so that the same observation sentences make incompatible observation statements, depending on which theory is used to interpret them. Feyerabend used these peculiar views to criticize his interpretation of Popper’s empiricism (‘falsificationism’) from within Popper’s broader philosophical framework (‘critical rationalism’). According to Feyerabend, Popper’s empiricism has a limited validity. It is limited to testing commensurable theories because it relies on formal relations between corresponding predictions deduced from incompatible rivals. By contrast, meaning change through scientific revolution renders rival worldviews, as realistic interpretations of experience, logically disjoint (or ‘incommensurable’). Feyerabend proposed a general model for testing incommensurable rivals based on conjectures and novel, theory-laden corroborations as exemplified by the Brownian motion example. Feyerabend was arguing for theoretical pluralism, and more tolerance toward new proposals, especially toward new approaches in the foundations of quantum theory, such as David Bohm’s ‘hidden variables’.

Feyerabend developed the consequences of his views on meaning and method, arguing that scientific progress should be understood to be an ‘ever-expanding ocean of alternatives’ while continuing to criticize falsificationism from within Popper’s critical rationalist camp – until mid-December of 1967 when Feyerabend had an epiphany and ‘awoke from his dogmatic slumber’. In personal letters, he dramatically announced he was breaking with the Popperian school. He explained his reasons by generalizing from the limited validity of falsificationism to the limited validity of all methodological rules. He also outlined his new “‘position’” to be entitled “Against Method”, according to which “anything goes”. In this way, Feyerabend reversed himself on realism, from recommending correcting common knowledge and everyday language with science in his early work to recommending protecting common knowledge and everyday language from the tyranny of scientism in his later work. He became one of Popper’s most raucous critics both in methodology and in the foundations of quantum mechanics. His most famous work, Against Method: Outline of an Anarchist Theory of Knowledge (1975, 1988, 1993), redeploys his early ideas and arguments from his new perspective. As he made his ‘historical turn’, he increasingly focused on transitions in worldviews, such as Galileo’s role in the scientific revolution and the rise of Western rationalism. He was seen as a leading cultural relativist who became a post-modernist and is celebrated as one of the most influential philosophers of the twentieth century. His denunciations of Western imperialism, his critique of scientism, his defense of the pursuit of alternative medicine and astrology, and his emphasis on environmental issues made him a hero of anti-technological countercultures.

1. A Brief Chronology of Feyerabend’s Life and Work

Feyerabend led an extraordinarily eventful life, interacting directly with several prominent philosophers and scientists, most notably Karl Popper, Ludwig Wittgenstein, Niels Bohr, and David Bohm, who became significant influences on the development of his views. Feyerabend’s formative development is best seen against the backdrop of his tumultuous relationship with his mentor Karl Popper, Initially, Feyerabend was an ardent supporter of Popper’s philosophy of science (‘falsificationism’) and his broader philosophy (‘critical rationalism’). In 1962, Feyerabend began to criticize falsificationism while continuing to support critical rationalism. After an epiphany, in private letters sent on the 17th of December 1967, Feyerabend broke with Popper’s school, generalizing from the limited validity of falsificationism to “anything goes” (the limited validity of all methodological rules). He reversed himself on realism from recommending correcting common knowledge and everyday language with science to protecting common knowledge and everyday language from scientism, abandoning his earlier project, and beginning his later work. He repeatedly redeveloped his views on meaning and method, making them relevant to a broad range of controversial issues, from his relativism in political philosophy in the late 1970s and 1980s, to his post-modernism in the 1990s.

1924 Born in Vienna. Son of a civil servant and a seamstress.
1940 After indoctrination in the Hitler youth, inducted into the Arbeitsdienst (the work service introduced by the Nazis).
1942 Drafted into the Pioneer Corps of the German army. After basic training, volunteered for Officers’ School.
1943 Learns of his mother’s suicide.
1944 Decorated, Iron Cross. Advances to Lieutenant. Lectures to Officers’ School.
1945 Shot in the hand and the belly while retreating from the Russian Army, rendering him paralyzed from the waist down.
1946 Receives fellowship to study singing and stage management in Weimar. Joins the “Cultural Association for the Democratic Reform of Germany”.
1947 Returns to Vienna to study history and sociology at the University. Transfers to physics, but eventually settles for philosophy (taking philosophy courses in all eight semesters). Initially “a raving positivist”.
1948 First visits the Alpbach International Summer Seminar of the Austrian College Society (European Forum Alpbach). Becomes secretary and short-hand writer of the philosophy of science seminar. First essay (grey literature) on Schrodinger’s views on Anschaulichkeit [visualizability] in modern physics. Meets and immediately takes to Karl Popper. Befriends Walter Hollitscher. Marries first wife, Edeltrud.
1949 Assists the contentious experimental physicist, Felix Ehrenhaft. Witnesses the impotence of Ehrenhaft’s experimental effects, raising problems of empiricism. Founds, as student leader, the “Kraft Circle” (‘third Vienna Circle’), a science-student philosophy club, under Viktor Kraft, who became Feyerabend’s dissertation supervisor. Befriends Elizabeth Anscombe. Meets Ludwig Wittgenstein, who participated in a meeting at Feyerabend’s invitation.
1950 Meets Ludwig Wittgenstein, who participated in a meeting of the Kraft Circle at Feyerabend’s invitation to discuss Popper’s ‘basic statements’.
1951 “Zur Theorie der Basissätze” [On the theory of basic statements] (Ph.D. thesis). Having unsuccessfully attempted a Ph.D. in theoretical physics, settles for a doctorate in philosophy developed from his Kraft Circle notes. Receives British Council scholarship to study foundations of quantum theory under Popper.
1952 Arrives in England to study under Popper at the London School of Economics. Concentrates on the quantum theory and Wittgenstein. Studies the typescript of Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations, and prepares a summary of the book. Befriends another of Popper’s students, Joseph Agassi.
1953 Returns to Vienna. Popper had applied for an extension to his scholarship, but Feyerabend decides to remain in Vienna instead. Begins translation of Popper’s ‘war effort’ (The Open Society and its Enemies). Declines an offer to become Popper’s research assistant. Becomes assistant to Arthur Pap in Vienna.
1954 Publishes lengthy critical reconstruction of Wittgenstein’s Investigations and ‘Physik und Ontologie’ [Physics and Ontology], setting out his conception of scientific philosophy based on the dynamic relation between science and philosophy. Pap introduces him to Herbert Feigl, who becomes central to promoting Feyerabend’s professional development. Publishes (in German) another five short reviews of books on formal logic and the foundations of mathematics.
1955 “Carnaps Theorie der Interpretation theoretischer Systeme” [Carnap’s theory of the interpretation of theoretical systems] launches his oft-repeated criticism of the logical positivist view. Publishes Anscombe’s translation of his two-part critical review of Wittgenstein’s Investigations (first English publication). Begins first full-time academic appointment as lecturer in philosophy at the University of Bristol, England.
1956 “A Note on the Paradox of Analysis” criticizes analytic philosophy. “Eine Bemerkung zum Neumannschen Beweis” [A Remark on von Neumann’s Proof] temporarily adopts Popper’s views on indeterminism in foundations of quantum mechanics reversing himself. Popper accuses him of plagiarism. Marries second wife, Mary O’Neill.
1957 “On the Quantum-Theory of Measurement” reverts to his earlier Bohrian view on the foundations of quantum mechanics. Befriends David Bohm, who increasingly becomes a substantial influence, especially concerning his criticism of Popper’s empiricism, his repeated pleas for more tolerance and pluralism in science, his ‘ever-increasing ocean of alternatives’ conception of progress, and his ontological pluralism given the ‘non-autonomy of facts’.
1958 “An Attempt at a Realistic Interpretation of Experience” summarizes the ideas developed in his 1951 Ph.D. thesis, setting out his conception of what good science should be. “Complementarity” applies his methodological views to the foundations of quantum theory. Begins visiting lectureship at the University of California, Berkeley.
1959 Accepts a permanent position at Berkeley. Applies for a Green Card to work in the US.
1960 “Das Problem der Existenz theoretischer Entitäten” [The Problem of the Existence of Theoretical Entities] argues that there is no special ‘problem’ of theoretical entities because all entities are theoretical. “Science without Foundations” embroiders on Popper’s views about the pre-Socratics based on two lectures he gave at Oberlin College, Ohio.
1961 Meets Thomas Kuhn. Severely criticizes a draft of The Structure of Scientific Revolutions, leading to a major rift in their relations that lasted until 1983.
1962 “Explanation, Reduction, and Empiricism” combines Popper’s views on testability with Wittgenstein’s insight that one observation sentence makes two incompatible statements depending on which theory is used to interpret it. Launches his often-repeated methodological argument for theoretical pluralism: Sometimes an anomaly can refute an established theory only after the invention of an alternative incommensurable explanation of it, as illustrated by Einstein’s prediction of Brownian motion.
1963 “How to be a Good Empiricist” simplifies and summarizes his views, arguing that contemporary empiricism (Popper’s included) needs to be disinfected of its empirical core, given the meaning variance that results from scientific revolutions. Publishes two papers promoting the possibility of overcoming the mind-body problem with “eliminative materialism”, illustrating why everyday language and common knowledge should be corrected.
1964 UCLA Berkeley opens doors to minorities. Actively attempts to avoid indoctrinating students with Western philosophy. Tries to promote critical thinking instead.
1965 “Problems of Empiricism” expands on his early work. Discusses issues in foundations of quantum theory with von Weizsäcker in Hamburg, confronting the uselessness of general, abstract methodological rules given specific, actual scientific problems later prompting his ‘skeptical phase’.
1967 ‘Awakes’ from his ‘dogmatic slumber’ after an epiphany: the realization he no longer considers himself a Popperian. Announces he is breaking from Popper’s school to Popper’s school, generalizing from the limited validity of falsificationism to ‘anything goes’ (all methodological rules have only a limited validity), relinquishing his aim to develop a positive, normative model for acquiring knowledge. Announces he will use the title “Against Method” for his new ‘position’. Begins his increasingly poignant derision of general methodology. Reverses himself on realism, from recommending correcting common knowledge and everyday language with science to protecting them from scientism. Concludes happiness, not truth, should guide our ontological beliefs, beginning his ‘skeptical phase’ and his ‘historical turn’.
1968 “Science, Freedom and the Good Life” criticizes both Popper and Kuhn and begins explicitly to doubt that science is promoting happiness. “On a Recent Critique of Complementarity. Part I” attacks the dogmatism of the ‘Copenhagen interpretation’ and includes a scathing criticism of Popper’s propensity interpretation.
1969 “Linguistic Arguments and Scientific Method” (belatedly) develops his early view that scientific knowledge should be used to correct common knowledge and everyday language to promote progress
1970 “Consolations for the Specialist” attacks Popper from a Kuhnian perspective. Essay version of “Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge” endorses “epistemological anarchism” and the slogan “Anything goes!”. Applies John Stuart Mill’s On Liberty to scientific methodology.
1974 Death of Feyerabend’s friend Imre Lakatos, who had initially planned to co-author For and Against Method. Feyerabend’s half became his best-known work: Against Method. Publishes a contemptuous review of Popper’s Objective Knowledge.
1975 Against Method. Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge is a collage of earlier work that sets out his later perspective. It became an international bestseller, reaching far beyond the bounds of traditional academia. Considers “How to Defend Society Against Science” and suggests: “Let’s Make more Movies”.
1976–7 “On the Critique of Scientific Reason” endorses relativism explicitly for the first time. Critical reviews of Against Method lead to depression.
1978 Science in a Free Society explores some political implications of epistemological anarchism, endorsing relativism. Includes a collection of scathing replies to reviews of Against Method. Soon began to regret writing it. Did not want to see it re-issued.
1981 Two volumes of collected papers (sometimes significantly revised) clarify Feyerabend’s reversal from correcting to protecting non-scientific traditions, emphasizing that happiness, not Truth, should guide what we choose to believe is real.
1983 Meets Grazia Borrini (third wife) at his Berkeley lectures.
1984 Wissenschaft als Kunst [Science as an Art] explores the transition from the Homeric worldview to the ‘substance universe’. Continues his campaign to rehabilitate Mach.
1986 Compares “Progress and Reality in the Arts and in the Sciences”.
1987 Farewell to Reason collects papers written in the 1980s and defends ‘Protagorean relativism’. “Putnam on Incommensurability” defends his account of incommensurability.
1988 Second, revised and enlarged English edition of Against Method incorporates parts of Science in a Free Society and removes the long chapter on the history of the visual arts.
1989 Marries Grazia Borrini in January. Leaves for Italy and Switzerland.
1990 Resigns from Berkeley in March.
1991 Three Dialogues on Knowledge demonstrates increasing discontent with relativism, while still vigorously opposing ‘objectivism’. Retires from Zurich.
1993 Third revised and enlarged edition of Against Method includes a new introduction for the Chinese translation. Develops an inoperable brain tumor and is hospitalized.
1994 Dies in the Genolier clinic (Genolier, Canton of Vaud, Switzerland), February 11th.
1995 Killing Time: The Autobiography of Paul Feyerabend includes much new information about his wartime experience (partially inspired by the Waldheim affair).
1999 Conquest of Abundance (based on his last unfinished book manuscript) includes a collection of late papers. Knowledge, Science and Relativism: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3 collects a wide range of papers.
2009 Naturphilosophie [The Philosophy of Nature], which was written in the early to mid-1970s as a historical companion to Against Method 1975, examines changes in worldviews from the Paleolithic to the 20th century. Published in English in 2016.
2011 The Tyranny of Science is a lecture series (May 1992) that Feyerabend edited into a book on conflict and harmony, the disunity of science, and the abundance of nature. It criticizes scientism and dehumanization through objectification.
2016 Physics and Philosophy: Philosophical Papers, Volume 4 collects Feyerabend’s work on the philosophy of physics, including many previously unavailable English translations.

2. Feyerabend’s Early Life

(Unless otherwise stated, page references are to Killing Time: The Autobiography of Paul Feyerabend (1995), henceforth referred to as “KT”).

2.1 Youth (1924 –1938)

Paul Karl Feyerabend was born into a middle-class Viennese family in 1924. Times were hard in Vienna in the nineteen-twenties: in the aftermath of the First World War there were famines, hunger riots, and runaway inflation. Feyerabend’s family had a three-room apartment on the Wolfganggasse, “a quiet street lined with oak trees” (p. 11). The first chapters of his autobiography give the impression of his being a strange child, whose activities were entirely centered around his own family, and who was cut off from neighbors, other children, and the outside world because “[t]he world is a dangerous place” (p. 15). Between the ages of three and six, Feyerabend recalls, he spent most of his time in the apartment’s kitchen and bedroom. Occasional visits to the cinema and numerous stories, especially stories with a magical aura, seem to have taken the place usually filled by childhood friends. He was a sickly child, who ran away from home once when he was five years old (p. 7). When he started school at the age of six, he “had no idea how other people lived or what to do with them” (p. 16). The world seemed to be filled with strange and inexplicable happenings. It took him some while to get used to school, which initially made him sick. But when he did so, his health problems had disappeared. When he learned to read, he found the new and magical world of books waiting for him and indulged himself to the full (p. 25). But his sense of the world’s inexplicability took some time to dissipate—he recalls feeling that way about events during the nineteen-thirties and throughout the Second World War.

Feyerabend attended a Realgymnasium (High School), where he was taught Latin, English, and science. He was a Vorzugsschüler, that is, “a student whose grades exceeded a certain average” (p. 22), and by the time he was sixteen, he had the reputation of knowing more about physics and math than his teachers. He was also thrown out of school once.

Feyerabend “stumbled into drama and philosophy” (p. 26) by accident, becoming something of a ham actor in the process. This accident then led to another, when he found himself forced to accept philosophy texts among the bundles of books he had bought for the plays and novels they contained. It was, he later claimed, “the dramatic possibilities of reasoning and… the power that arguments seem to exert over people” (p. 27) with which philosophy had fascinated him. Although he was a philosopher by profession, he preferred to be thought of as an entertainer. His interests, he said, were always somewhat unfocussed (p. 27).

Feyerabend’s school physics teacher, Oswald Thomas, inspired his interest in physics and astronomy. The first presentation Feyerabend gave (at school) seems to have been on those subjects (p. 28). Together with his father, he built a telescope and “became a regular observer for the Swiss Institute of Solar Research” (p. 29). He describes his scientific interests as follows:

I was interested in both the technical and the more general aspects of physics and astronomy, but I drew no distinction between them. For me, Eddington, Mach (his Mechanics and Theory of Heat), and Hugo Dingler (Foundations of Geometry) were scientists who moved freely from one end of their subject to the other. I read Mach very carefully and made many notes (p. 30).

Feyerabend does not tell us how he became acquainted with another one of his main preoccupations—singing. He was proud of his voice, became a member of a choir, and took singing lessons for years, later claiming to have remained in California in order not to have to give up his singing teacher. In his autobiography he talks of the pleasure, greater than any intellectual pleasure, derived from having and using a well-trained singing voice (p. 83). During the Second World War, his interest in singing led him to attend the opera together with his mother in Vienna (first the Volksoper, and then the Staatsoper). A former opera singer, Johann Langer, gave him singing lessons and encouraged him to go to an academy. After passing the entrance examination, Feyerabend did so, becoming a pupil of Adolf Vogel. At this point in his life, he later recalled:

The course of my life was […] clear: theoretical astronomy during the day, preferably in the domain of perturbation theory; then rehearsals, coaching, vocal exercises, opera in the evening […]; and astronomical observation at night […] The only remaining obstacle was the war (p. 35).

2.2 The Anschluss (1938)

Feyerabend tells how, without falling for Adolf Hitler’s charisma, he appreciated Hitler’s oratorial style. Austria was reunified with Germany in 1938. Jewish schoolmates were treated differently, and Jewish neighbors and acquaintances started disappearing. He actively participated in the Hitler Youth program (p. 38), and yet, Feyerabend maintained that he had no clear view of the situation:

Much of what happened I learned only after the war, from articles, books, and television, and the events I did notice either made no impression at all or affected me in a random way. I remember them and I can describe them, but there was no context to give them meaning and no aim to judge them by (pp. 37–8).

For me the German occupation and the war that followed were an inconvenience, not a moral problem, and my reactions came from accidental moods and circumstances, not from a well-defined outlook (p. 38).

The general impression given by his autobiography is of an imaginative but fairly solitary person with no stable or well-defined personality, with a tendency to adopt strange views and push them to the extreme – a tendency that stayed with him throughout his life (p. 39). Given his lack of definite principles, his decisions seem to have been the result of a struggle between his tendency to conform and his contrariness (p. 40). He was easily persuaded by views before becoming critical of them in defense of alternatives. Just as when he was a child, events happening around him continued to seem strange, distant, and somehow out of context without a definite framework with which to make sense of them.

2.3 The War (1939–1945)

As far as his army record goes, Feyerabend claims in his autobiography that his mind is a blank. And yet, motivated in part by the Waldheim affair, this is one of the periods he tells us most about. It had deep and long-lasting consequences for his views, his body, and his psyche. Having passed his final high school exams in March 1942, he was drafted into the Arbeitsdienst (the work service introduced by the Nazis), and sent for basic training in Pirmasens, Germany. Feyerabend opted to stay in Germany to keep out of the way of the fighting, but subsequently asked to be sent to where the fighting was, having become bored with cleaning the barracks! He even considered joining the SS, for aesthetic reasons. His unit was then posted at Quelerne en Bas, near Brest, in Brittany. Still, the events of the war did not register. In November 1942, he returned home to Vienna but left before Christmas to join the Wehrmacht’s Pioneer Corps.

Their training took place in Krems, near Vienna. Feyerabend soon volunteered for officers’ school, not because of an urge for leadership, but out of a wish to survive, using officers’ school as a way to avoid front-line fighting. The trainees were sent to Yugoslavia. In Vukovar, in July 1943, he learned of his mother’s suicide, but was completely unmoved, and noticeably shocked his fellow officers by displaying no feeling. In October he was promoted to lance corporal. In December, his unit was sent into battle on the northern part of the Russian front. Although they blew up every house in their path, they never encountered any Russian soldiers, nor any civilians – with two exceptions. On one occasion, men and women were herded into a cellar before a grenade was tossed in after them. On another, a civilian was shot right in the head. Although his memory was admittedly strangely selective, these disturbing memories stayed with him (p. 46).

Feyerabend reports that he was foolhardy during battle, treating it as a theatrical event. He received the Iron Cross (second class) early in March 1944, for leading his men into a village under enemy fire and then occupying it. He was promoted to sergeant in April, and then to lieutenant toward the end of that year (taking command of a company of seasoned soldiers). At the end of November, having completed his assignment, he gave a series of lectures at the officers’ school in Dessau-Rosslau, near Leipzig. Their theme was the (“historicist”) one that “historical periods such as the Baroque, the Rococo, the Gothic Age are unified by a concealed essence that only a lonely outsider can understand” (p. 49). His description of these lectures, and his notebook entries at the time, reveal the influence of Friedrich Nietzsche in their fascination with this “lonely outsider”, “the solitary thinker” (p. 48).

Having returned home for Christmas 1944, Feyerabend again boarded the train for the front, this time for Poland, in January 1945. There, during the retreat, he was put in charge of a bicycle company, only to lose all of their bicycles to the advancing Russians the next day. Although he claims to have relished the role of army officer no more than he later did that of a university professor, he must have been quite competent, as in the field he came to take the place of a sequence of injured officers: first a lieutenant, then a captain, and then a major. Eventually, he,

was in command of three tanks; an infantry battalion; auxiliary troops from Finland, Poland, the Ukraine; and masses of German refugees (p. 51).

In 1945, he was shot during a heroic act of carelessness (trying to direct traffic, while taking fire from all sides). The surgery removing the bullet lodged in his spine left him paralyzed from the waist down. He spent time in a wheelchair, and then on crutches, before learning to walk with the aid of a cane. The war ended as he was recovering from his injury, in a hospital in Apolda, a little town near Weimar, while fervently hoping not to recover before the war was over. Germany’s surrender came as a relief, but also as a disappointment relative to past hopes and aspirations. He later said of his stint in the army that it was “an interruption, a nuisance; I forgot about it the moment it was over” (p. 111), but he also said that he had to learn to live with awakening in the middle of the night from reoccurring nightmares in which he had either to commit treason or murder (pp. 52–53).

2.4 Post-War Activities (1945–1947)

The war took its toll on Feyerabend. The bullet that was removed from his spine left him impotent for the rest of his life (his autobiography contains amusing descriptions of many subsequent sexual encounters). Although he started off completely ignorant of women, he married four times, and had, by his own account, plenty of affairs. But he seems to have been distant not just in his relationship with his parents, but in some of his marriages too. He hated the slavery love seemed to imply, but hated equally the freedom achieved by taking evasive action. He got bogged down in cycles of dependence, isolation, and renewed dependence, which only dissolved into a more balanced pattern after many years.

At the end of the war, Feyerabend went to the mayor of Apolda and asked for a job. He was assigned to the education section, given an office and a secretary and, fittingly, put in charge of entertainment. In 1946, having recovered from paralysis, he received a state fellowship to return to study singing and stage management for a year at the Musikhochschule in Weimar. He moved from Apolda to Weimar after about three months. At the Weimar Institut zur Methodologischen Erneuerung des Deutschen Theaters, he studied theatre, and at the Weimar Academy, he took classes in Italian, harmony, piano, singing, and enunciation. Singing remained one of his life’s major interests. He attended performances (drama, opera, ballet, concerts) at Weimar’s Nationaltheater, and later reminisced about opera stars of the time, recalling debates and arguments about theatre (e.g. the stereotyping of roles and plays) with Maxim Vallentin, Hans Eisler, etc. He also played a small part in the film Der Prozeß (1948) directed by the renowned G.W. Pabst. Although, by his own account, he led a full life, he became restless and decided to move.

3. Feyerabend’s Turn to Philosophy: The Kraft Circle, Popper and Wittgenstein

The details of Feyerabend’s developing relationships with Popper and Wittgenstein (and their ideas) frame Feyerabend’s philosophical development. Feyerabend took Popper and Wittgenstein to be two of his philosophical father figures (Felix Ehrenhaft was another, on Feyerabend and Ehrenhaft, see Collodel 2022 and Shaw 2017b). The centerpiece of his early philosophy of science, “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a), is a critical synthesis of Popper’s empiricism with Wittgenstein’s insights on meaning, which eventually led to his break with Popper’s school in December 1967.

3.1 Return to Vienna: University, Alpbach and Popper (1947–1948)

Feyerabend returned to his parents’ apartment house in Vienna’s 15th district on crutches. Although he planned to study physics, math, and astronomy, he initially chose instead to read history and sociology at the University of Vienna’s Institut für Osterreichische Geschichtsforschung, thinking that history, unlike physics, is concerned with real life. However, he quickly became dissatisfied with history and returned to theoretical physics. Although he later denied having studied philosophy, his college transcript indicates that he also took classes in philosophy of science in all eight semesters (he also took four consecutive classes and completed a practicum in psychology). Together with a group of science students, who all regarded themselves as far superior to students of other subjects, Feyerabend invaded philosophy lectures and seminars. Although this was not his first contact with philosophy, it seems to have been the period that cemented his interest.

At the time, he took the positivist line that science is the basis of knowledge; that it is empirical; and that nonempirical enterprises are either logic or nonsense (p. 68). These views would have been familiar from the climate of Logical Positivism which found its main root in the Vienna Circle, a group of scientifically-minded philosophers who, in the nineteen-twenties and thirties sought to deploy the newly revitalized formal logic of Gottlob Frege and Russell and Whitehead’s Principia Mathematica to represent the structure of human knowledge. Feyerabend’s youthful scientism makes quite a contrast with his later criticisms of it.

In August 1948, at the first meeting of the international summer seminar of the Austrian College Society in Alpbach which he attended, Feyerabend met the philosopher of science Karl Popper, who had already made a name for himself as the Vienna Circle’s ‘official opposition’. (The Austrian College Society had been founded in 1945 by Austrian resistance fighters, “to provide a forum for the exchange of scholars and ideas and so to prepare the political unification of Europe” (1978, p. 109). In contrast to the inductivism of positivism, Popper defended deductivism as the logic of justification. In his 1934 book Logik der Forschung, Popper elaborated the straightforward and appealing falsificationist view that science is a process of conjecture and refutation. Good science should be characterized as a process of bold conjectures and our best attempts to refute them. In the 1950s, Feyerabend was an ardent supporter of Popper’s normative approach and Feyerabend’s philosophical development was affected tremendously by his tumultuous relationship with Popper and his views both in general methodology and the foundations of quantum theory (Collodel 2016; Collodel and Oberheim 2020; Kuby 2021; van Strien 2020).

Unfortunately, Popper’s autobiography tells us nothing about their relationship, although he was to be the largest single influence (first positive, then negative) on Feyerabend’s development. For those hoping that Feyerabend would have used the occasion of his autobiography to clarify his turbulent relationship with Popper, it is disappointing that the book tells us so little about it. Elsewhere Feyerabend tells us that initially when they met in Alpbach in 1948, where Popper presented his “The Aim of Science” (Kuby 2021), he

admired [Popper’s] freedom of manners, his cheek, his disrespectful attitude towards the German philosophers who gave the proceedings weight in more senses than one, his sense of humor [ … and] his ability to restate ponderous problems in simple and journalistic language. Here was a free mind, joyfully putting forth his ideas, unconcerned about the reaction of the ‘professionals’ (1978, p. 115).

But Popper’s ideas themselves were not especially new to Feyerabend. Viktor Kraft, who taught Feyerabend and supervised his Ph.D. thesis, had been defending deductivism since 1925, and according to Feyerabend, falsificationism was something “taken for granted” at Alpbach. Popper’s ideas, he remarked, were also similar to those of another Viennese philosopher, Ludwig Wittgenstein, although “more abstract and anaemic” (1978, p. 116). As early as his 1955 review of Wittgenstein’s Investigations (his first English publication), Feyerabend suggested that Wittgenstein’s nominalist and constructivist views on meaning were less clear renditions of Popper’s views. Popper notoriously took Wittgenstein to be his arch-nemesis in philosophy (see Edmonds and Eidinow, 2001), who was detracting from the credit and attention he should be receiving.

Feyerabend attended the Alpbach symposium another fifteen times, first as a student, then as a lecturer and seminar chair. He also accepted the post of “scientific secretary”, and this he called “the most decisive step of my life” (p. 70). This fateful decision answers his self-addressed questions about the origin of his career, his reputation, and his situation at the time of writing his autobiography since he traced his situation back to it. These annual visits brought Feyerabend into contact with distinguished scientists-philosophers such as Erwin Schrödinger (1949, 1953, 1955), Léon Rosenfeld (1949), Maurice Pryce (1949), and Philipp Frank (1950, 1955), which allowed him to make a name for himself on both sides of the Atlantic in the second half of the 1950s as a philosopher engaged with the foundations of quantum theory and scientific method.

At Alpbach, he was also approached by communists, including the Marxist intellectual Walter Hollitscher, who became his teacher and friend. Feyerabend resisted Hollitscher’s political arguments based on his own “youthful elitism” and “an almost instinctive aversion to group thinking” (p. 73). But although Feyerabend later described himself as having been “a raving positivist” at the time, it was Hollitscher, he says, who persuaded him of the cogency of realism about the “external world”. Defending realism became a fundamental concern for Feyerabend, who repeatedly argued that scientific research is and should be conducted on the assumption of realism, which promotes scientific progress in contrast to positivism and instrumentalism.

Feyerabend developed his early ideas in a fascinating series of papers on problems of empiricism, beginning in 1958 (itself based on his 1951 thesis), that argue that realism and pluralism promote scientific progress and prevent it from stagnating into dangerous ideology. He characterized what good science should be as “An Attempt at a Realistic [Re-] Interpretation of Experience” (1958). Throughout his early philosophy, he recommended correcting common knowledge according to realistic interpretation of our best scientific theories, until his December 1967 epiphany, when he broke from Popper’s school and reversed himself on realism, concluding that common knowledge needs to be protected from scientism (Oberheim forthcoming).

3.2 From Physics to Philosophy: The Kraft Circle, Ehrenhaft’s Effects and Wittgenstein (1948–1952)

At The University of Vienna, Feyerabend was an aspiring physicist. He studied physics under Hans Thirring, Karl Przibram, and Felix Ehrenhaft, for whom he worked as an assistant. Ehrenhaft was an experimental physicist known as a fierce and independent critic of all kinds of orthodoxy in physics, who was often dismissed as a charlatan after his infamous controversy with Millikan on the oil-drop experiment (Holton 1978, Niaz 2005). Initially, Feyerabend and his fellow science students looked forward to exposing Ehrenhaft as a fraud. By 1949, Feyerabend was working as his assistant in Alpbach, when he witnessed a dispute between Ehrenhaft and the orthodoxy in which the former presented his experiments (which Feyerabend had helped to set up), while the latter defended their position by using strategies that Galileo’s opponents would have been proud of, ridiculing Ehrenhaft’s phenomena as mere Dreckeffect:

Only much later did Ehrenhaft’s lesson sink in and our attitude at the time as well as the attitude of the entire profession provided me then with an excellent illustration of the nature of scientific rationality (1978, p. 111).

Ehrenhaft did not convince the theoreticians, who protected themselves with an iron curtain of dogmatic belief of exactly the same kind as that deployed by Galileo’s opponents. All the while, they remained staunch empiricists, never doubting that science had to be adapted to facts. Feyerabend later commented that the day-to-day business of science, what Thomas Kuhn called “normal science”, cannot exist without this kind of “split consciousness”.

Feyerabend’s experience with Ehrenhaft deeply influenced him in at least two significant respects. First, the impotence of Ehrenhaft’s experimental effects (which Feyerabend had helped set up) motivated his interest in problems of empiricism, which became the main theme in his early philosophy. Why were Ehrenhaft’s experimental effects impotent? Should they have been? More generally, how should experimental effects be used to test theories and justify theory choice? These were exactly the kinds of questions to which Popper’s empiricism provided answers, and which eventually led Feyerabend to conclude that established theories only seem empirically secure when there is a lack of alternative theories that could show how they are wrong (Feyerabend 1962a). A second lasting influence is demonstrated by Feyerabend’s emphasis on the fact that it is impossible to tell the difference between a charlatan and a revolutionary except in hindsight, which began to play out in Feyerabend’s published papers in the mid-to late-1960s (see Feyerabend 1964, Collodel 2022, Shaw 2017b), but only fully came to fruition in conjunction with his new ‘position’ in “Against Method” (Feyerabend 1970), according to which “Anything goes!” (Oberheim forthcoming).

Following Popper, Feyerabend began to develop a keen interest in the foundations of quantum theory in this period. To this end, from 1949 to 1952, he made annual trips to either Sweden or Denmark. As with Wittgenstein, in August 1951, Feyerabend went to straight to the source of the issues that interested him. He attended Bohr’s summer seminar in Askov, on ‘the causality problem’ (Collodel and Oberheim 2024, p. 14), where he witnessed an event that significantly shaped his work in the foundations of quantum theory and his complementary work in general methodology through his early work (until after his break with Popper’s school in December 1967): How Bohr and the Bohrians initially reacted to David Bohm’s “hidden variables” proposal. While Bohr was puzzled and somewhat taken aback by this amazing news, after he left the room, the Bohrians were dismissive of Bohm’s proposal, without good grounds (invoking von Neumann’s proof as a crutch). Bohm’s subsequent attempts to develop a ‘hidden variables’ interpretation of quantum theory in the face of von Neumann’s alleged proof that no deterministic completion by ‘hidden variables’ can be consistent with the principles of quantum mechanics became a central focus of Feyerabend’s work in the foundations of quantum theory in the 1950s and 60s, as Feyerabend repeatedly criticized the Copenhagen interpretation and developed his own Bohrian proposal for handling the measurement problem.

Outside of physics, Feyerabend’s principal intellectual engagement in the late 1940s and early 1950s was in his capacity as student leader of the “Kraft Circle”, which was a philosophy club centered around Kraft, that became part of the Austrian College Society (Kuby 2010). The Kraft Circle held regular meetings from 1949 to 1952 (1978, p. 109), with the self-proscribed task of “considering philosophical problems in a nonmetaphysical manner and with special reference to the findings of the sciences” (Feyerabend 1966a, pp. 1–2). Their main topic of discussion concerned questions about the reality of theoretical entities and the “external world”. As the student leader of the Kraft circle, Feyerabend led the discussions, took notes, and invited new participants. Bela Juhos, Walter Hollitscher, Georg Henrik von Wright, and Elizabeth Anscombe were all visiting speakers. Elizabeth Anscombe had come to Vienna to improve her German to translate Wittgenstein’s work:

She gave me manuscripts of Wittgenstein’s later writings and discussed them with me. The discussions extended over months and occasionally proceeded from morning over lunch until late into the evening. They had a profound influence upon me though it is not at all easy to specify particulars (1978, p. 114).

To everyone’s surprise, even Wittgenstein attended a meeting of this ‘third Vienna Circle’ (Stadler 2015) at Feyerabend’s invitation (Feyerabend 1995, pp. 74–76). Feyerabend went to Wittgenstein’s family home in Vienna to invite him in person, but he was turned away. At the suggestion of Anscombe (who admonished him against appearing sycophantic), Feyerabend then succinctly invited Wittgenstein to come to a meeting with a short note: “We are discussing basic statements, and we are stuck”. Apparently, Wittgenstein could not pass up the opportunity to criticize Popper’s views. After arriving belatedly (over an hour late), taking a seat, and listening to Feyerabend (who was summarizing results of earlier discussions) for a few moments, Wittgenstein abruptly interrupted: “‘Halt, so geht das nicht’ (‘Stop, that’s not the way it is’)” and proceeded to discuss what one sees through a microscope (Feyerabend 1995, p. 76). Feyerabend later reported that Wittgenstein seemed to prefer their disrespectful attitude to the fawning admiration he encountered elsewhere. (1978, p. 109). And yet,

Not even a brief and quite interesting visit by Wittgenstein himself […] could advance our discussion. Wittgenstein was very impressive in his way of presenting concrete cases, such as amoebas under a microscope […] but when he left we still did not know whether or not there was an external world, or, if there was one, what the arguments were in favor of it (Feyerabend 1966a, p. 4).

Although Feyerabend had originally planned to submit a thesis on physics, after getting nowhere with the electrodynamics problem he had chosen, he turned to philosophy to earn his degree. He revised his Kraft circle discussion notes, which contained ideas and arguments that were roughly the right length, and turned them into his doctoral thesis, “Zur Theorie der Basissätze”, which he submitted in November 1951 under Kraft’s supervision, (p. 115). Here, Feyerabend first delineated his peculiar views on meaning and method. He may even have realized that they did not comport to Popper’s notion of neutral ‘basic statements’ as the empirical basis of science as the invitation to Wittgenstein would seem to imply, although it would only be about a decade later that Feyerabend openly criticized Popper’s empiricism in “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a).

In his 1951 Ph.D. thesis, Feyerabend first introduced his top-down view of the meaning of observation statements, according to which the meaning of any statement used to test a theory is determined by the theory from which it is deduced and used to test, in contrast to Carnap’s dual language model, according to which observation language gets it meaning from the observations, and is separate from theoretical language, which gets its meaning from observation language. Feyerabend’s top-down account has the peculiar consequence that one observation sentence makes two or more incompatible statements depending on which theory is used to interpret it. For example, the sentence “the ball fell” meant that it was pushed by its impetus before it meant that it was pulled by gravity. This Wittgensteinian insight laid the foundation for Feyerabend’s account of incommensurability, which he used to criticize formal accounts of the growth of knowledge in “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a), arguing that contemporary theories do not explain antiquated facts. It just appears that way because we continue to use the same observation sentences after scientific revolutions, when in fact, the same sentences can be used to make two incompatible statements– depending on which theory is used to interpret it, that is, from which theory it is deduced, together with auxiliary assumptions, and used to test. In this way, Feyerabend’s early philosophical work “started from and returned to the discussion of protocol statements in the Vienna Circle” (Feyerabend 1991, p. 526).

3.3 Life at the London School of Economics (1952–1953)

In Feyerabend’s autobiography, we are told a little about Popper’s lectures and his famous LSE seminar. The lectures began with the claim that there is no method in science, but that there are some simple and helpful rules of thumb. Popper tried to show “how simple ideas that were derived from equally simple requirements brought order into the complex world of research” (pp. 88–89). Having been convinced by Popper’s and Pierre Duhem’s critiques of inductivism (the view that science proceeds through generalization from facts recorded in experience), Feyerabend considered falsificationism a real option, and, he says, he “fell for it” applying falsificationism in his papers and lectures (p. 89).

Later Feyerabend saw this phase of his development as an example of the dangers of abstract reasoning. Rationalism is already dangerous since it “paralyzes our judgment” (p. 89) and is invested with “an almost superhuman authority” (p. 90). But Popper added a further dangerous element: simplicity. Such a philosophy, complains Feyerabend, “may be out of touch with reality [… that is], with scientific practice” (p. 90).

Feyerabend had adopted Popper’s normative approach to epistemology. In chapter II of Logik der Forschung [The Logic of Scientific Discovery] (1934, English 1959), Popper distinguished between scientific practice and scientific standards, principles, or methodology. He argued against a “naturalistic” theory of method that makes standards depend on practice, opting instead for a strongly normative epistemology, a discipline that lays down ideals and methodological rules for scientists to aspire to and ascribe to. This is one of the most important aspects of the Popperian perspective that Feyerabend initially took on board. He was trying to contribute to a normative “model for the acquisition of knowledge” (see Preston 1997, p. 13) until he broke with the Popperian school in December 1967, reversing himself on realism in a ‘historical turn’.

Such an epistemology, Feyerabend concluded, makes the false assumption that “rational” standards can lead to a practice that is as mobile, rich, and effective as the science we already have. However, science did not develop according to Popper’s model and falsificationism does not promote scientific progress, but stifles it. It stifles progress by sharing a dogmatic feature with school philosophies (the assumption of meaning invariance). If new theoretical proposals have to predict the accepted observation statements to justify replacing established theories, then scientific revolutions that change the meaning of those statements would be impossible to justify (Feyerabend 1962a). After his epiphany in 1967, Feyerabend generalized his criticism, arguing that while science is not ‘irrational’, it contains no overarching ‘rational’ pattern (as Otto Neurath had argued, p. 91). Rationalism (Popper’s included) could produce a science, but not the progressive science we actually have.

In 1952, Feyerabend focused on two topics: the foundations of quantum theory (von Neumann and Bohm) and Wittgenstein (p. 92). Feyerabend’s work on Wittgenstein from a Popperian perspective led to his views on meaning and method. He presented his ideas on scientific change to Popper’s LSE seminar and to a gathering of illustrious Wittgensteinians (Elizabeth Anscombe, Peter Geach, H. L. A. Hart, and Georg Henrik von Wright) in Anscombe’s Oxford flat, which he then repeated in Popper’s LSE seminar. These meetings seem to have been the first English presentations of his central idea that some scientific theories are ‘incommensurable’, although that term appeared in his publications only a decade later (see Oberheim 2005):

On one occasion which I remember vividly Anscombe, by a series of skilful questions, made me see how our conception (and even our perceptions) of well-defined and apparently self-contained facts may depend on circumstances not apparent in them. There are entities such as physical objects which obey a “conservation principle” in the sense that they retain their identity through a variety of manifestations and even when they are not present at all while other entities such as pains and after-images are “annihilated” with their disappearance. The conservation principles may change from one developmental stage of the human organism to another and they may be different for different languages (cf. Whorf’s “covert classifications” […]). I conjectured that such principles would play an important role in science, that they might change during revolutions and that deductive relations between pre-revolutionary and post-revolutionary theories might be broken off as a result (1978, p. 115).

Major discoveries, I said, are not like the discovery of America, where the general nature of the discovered object is already known. Rather, they are like recognizing that one has been dreaming (p. 92).

These thoughts received an unenthusiastic reception from Hart, von Wright, and Popper (p. 92). Feyerabend scrutinized the manuscript that became the Philosophische Untersuchungen [Philosophical Investigations], while visiting Anscombe in London: “Being of a pedantic turn of mind”, he says, “I rewrote the book so that it looked more like a treatise with a continuous argument” (1978, p. 116).

Anscombe translated Feyerabend’s critical reconstruction into English and sent it to The Philosophical Review. This became Feyerabend’s first English-language publication, which he called his “Wittgensteinian monster” (p. 115). He later commented:

I knew that Wittgenstein did not want to present a theory (of knowledge, or language), and I did not expressly formulate a theory myself. But my arrangements made the text speak like a theory and falsified Wittgenstein’s intentions (p. 93).

Wittgenstein’s emphasis on the need for concrete research and his objections to abstract reasoning (“Look, don’t think!”) somewhat clashed with my own inclinations and the papers in which his influence is noticeable are therefore mixtures of concrete examples and sweeping principles (1978, p. 115).

In his review of the Philosophical Investigations, he reconstructed Wittgenstein’s critique of a family of “realist” or “essentialist” theories of meaning according to which the meaning of a word is the object designated or referred to by that word. Feyerabend argued that Wittgenstein was attempting a reductio ad absurdum of realist theories of meaning, showing that they had the untenable implication that we could not be said to know the meaning of words that we nevertheless constantly use in totally unproblematic ways. While he defended Wittgenstein’s semantic views (adopting and developing the implications of the contextual theory of meaning he read into Wittgenstein’s work), he harshly rejected Wittgenstein’s conception of philosophy as pure “philosophical analysis” of genuinely philosophical (pseudo-) problems. Feyerabend abhorred philosophy that merely leaves everything as it is, relegated to merely letting flies out of bottles. Philosophy should be progressive. It should contribute to improving our understanding and the human condition, not to the dangerous entrenchment of the status quo. At the same time, Feyerabend did not only endorse Wittgenstein’s conception of genuinely philosophical (pseudo-) problems, he tried to specify their source, as well as to show how their clarification can lead to progress. They are caused by incompatible rules of usage implied by incommensurable, antiquated scientific theories. Such problems are dissolved by reforming everyday language according to our best theories.

In a short article published the next year (1956), Feyerabend expanded on his critique, arguing that consideration of G. E. Moore’s famous “paradox of analysis” showed that “philosophy cannot be analytic and scientific, i.e., interesting, progressive, about a certain subject matter, informative at the same time” (“A Note on the Paradox of Analysis”, 1956a, p. 95). Feyerabend thenceforth plumped for (what he conceived of as) scientific philosophy. Like Popper, he increasingly adamantly rejected “analytic” philosophy or the “linguistic” philosophy which followed in Wittgenstein’s wake, and with which Oxford University dominated the philosophical scene in the 1950s and early 1960s.

One of the things that comes across most clearly from his autobiography is the consistently malleable nature of Feyerabend’s views. He records that his friend Agassi caused him completely to change his mind about a book he considered translating. When Agassi urged Feyerabend to become a faithful Popperian, Feyerabend’s resistance seems to have been based mainly on his aversion to groups more than his vague feeling that there was some kind of problem with Popper’s account.

3.4 Return to Vienna (1953–1955)

By the summer of 1953, when Popper had to apply for extra funds to allow Feyerabend to work as his assistant, Feyerabend had decided to take a leave from the Popperian church and return to Vienna. Although the assistantship was soon approved, Feyerabend “felt quite uncomfortable. I couldn’t put my finger on it; I only knew that I wanted to remain in Vienna” (p. 99).

During this period Feyerabend translated Popper’s “war effort”, The Open Society and its Enemies, wrote articles on “Methodology” and “Philosophy of Nature” for a French encyclopedia, produced a report on post-war developments in the Humanities in Austria for the U.S. Library of Congress, and made a mess of his first professional opportunity as a singer (p. 98). But he also felt that he did not know what to do in the long run, so he applied for jobs at various universities.

He met Arthur Pap, “who had come to Vienna to lecture on analytic philosophy and who hoped, perhaps somewhat unrealistically, that he would be able to revive what was left from the great years of the Vienna Circle and the analytic tradition there” (1966a, p. 3). Feyerabend became Pap’s assistant. Pap arranged for him to meet Herbert Feigl in Vienna in 1954, and together they studied Feigl’s papers. Feigl had been a member of the Vienna Circle until he emigrated to the USA in 1930, but he had never given up the “realist” view that there is a knowable external world. He convinced Feyerabend that the positivism of Kraft and Pap had not solved the traditional problems of philosophy. His paper “Existential Hypotheses” (1950), together with Kraft’s contributions and certain ideas Popper had put forward at Alpbach in 1948 and 1949, greatly diminished Feyerabend’s doubts about realism (1966a, p. 4). Here is how Feyerabend recounts Feigl’s influence:

It was […] quite a shock to hear Feigl expound fundamental difficulties and to hear him explain in perfectly simple language without any recourse to formalism why the problem of application [of the probability-calculus] was still without a solution. Formalization, then, was not the last word in philosophical matters. There was still room for fundamental discussion-for speculation (dreaded word!); there was still a possibility of overthrowing highly formalized systems with the help of a little common sense! (1966a, p. 5).

4. Feyerabend’s Early Work: Liberalizing Empiricism

4.1 First Academic Appointment: The University of Bristol (1955–1958)

In 1955, with the help of references from Popper and Erwin Schrödinger, as well as his own big mouth (p. 102, 1978, p. 116), Feyerabend secured his first academic post lecturing in the philosophy of science at the University of Bristol, England. In his autobiography (pp. 103–4) he describes how Agassi had to help him prepare for these lectures since they covered a subject Feyerabend claimed he had never studied (1978, p. 116). He also describes how for some time he felt directionless and unsettled: he was “killing time”.

In the summer of that year, he again visited Alpbach, where he met the physicist and mathematician, Philipp Frank (another former member of the Vienna circle), who exerted on him a (somewhat delayed) influence:

Frank argued that the Aristotelian objections against Copernicus agreed with empiricism, while Galileo’s law of inertia did not. As in other cases, this remark lay dormant in my mind for years; then it started festering. The Galileo chapters of Against Method are a late result (p. 103. See also 1978, p. 112).

At the turn of 1956, Feyerabend launched a weekly lecture course in Bristol on the foundations of quantum mechanics, which he remembered as being a disaster. Directly before the first meeting, he reversed himself on indeterminism in the quantum theory, adopting Popper’s view that it can be derived from (and so is nothing more special than) classical indeterminacy (something Popper, throughout his work on the foundations of quantum theory tried, but ultimately, failed to prove). Feyerabend excitedly published “Eine Bemerkung zum Neumannschen Beweis” [A Remark on von Neumann’s Proof] (Feyerabend 1956b). Popper immediately privately accused Feyerabend of plagiarism, insisting Feyerabend write to the editors and have them add a note giving himself and Agassi credit for the ideas. Feyerabend initially agreed to write to the editors and have them add such a note, but then he thought better of it and told Popper that it was too late. By adopting Popper’s view on the foundations of quantum theory, however briefly, Feyerabend (it seemed to Popper), was getting way out ahead of his own “propensity interpretation”, which Popper only publicly launched at the Colston Research Society symposium in 1957 (through Feyerabend, who read Popper’s paper in absentia). In any case, it was a short-lived reversal for Feyerabend, who quickly returned to what he had been arguing before concerning von Neumann’s proof. By January 1957, Feyerabend made his discomfort about his published ‘Remark’ very clear in a letter to Popper: “if I am right your and Joske’s [Agassi] criticism [of von Neumann] which I have adopted myself [in Feyerabend 1956b] is wrong”. It now seemed to Feyerabend once again that “there is much more behind [von Neumann’s] proof than you [Popper] were inclined to admit” (Collodel and Oberheim eds. 2020, p. 248).

In the summer of 1956, along with Alfred Landé, he chaired a successful seminar on philosophical issues in quantum mechanics at Alpbach. He also got married for the second time. This time to one of his former students, Mary O’Neill. But this relationship seems to have been very short-lived, for he reports that his wife spent Christmas 1957 away from him with her parents, that she subsequently had an affair, and that the last time he saw her was 1958.

In 1957, Feyerabend met David Bohm, triggering several related crucial events that laid the foundations for Feyerabend’s philosophical development to come. Bohm had been the favored protégé of Robert Oppenheimer and had contributed to the Manhattan Project in Oak Ridge, Tennessee (his doctoral work on scattering had been classified), before he went to work with Albert Einstein (who became his new mentor), at Princeton in 1947. In 1951, Bohm fled from McCarthyism to South America (1951–55) and then Israel (1955–1957), before arriving in Bristol. Feyerabend studied Bohm’s dialectical conception of science and reality and Bohm’s methodological views on the foundations of quantum theory immediately after Bohm’s Causality and Chance in Modern Physics (1957) became available, on the eve of the ninth symposium of the Colston Research Society in April, “Observation and Interpretation”, that Feyerabend had helped organize. At the symposium, Feyerabend gave a paper “On the Quantum Theory of Measurement” that sets out his Bohrian strategy for handling the measurement problem in the foundations of quantum theory, which he developed in a series of papers criticizing the Copenhagen interpretation (not Bohr himself, who had proposed such an approach, as Feyerabend, to his chagrin, only found out at the conference) published in 1957, 1958, 1962, 1968, and 1969 (see Kuby 2021 and van Strien 2020). Feyerabend also emphasized what was to become a long-running central theme in his work: that there is no separate, neutral “observation language” or “everyday language” against which the theoretical statements of science are tested, but that “the everyday level is part of the theoretical rather than something self-contained and independent” (1981, p. 217, emphasis added). This view represents a decisive break with Carnap and the logical positivist conception of theories. It led Feyerabend to the idea of incommensurability, with which he eventually criticized Popper’s empiricism.

Moreover, during the discussions of the symposium, Feyerabend championed Bohm’s cause and his plea for more tolerance and pluralism in the foundation of quantum theory. Bohm and Vigier were criticized for re-introducing untestable metaphysics into science so that the quantum of action becomes derivative. However, Bohm and Vigier saw nothing wrong with their ad hoc strategy, which introduces ‘hidden variables’ (a sub-quantum fluid, giving rise to quantum indeterminacy as a second, lower-level form of Brownian motion) to explain the known results. After all, as they pointed out, the kinetic theory of heat was ad hoc and relied on such hidden variables (in this case atoms) until it was empirically corroborated by Einstein’s prediction of the stochastic character of Brownian motion, ending classical phenomenological thermodynamics and Energeticism. Perhaps another Einstein might come along and do the same for their theory (think up an independent test corroborating it). This is how Bohm’s defense of the ad hoc strategy they were using to support his (and Vigier’s) 1954 sub-quantum fluid proposal, as illustrated by Einstein’s prediction of the stochastic character of (classical) Brownian motion, became Feyerabend’s methodological argument for theoretical pluralism as illustrated by the same example. Feyerabend’s argument based on this example became the centerpiece of his work in the philosophy of science from “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a) through Against Method (1993).

When Feyerabend finally finished drafting a long-planned critical study of Bohm’s 1957 book Causality and Chance in Modern Physics in 1959 (see Feyerabend 1960), he was still very much under Popper’s influence. The essay review is a detailed critical comparison of Bohm’s methodology (‘the qualitative infinity of nature’) with Popper’s falsificationism, with Feyerabend bluntly concluding: “I cannot accept Bohm’s methodology of caution […] I prefer […] the methodology of falsification as it has been developed by Popper” (1960, p. 339), while definitively rejecting “the epistemology behind Bohm’s belief that every theory, however absurd it may seem at first sight, has some kind of truth in it and correctly mirrors what exists in the universe” (1960, p. 337).

However, Bohm’s (unpublished) response to Feyerabend’s criticism of falsificationism motivated Feyerabend’s criticism of Popper’s empiricism in “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a). In this collage of his earlier publications, Feyerabend built on his peculiar ideas on meaning and method by adopting and developing Bohm’s argument for pluralism and Bohm’s plea for more tolerance towards his views based on the Brownian motion example. He used them to criticize Popper’s empiricism while illustrating how there can still be a crucial experiment between incommensurable alternatives despite the lack of formal relation between their corresponding predictions required for a falsification. Bohm increasingly became a central figure in Feyerabend’s formative development, leading him away from Popper’s empiricism, towards Bohm’s dialectical views on scientific progress and the qualitative infinity of nature, such as ontological pluralism and the non-autonomy of facts. In the long run, with the publication of his collected papers in 1981, Feyerabend retracted his Popperian criticism of Bohm’s views. Bohm and Feyerabend’s ideas continued to converge, including their shared interests in “fringe” science, as Bohm’s dialectical ideas continued to have visible effects on Feyerabend’s published productions (see Feyerabend 1966b; Collodel and Oberheim 2024). Most notably, Feyerabend increasingly openly flirts with a Hegelian ontology, according to which reality is co-constituted by subject-sided and object-sided moments — as can be seen by comparing Bohm’s view on the qualitative infinity of nature with Feyerabend’s ‘Kant-on-wheels’ ontology (see Oberheim 2016) which remains intact from “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a) to The Conquest of Abundance (1999).

In the summer of 1957, Feyerabend accepted an invitation to visit Feigl’s Minnesota Center for the Philosophy of Science in Minneapolis. The Center was, as Feyerabend later said, “one of the foremost institutions in the field” (p. 115). There he met Carl Hempel, Ernest Nagel, Hilary Putnam, Adolf Grünbaum, Grover Maxwell, E. L. Hill, Paul Meehl, and others. He returned to the Center in 1958, having accepted another invitation to work there, backed by an NSF grant. He often returned in subsequent years, as Feigl continued to promote Feyerabend’s career and his engagement with the leading philosophers of science in North America.

4.2 The University of California at Berkeley: Early Years (1958–1964)

In 1958, Feyerabend accepted an invitation to spend a year at the University of California at Berkeley, after which the University administration decided to give him tenure based on his publications and, of course, his big mouth (p. 115). After his repeated visits to Minnesota Center, he started lecturing full-time at Berkeley in 1960, where in the autumn of that year, he met Thomas Kuhn. They quickly became close compatriots, and Kuhn gave Feyerabend a draft of The Structure of Scientific Revolutions (1962). They were soon to become very closely associated, often recognized together for having independently introduced the idea of incommensurability into discussions of scientific progress in 1962 publications. They are also often lumped together as having initiated the movement away from a logic-oriented, to a historically oriented, approach to the philosophy of science, as well as among the “worst enemies of science” (together with Popper, see Lamb, Munevar, and Preston eds. 2000) because they all reject the claim that theories can be proven to be true, opening the door to relativism. For these reasons, it can be surprising to learn that after their brief initial robust personal engagement that ended in the fall of 1961, direct discussion of the deep affinities in their ideas was set back by a rift in their relations that lasted about two decades (until 1983, see Collodel and Oberheim 2024). At the time, Feyerabend was deeply immersed in normative epistemology. He wrote a series of scathing letters criticizing Kuhn’s historical approach, even accusing Kuhn of intentionally misleading his readers. He acerbically attacked Kuhn’s defense of ‘normal science’ as a pernicious form of dogmatism, and vehemently challenged Kuhn’s use of purportedly neutral historical facts given the normative implications of his account. For Feyerabend: “What you [Kuhn] are writing is not just history. It is ideology covered up as history” (Collodel and Oberheim eds. 2024, p. 232) Feyerabend’s persistent, caustic criticisms of Kuhn and his work, especially the recurrent accusation that he was promoting a dogmatic, conservative ideology, led to a break in personal contact that lasted about two decades – until their gradual rapprochement beginning in 1983. Thus, while Kuhn and Feyerabend were perceived to be ushering in the historical turn together over the next two decades, actually they had broken off personal contact when Kuhn left Berkeley at the end of 1961, fueled by Feyerabend’s harsh criticism of Kuhn’s historical approach and what became Kuhn’s most prominent work (see Collodel and Oberheim 2024. For the full surviving Feyerabend-Kuhn correspondence, see Collodel and Oberheim eds. 2024). According to Feyerabend’s normative approach, there are no neutral facts. Epistemology should result from ethical decisions about the kind of knowledge we want to have. Science and methodology are what we make them, and what we make of them. We should want to have a progressive science because the alternative is dogmatic ideology, which is dangerous. After all, it can quickly devolve into intolerance and ultimately violence. As the German saying paradoxically puts it: “Der Weg ist das Ziel” [the route is the destination, implying the goal is to stay on the path] so as not to become entrenched as dogmatic ideology.

From 1958 through 1967, Feyerabend developed his normative approach to epistemology in a series of papers on problems of empiricism that attempted to contribute to a positive model for the acquisition of knowledge. In these papers, he unpacks the consequences of his views on meaning and method, while criticizing his contemporaries’ accounts. These strange ideas emerged from his earlier engagement with the Vienna Circle’s protocol sentence debate and appear in their initial form in his 1951 Ph.D. thesis. They were initially published in English as “An Attempt at a Realistic Interpretation of Experience” (1958), which primarily targets logical positivism and Carnap’s dual language model. “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a) sets out his mature early view by drawing together his work in analytic philosophy, general methodology, and the foundations of quantum theory. Feyerabend also adds new critical targets (Popper included) and proposes a new test model for comparing incommensurable theories, launching his oft-repeated methodological argument for theoretical pluralism. Subsequent major papers written in the 1960s before his reversal in December 1967 develop particular aspects, and further consequences of, his early views, while responding to criticisms. “How to be a Good Empiricist” (1963a) is “A Plea for Tolerance in Matters Epistemological” that stresses the non-autonomy of facts (facts do not exist independently of theories). “Realism and Instrumentalism: Comments on the Logic of Factual Support” (1964) goes deeper into the issue of realism as an ideal and his normative argument for it. In 1965, Feyerabend tried to clarify his contentious views in “On the ‘Meaning’ of Scientific Terms” and “Reply to Criticism: Comments on Smart, Sellars and Putnam”. His early views culminate in two papers: “Problems of Empiricism” (1965), which is a lengthy paper that sets out the “ever-expanding ocean of alternatives” (pp. 224–225) account of progress and his belatedly published (written before his December 1967 reversal) “Linguistic Arguments and Scientific Method” (1969), which emphasizes his view that common knowledge and everyday language should be corrected by our current best scientific theories as part of scientific progress – and not merely analyzed – which permeates his early work, until he reversed himself in December 1967.

“An Attempt at a Realistic Interpretation of Experience” (1958) explains Feyerabend’s peculiar views on meaning and method. Feyerabend argues that good science should be an attempt at a realistic re-interpretation of experience. Our best scientific theories should be used to correct common knowledge and everyday language as part of progress. Specifically, he criticizes the logical positivist conception of meaning and Carnap’s dual language model of theoretical systems, arguing that they have consequences “at variance with scientific method and reasonable philosophy” (1981, p. 17). This launches his signature two-pronged (descriptive and normative) argumentative strategy, according to which an account is historically inaccurate and normatively undesirable because it would stifle progress. According to Feyerabend, positivist theories imply the “stability thesis”: Even major changes in theory (scientific revolutions) will not affect the meanings of terms in the observation language. Against this supposition, Feyerabend defended what he called “Thesis I”, the idea that

the interpretation of an observation-language is determined by the theories which we use to explain what we observe, and it changes as soon as those theories change (1958, p. 31).

Thesis I reverses the flow of meaning from what positivism presupposes. Instead of meaning seeping upwards from observation language to theoretical language (as logical positivism and Carnap’s dual language model would have it), Feyerabend, following Wittgenstein’s remarks and Gestalt psychology, argues that meaning trickles down from theory to experience. Theories inform experience, not vice-versa. This view results from combining a contextual theory of meaning, according to which meaning is conferred on terms by the theory used to interpret them, with Popper’s “hypothetico-deductive model” of theory testing. For an observation statement to be used to test a theory, it must be deduced from that theory, and so it must have the meaning conferred on it by that theory. Therefore, when theories change, the meanings of the observations used to test them change.

Feyerabend also argues that the idea that the interpretation of observation terms does not depend upon the status of our theoretical knowledge has undesirable consequences for positivists. It implies that “every positivistic observation language is based upon a metaphysical ontology” (Philosophical Papers, Volume 1, p. 21). If observation language gets its meaning directly from experience, then the observation language becomes untestable. In contrast, according to Feyerabend’s realism, “the interpretation of a scientific theory depends upon nothing but the state of affairs it describes” (Philosophical Papers, Volume 1, p. 42). Unlike positivism, which conflicts with science by taking experiences as given, unanalyzable building blocks, realism treats experiences as analyzable, as the result of processes not immediately accessible to observation, so that the observations statements that they prompt can and should be tested and improved.

In “Das Problem der Existenz theoretischer Entitäten” (1960) [On the Problem of the Existence of Theoretical Entities] (for an English translation, see Feyerabend 1999), Feyerabend concludes that there is no special problem concerning the existence of theoretical entities, as all entities are theoretical. If, as the contextual theory implies, the meanings of observation statements depend on the principles of the theories used to explain them, inadequacies in these principles will be transmitted to the observation statements that they subtend, whence our beliefs about what is observed may be in error so that even our experiences themselves can and should be criticized and improved as we improve our conception of reality. Instead of passively accepting observation statements as given, we should attempt to find and test the theoretical principles implicit in them, which may lead to changes to those principles. This is part of Feyerabend’s conception of scientific philosophy (see “Physik und Ontologie” 1954), as part of ontology (the study of the implications our theories have concerning the nature of reality), which is how metaphysical speculation can become testable.

In “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a), Feyerabend develops his view that revolutionary new theories are incommensurable with established views. They are logically disjoint (‘incommensurable’) due to meaning variance in the non-logical terms used to state the rival theories, which results in meaning variance in the observation statements used to test them. Feyerabend was trying to develop Wittgenstein’s insights into observation language within the context of Popper’s critical rationalist philosophy in a critical synthesis that develops the best from both while criticizing the worst in each. From Wittgenstein, Feyerabend develops a contextual theory of meaning according to which our theories determine the meaning of observation statements; specifically the insight that one observation sentence makes two incompatible statements depending on which theory is used to interpret it. For example, in the transition to classical mechanics, ‘The ball fell’ was used to test and corroborate competing theories of motion, but it was used to make two incompatible statements (that it was pushed from within or pulled from outside). Feyerabend concluded that revolutionary new theories do not explain established facts. They replace them. For example, relativity theory does not explain classical facts. It replaces them with relativistic facts and classical facts should become antiquated.

Feyerabend also adds three new critical targets, mirroring the title (Hempel on explanation, Nagel on reduction, and then Popper on empiricism). Feyerabend criticizes Hempel’s account of explanation because it implies that to justify the replacement of an established explanation, the new explanation should explain everything explained by the established one, plus something more. However, according to Feyerabend, in revolutions, meaning variance renders rival explanations logically disjoint, so the new explanation does not, and cannot, explain the same observation statements already explained. The new explanation may explain the same observation sentences, but it does so by reinterpreting them into incompatible observation statements. Progress has been made without meeting Hempel’s criteria, which are too conservative, because they would make the justification of revolutionary new explanations impossible, and so stifle progress. Feyerabend then criticizes Nagel’s account of inter-theoretic reduction for the same reason, coming to the same conclusion. In revolutions, meaning variance renders rival theories logically disjoint, so formal relations cannot be used to explain (by reduction) established theories as special cases (as Nagel suggests), so suggesting that they should have to, to be satisfactory as replacements, stifles progress. Finally, setting up the main conclusion of the paper, Feyerabend criticizes his interpretation of Popper’s empiricism (today known as ‘falsificationism’) for the same reason, concluding that Popper’s empiricism also shares the same undesirable feature with dogmatic school philosophies as Hempel and Nagel’s accounts (1962a, pp. 30–31). It cannot take incommensurability into account (Feyerabend 1962a, p. 93), because there can be no formally comparable consequences (observational or otherwise) deduced from incommensurable alternatives (Feyerabend 1962a, p. 94). The new theory should not have to successfully predict (by deduction) all of the existing theories’ correct predictions plus more (Hempel’s criteria for a more comprehensive explanation), plus an observation statement that formally contradicts one of the established theories’ unsuccessful predictions (the falsifier). This is not what has happened in revolutionary advances (which result in meaning variance), and these criteria are normatively undesirable because they set an impossibly high bar for justifying revolutionary new proposals, inhibiting progress.

Feyerabend’s criticism of these three new main targets (he also repeats his usual criticism of Carnap, the Copenhagen interpretation, and mentions a few others) is used to support the main contention of the paper, which is that, more generally, a formal account of reduction and explanation is impossible (because of meaning variance that results in incommensurability). Revolutionary new theories do not explain antiquated facts.

Feyerabend was developing Popper’s view that increasing testability increases empirical content and promotes progress through a process of conjectures and refutations. Feyerabend argues that Popper’s empiricism has only a limited validity. It is limited to testing commensurable theories. While Newton’s theory falsified Kepler’s (commensurable) laws in this Popperian fashion, relativity theory does not falsify classical mechanics because meaning variance renders them incommensurable, precluding the formal relation (consistency and inconsistency) between the corresponding observation statements deduced from each theory needed for a falsification. More generally, instead of Popper’s conjectures and refutations (which only works for comparing commensurable theories within shared theoretical frameworks), in revolutions, it is conjectures and novel theory-laden corroborations, as illustrated by the Brownian motion example. The example purportedly shows that Brownian motion only indirectly refuted classical phenomenological thermodynamics once it was successfully predicted (and thereby potentially explained) by the kinetic theory of heat. The phenomenological theory was not refuted by predictions deduced from it that logically contradict predictions deduced from the kinetic theory that were corroborated. It was abandoned because the ontology it implies is incompatible with the ontology implied by a better corroborated new theory. The conclusion that there is no absolute mass because mass is relative to motion was justified by the corroboration of relativity theory, not by a falsification of classical mechanics. This test model became the basis for his methodological argument for theoretical pluralism, which became the centerpiece of his work in philosophy of science through Against Method (1993). The argument is that no matter how successful an established theory is, new theoretical proposals should always be welcome (and pluralism should be the norm) because sometimes the fact that some observations refute an established view can only be established by developing an incommensurable alternative to the established view.

Feyerabend also explains Wittgenstein’s illusive ‘grammar’ as the source of genuinely philosophical problems as the tension between the semantic principles implied by contemporary views and the semantic principles implied by antiquated scientific theories that continue to haunt everyday language because we continue to use many of the same terms and sentences after a revolution but with new, incompatible meanings. However, against Wittgenstein (and linguistic philosophy more generally), Feyerabend argues that dissolution through clarification of such problems is often crucial to scientific advance and that common knowledge and everyday language should be corrected according to our best theories to avoid stifling scientific advance. For example, the mind-body problem may perhaps dissolve by progress in cognitive psychology that results in eliminative materialism (see Shaw 2021a).

Feyerabend also introduces what is sometimes called his Kant-on-wheels ontology (see Oberheim 2016):

scientific theories are ways of looking at the world; and their adoption affects our general beliefs and expectations, and thereby also our experiences and our conception of reality. We may even say that what is regarded as ‘nature’ at a particular time is our own product in the sense that all the features ascribed to it have first been invented by us and then used for bringing order into our surroundings. As is well known, it was Kant who most forcefully stated and investigated this all-pervasive character of theoretical assumptions. However, Kant also thought that the very generality of such assumptions and their omnipresence would forever prevent them from being refuted. As opposed to this, the second idea implicit in the position to be defended here demands that our theories be testable and that they be abandoned as soon as [they fail] a test (1962a, p. 29),

so that science proceeds to “better and better theories” (p. 30). Feyerabend also develops his contrastive, historical accounts of empirical content and knowledge.

The use of a set of theories with the properties indicated above [mutually incompatible, but factually adequate (p. 50)] will also improve our understanding of each of its members by making it very clear what is denied by the theory that happens to be accepted in the end (p. 67).

Moreover,

Any attempt to reduce this class [of theories that are mutually incompatible, but factually adequate] to a single theory would result in a decisive decrease of the empirical content of this remaining theory and would therefore be undesirable from the point of view of empiricism. The freedom granted by the indeterminateness of facts is therefore not only psychologically important […] it is also needed for methodological reasons (p. 50).

Relativity theory is better understood in contrast to classical mechanics, which become part of its empirical content (as part of the set of statements ruled out by it).

“How to be a Good Empiricist” (1963a) is supposed to be a simplified summary of his earlier work, especially “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” (1962a) and “Problems of Microphysics” (1962b). Feyerabend argues for pluralism and makes a plea for more tolerance in matters of epistemology, mirroring his specific call for more tolerance towards Bohm’s proposal and his criticism of the hegemony of the Copenhagen interpretation (not Bohr’s view, which Feyerabend was following) in the foundations of quantum theory. Feyerabend emphasizes the relative nature of facts (which Bohm also emphasizes) that results from his Kant-on-wheels ontology, according to which there are classical facts and relativistic facts, depending on which theory is used to explain them. He claimed the most significant insight of his early philosophy is his rejection of the ‘autonomy principle’, according to which facts exist and are available independently of whether or not one considers alternatives to the theory to be tested (1963a).

In “Mental Events and the Brain” (1963b) and “Materialism and the Mind-Body Problem” (1963c), Feyerabend applied his ideas to the mind-body problem arguing that the distinction between mental and physical results from principles that derived from an incommensurable antiquated scientific theory. The clash between those principles and contemporary physicalism results in a genuinely philosophical (pseudo-) problem in Wittgenstein’s sense: the mind-body problem. He sought to undermine the supposition that the mind cannot be a physical thing by promoting the possibility of “eliminative materialism” illustrating how common knowledge and everyday language should be reformed to reflect the current state of scientific knowledge. Feyerabend’s radical ‘eliminative materialist’ proposal was taken up by Richard Rorty and Paul and Patricia Churchland, becoming an important legacy.

In “Realism and Instrumentalism: Comments on the Logic of Factual Support” (1964) Feyerabend applied his normative approach to the dispute about how best to interpret scientific theories, arguing that the disagreement between realists and instrumentalists is not a factual issue, but a matter of choice. We can choose to see theories either as descriptions of reality (scientific realism) or as instruments of prediction (instrumentalism), depending on what ideals of scientific knowledge we aspire to. Adherence to these competing ideals (high informative content on the one hand, and the certainty of our senses, on the other) is to be judged by their respective consequences. Stressing that philosophical theories have not merely reflected science but have changed it, Feyerabend argued further that the form of our knowledge can be altered to fit our ideals. So we can have certainty and theories that merely summarize experience if we wish. However, he urged that we should opt instead for theories that go beyond experience and try to say something informative about reality itself because this is how science makes progress (by competing as the best realistic interpretation of experience). In this respect, he was following Popper’s lead, reconstruing empiricism as a doctrine about the most desirable form for our theories, rather than as a view about the sources of knowledge.

“Problems of Empiricism” (1965) is a long paper that draws consequences of Feyerabend‘s methodological views for the nature of scientific progress. He emphasizes that he has been trying to “eliminate whatever remainder of an empirical ‘core’ may still be contained in Popper’s point of view” (p. 153). He envisions scientific progress as an ever-expanding ocean of alternatives (very much like Bohm), rejecting the standard view of scientific progress as converging on, or better approximating, an ideal point of view:

Knowledge so conceived is not a process that converges toward an ideal view; it is an ever increasing ocean of alternatives, each of them forcing the others into greater articulation, ail of them contributing, via this process of competition, to the development of our mental faculties (1965, pp. 224–225; 1981, p. 107).

From this perspective, the history of science becomes an inseparable part of science itself.

4.3 The Impact of the ‘Student Revolution’: The Mid to Late Sixties

In Alpbach in 1964, Feyerabend and Feigl jointly directed a seminar on the recent development of analytic philosophy. Feyerabend was still very much attached to scientific philosophy, and considered philosophy worthless unless it made a positive contribution to the growth of knowledge (which, of course, meant science) as he continued his crusades to disinfect contemporary empiricism and to chastise linguistic philosophy for entrenching meanings by merely analyzing them, instead of trying to improve them. The mid-to-late 1960s became a time of ferment in Western culture, and Feyerabend was in the thick of it. In Berkeley, naturally, he ran into the Free Speech Movement, and he encountered the “student revolution” there too, as well as in London and Berlin. This fired his interest in political philosophy, more especially in political questions about science. Of his post at Berkeley, he later said:

My function was to carry out the educational policies of the State of California which means I had to teach people what a small group of white intellectuals had decided was knowledge (1978, p. 118).

However, Feyerabend’s experience under these educational policies was undoubtedly one of the defining periods of his intellectual life, a time in which he became deeply suspicious of these intellectuals and “Western rationalism” as a whole:

In the years 1964ff. Mexicans, Blacks, Indians entered the university as a result of new educational policies. There they sat, partly curious, partly disdainful, partly simply confused hoping to get an “education”. What an opportunity for a prophet in search of a following! What an opportunity, my rationalist friends told me, to contribute to the spreading of reason and the improvement of mankind! I felt very differently. For it dawned on me that the intricate arguments and the wonderful stories I had so far told to my more or less sophisticated audience might just be dreams, reflections of the conceit of a small group who had succeeded in enslaving everyone else with their ideas. Who was I to tell these people what and how to think? (1978, p. 118. See also 1995, p. 123).

At this time, Feyerabend gave two lecture series, one on general philosophy, and one on philosophy of science. He seems to have got into some trouble at Berkeley by running his seminar on unacceptably loose lines, regularly canceling lectures, and failing to prepare for the lectures he did give:

I often told the students to go home—the official notes would contain everything they needed. As a result an audience of 300, 500, even 1,200 shrank to 50 or 30. I wasn’t happy about that; I would have preferred a larger audience, and yet I repeated my advice until the administration intervened. Why did I do it? Was it because I disliked the examination system, which blurred the line between thought and routine? Was it because I despised the idea that knowledge was a skill that had to be acquired and stabilized by rigorous training? Or was it because I didn’t think much of my own performance? All these factors may have played a role (p. 122).

But although he sympathized with the original aims of the student movement, Feyerabend was unimpressed by their leaders, feeling that their ideas were as authoritarian as those they were trying to replace. He reports having cut fewer lectures during the student strike than either before or afterward! Nevertheless, by holding his lectures off-campus during this campus war, Feyerabend antagonized the administration that had hired him. Reports of him giving “A” grades to every student in his class, regardless of their production (or lack of it), abound. He had the impression that some of his colleagues, especially John Searle, wanted to have him fired and that they only gave up when they realized how much paperwork would be involved (p. 126).

In Hamburg in 1965, a discussion on the foundations of quantum theory with the physicist C.F. von Weizsäcker belatedly set doubts in Feyerabend’s mind about the value of his normative approach to general methodology:

Von Weizsäcker showed how quantum mechanics arose from concrete research while I complained, on general methodological grounds, that important alternatives had been omitted. The arguments supporting my complaint were quite good… but it was suddenly clear to me that imposed without regard to circumstances they were a hindrance rather than a help: a person trying to solve a problem whether in science or elsewhere must be given complete freedom and cannot be restricted by any demands, norms, however plausible they may seem to the logician or the philosopher who has thought them out in the privacy of his study. Norms and demands must be checked by research, not by appeal to theories of rationality. In a lengthy article, I explained how Bohr had used this philosophy and how it differs from more abstract procedures. Thus Professor von Weizsäcker has prime responsibility for my change to “anarchism”—though he was not at all pleased when I told him so in 1977 (1978, p. 117).

During the summer of 1966, Feyerabend lectured on church dogma at Berkeley: “Why church dogma? Because the development of church dogma shares many features with the development of scientific thought” (pp. 137–138). He eventually turned these thoughts into a paper on “Classical Empiricism”, published in 1970, in which he argued that empiricism shared certain problematic features with Protestantism.

In London, lecturing at University College and the LSE, he met Imre Lakatos. The two became great friends, corresponding with one another regularly and voluminously until Lakatos’ death. Feyerabend recalls that Lakatos, whose office was across the corridor from the LSE lecture hall, used to intervene in his lectures when Feyerabend made a point he disagreed with (p. 128, 1978, p. 13). For his part, listening from the hallway to Lakatos lecture his students on Popper’s methodology in mid-December 1967, Feyerabend had an epiphany and ‘awoke’ from his ‘dogmatic slumber’ – he no longer considered himself to be a Popperian. He flew home and immediately announced his break from Popper’s school in two dramatic letters sent on the 17 of December, one to Lakatos and one to John Watkins that explain how his 1962 criticism of Popper’s empiricism had led to his new ‘position’ (in ‘scare quotes’ because his position is that he has no position). He immediately generalized from the limited validity of falsificationism to “anything goes” (the limited validity of all methodological rules) and he announced his plan to use the title “Against Method”, citing Susan Sontag’s Against Interpretation (1966). In this reversal on realism, together with his attempt to contribute to a positive model for the acquisition of knowledge, Feyerabend abandoned his recommendation that common knowledge should be corrected according to science. Instead, he began to argue that common knowledge should be protected from science. Decisions about ontological issues such as realism should be guided by the pursuit of happiness, not in support of some tyrannical truth.

Despite taking his academic duties and responsibilities decreasingly seriously, and coming into conflict with his own university’s administration as a result, Feyerabend had not yet fouled his substantial reputation as a serious philosopher of science. He reports that he received job offers from London, Berlin, Yale, and Auckland, that he was invited to become a fellow of All Souls College, Oxford, and that he corresponded with Friedrich von Hayek (whom he already knew from the Alpbach seminars) about a job in Freiburg (p. 127). He accepted the posts in London, Berlin, and Yale. In 1968, he resigned from UC Berkeley and left for Minneapolis, but grew homesick, got re-appointed, and returned to Berkeley almost immediately.

5. Feyerabend’s Later Work: Towards Relativism, but then Beyond It

5.1 Against Method (1970–1975)

After stints in London, Berlin, and Yale (all of them running alongside his post at UC Berkeley), Feyerabend took up a visiting professorship at the University of Auckland, New Zealand, and lectured there in 1972 and 1974 (pp. 134–5). He even considered settling down in New Zealand around that time (p. 153), although this hardly seems compatible with his jet-setting lifestyle.

In 1970, he published a long article entitled “Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge” in which he attacked several prominent accounts of scientific methodology. Originally, it was planned as a debate to be entitled For and Against Method, in which Lakatos would put forward the “rationalist” case that there was an identifiable set of rules of scientific method that make all good science, good science, and Feyerabend would attack it. Lakatos’ unexpected death in February 1974, which seems to have shocked Feyerabend deeply, put an end to his hope that Lakatos, who had backed out, would reconsider and contribute to the project.

Later that year, Feyerabend found himself lecturing at the University of Sussex:

I have no idea why and how I went to the University of Sussex at Brighton […] what I do remember is that I taught two terms (1974/1975) and then resigned; twelve hours a week (one lecture course, the rest tutorials) was too much (p. 153).

A member of Feyerabend’s audience recalls things in rather more detail:

Sussex University: the start of the Autumn Term, 1974. There was not a seat to be had in the biggest Arts lecture theatre on campus. Taut with anticipation, we waited expectantly and impatiently for the advertized event to begin. He was not on time—as usual. In fact rumour had it that he would not be appearing at all that illness (or was it just ennui? or perhaps a mistress?) had confined him to bed. But just as we began sadly to reconcile ourselves to the idea that there would be no performance that day at all, Paul Feyerabend burst through the door at the front of the packed hall. Rather pale, and supporting himself on a short metal crutch, he walked with a limp across to the blackboard. Removing his sweater he picked up the chalk and wrote down three questions one beneath the other: What’s so great about knowledge? What’s so great about science? What’s so great about truth? We were not going to be disappointed after all!

During the following weeks of that term, and for the rest of his year as a visiting lecturer, Feyerabend demolished virtually every traditional academic boundary. He held no idea and no person sacred. With unprecedented energy and enthusiasm he discussed anything from Aristotle to the Azande. How does science differ from witchcraft? Does it provide the only rational way of cognitively organizing our experience? What should we do if the pursuit of truth cripples our intellects and stunts our individuality? Suddenly epistemology became an exhilarating area of investigation.

Feyerabend created spaces in which people could breathe again. He demanded of philosophers that they be receptive to ideas from the most disparate and apparently far-flung domains, and insisted that only in this way could they understand the processes whereby knowledge grows. His listeners were enthralled, and he held his huge audiences until, too ill and too exhausted to continue, he simply began repeating himself. But not before he had brought the house down by writing “Aristotle” in three-foot high letters on the blackboard and then writing “Popper” in tiny, virtually illegible letters beneath it! (Krige 1980, pp. 106–107).

Given his poor health, Feyerabend tried many unorthodox approaches. He started seeing a healer who had been recommended to him. The treatment was successful, and thenceforth Feyerabend referred to his own case as an example of both the failures of orthodox medicine and the largely unexplored possibilities of “alternative” or traditional remedies.

Instead of a joint book with Lakatos, Feyerabend put together his tour de force, the book version of Against Method (1975), which he sometimes conceived of as a letter to Lakatos (to whom the book is dedicated). A more accurate description, however, is the one given in his autobiography:

AM is not a book, it is a collage. It contains descriptions, analyses, arguments that I had published, in almost the same words, ten, fifteen, even twenty years earlier […] I arranged them in a suitable order, added transitions, replaced moderate passages with more outrageous ones, and called the result “anarchism”. I loved to shock people (pp. 139, 142).

The book contained many of the ideas and arguments developed in his earlier works, augmented with a case study on the transition from geocentric to heliocentric astronomy. But whereas he had previously been trying to contribute to a positive model for the acquisition of knowledge (a pluralistic methodology), he now argued against all general methodological rules, having concluded that they all have only limited validity. General methodological principles do not guide actual research. Actual research determines the scientific method and whatever works, works – sometimes citing Einstein’s claim that a scientist “must appear to the systematic epistemologist as a type of unscrupulous opportunist” (Feyerabend 1975, p. 11).

Feyerabend emphasized that older scientific theories, like Aristotle’s theory of motion, had powerful empirical and argumentative support, and stressed, correlatively, that the heroes of the scientific revolution, such as Galileo, were not as scrupulous as they were sometimes represented to be. He portrayed Galileo as making full use of rhetoric, propaganda, and various epistemological tricks to support the heliocentric position. Feyerabend also sought further to downgrade the importance of empirical arguments by suggesting that aesthetic criteria, personal whims, and social factors have a far more decisive role in the history of science than rationalist or empiricist historiography would indicate.

Against Method explicitly drew the “epistemological anarchist” conclusion that there are no useful and exceptionless methodological rules governing the progress of science or the growth of knowledge. The history of science is so complex that if we insist on a general methodology that will not inhibit progress the only “rule” it will contain will be the useless suggestion: “Anything goes”. In particular, logical empiricism and Popper’s critical rationalism would inhibit scientific progress by imposing overly restrictive conditions on the legitimacy of new theories. The more sophisticated “methodology of scientific research programmes” developed by Lakatos either contains ungrounded value judgments about what constitutes good science, or it is reasonable only because it is epistemological anarchism in disguise. The phenomenon of methodological incommensurability renders the standards that these “rationalists” use for comparing theories inapplicable. The book thus (understandably) had Feyerabend branded an “irrationalist”. At a time when Kuhn was downplaying the perceived “irrationalist” implications of his work, Feyerabend was perceived to be casting himself in the role others already saw as his for the taking. He rejected political anarchism. His political philosophy was a mixture of liberalism and social democracy.

He later said:

One of my motives for writing Against Method was to free people from the tyranny of philosophical obfuscators and abstract concepts such as “truth”, “reality”, or “objectivity”, which narrow people’s vision and ways of being in the world. Formulating what I thought were my own attitude and convictions, I unfortunately ended up by introducing concepts of similar rigidity, such as “democracy”, “tradition”, or “relative truth”. Now that I am aware of it, I wonder how it happened. The urge to explain one’s own ideas, not simply, not in a story, but by means of a “systematic account”, is powerful indeed (pp. 179–180).

5.2 The Political Consequences of Epistemological Anarchism: Science in a Free Society (1978)

The critical reaction to Against Method seems to have taken Feyerabend by surprise. He was shocked to be accused of being aggressive and nasty, so he replied by accusing his accusers of the very same thing. He felt it necessary to respond to most of the book’s major reviews in print, and later assembled these replies into a section of his next book, Science in a Free Society (1978), entitled “Conversations with Illiterates”. Here he berated unfortunate reviewers for having misread Against Method, as well as for being constitutionally incapable of distinguishing between irony, playfulness, argument by reductio ad absurdum, and the (apparently rather few) things he had really committed himself to in AM. The spectacle of Feyerabend leveling these accusations at others is not itself without irony. (His widow reports that he did not want the book re-issued). In the commotion surrounding AM, Feyerabend succumbed to depression:

now I was alone, sick with some unknown affliction; my private life was in a mess, and I was without a defense. I often wished I had never written that fucking book (p. 147).

Feyerabend saw himself as having undermined the arguments for science’s privileged position within culture, and much of his later work was a critique of the position of science within Western societies. The results of science don’t prove its excellence, since these results have often depended on the presence of non-scientific elements. Science only prevails over other forms of knowledge because “the show has been rigged in its favour” (1978, p. 102), and other traditions, despite their achievements, have never been given a chance. The truth, he suggests, is that:

science is much closer to myth than a scientific philosophy is prepared to admit. It is one of the many forms of thought that have been developed by man, and not necessarily the best. It is conspicuous, noisy, and impudent, but it is inherently superior only for those who have already decided in favour of a certain ideology, or who have accepted it without ever having examined its advantages and its limits (1975, p. 295).

The separation of church and state should therefore be supplemented by the separation of science and state, for us to achieve the humanity we are capable of. Setting up the ideal of a free society as “a society in which all traditions have equal rights and equal access to the centers of power” (1978, p. 9), Feyerabend argues that science is a threat to democracy. To defend society against science we should place science under democratic control and be intensely skeptical about scientific “experts”, consulting them only if they are controlled democratically by juries of laypeople (on Feyerabend’s political philosophy, see Kidd 2016b).

5.3 Ten Wonderful Years: The Eighties in Berkeley and Zurich

Out of all Feyerabend’s many academic positions, perhaps the one he enjoyed most was his tenure throughout the 1980s at the Eidgenössische Technische Hochschule, Zurich. Feyerabend applied for the post after his friend Eric Jantsch had told him that the Polytechnic was looking for a philosopher of science. The selection process was, by Feyerabend’s account, very long and somewhat involved (pp. 154ff.). Having recently left another post in Kassel, he appears to have given up hopes of being hired by the Swiss, and so “decided to remain in Berkeley and stop moving about” (p. 158). But, after several stages in the decision-making procedure, he was finally given the job, and “ten wonderful years of half-Berkeley, half-Switzerland” (p. 158) turned out to be exactly what he had been looking for. At Zurich, he lectured on Plato’s Theaetetus and Timaeus, and then on Aristotle’s Physics. The two-hour seminars, many of which were organized by Christian Thomas (with whom Feyerabend was to edit anthologies) were run on the same lines as Berkeley: no set topic, but presentations by the participants (p. 160). Feyerabend later considered this to be the period in which he “got his intellectual act together” (p. 162), meaning that he recovered from the critical reactions to Against Method. However, this didn’t seem to have affected his attitude towards his institutional responsibilities: in Zurich, he refused offers of an office, because no office meant no office hours, and therefore no waste of time (pp. 131, 158).

Many of the more important papers Feyerabend published during the mid-1980s were collected together in Farewell to Reason (1987). The major message of this book is that recognizing some forms of relativism is part of the solution to the problems generated by conflicting beliefs and ways of life (for the various components of Feyerabend’s relativism, see Kusch 2016). Feyerabend suggests that the contemporary intellectual scene in Western culture is by no means as fragmented and cacophonous as many intellectuals would have us believe. The surface diversity belies a deeper uniformity, a monotony generated and sustained by the cultural and ideological imperialism that the West uses to beat its opponents into submission. Such uniformity, however, can be shown to be harmful even when judged by the standards of those who impose it. Cultural diversity, which already exists in some societies, is a good thing, not least because it affords the best defense against totalitarian domination.

Feyerabend proposed supporting the idea of cultural diversity both positively, by producing considerations in its favor, and negatively “by criticizing philosophies that oppose it” (1987, p. 5). Contemporary philosophies of the latter type are said to rest on the notions of Objectivity and Reason. He seeks to undermine the former notion by pointing out that confrontations between cultures with strongly held opinions about what is objectively true can go in different directions. The result of such confrontation may be the persistence of the old views, fruitful and mutual interaction, relativism, or argumentative evaluation. “Relativism” here means the decision to treat other people’s form of life, and the beliefs it embodies, as “true-for-them”, while treating our own views as “true-for-us”. Feyerabend feels that this is an appropriate way to resolve such a confrontation.

Feyerabend complains that the ideas of reason and rationality are “ambiguous and never clearly explained” (1987, p. 10); they are deified hangovers from autocratic times that no longer have any content, but whose “halo of excellence” (ibid.) clings to them and lends them spurious respectability:

[R]ationalism has no identifiable content and reason no recognizable agenda over and above the principles of the party that happens to have appropriated its name. All it does now is to lend class to the general drive towards monotony. It is time to disengage Reason from this drive and, as it has been thoroughly compromised by the association, to bid it farewell (1987, p. 13).

Relativism is the tool with which Feyerabend hopes to “undermine the very basis of Reason” (ibid.). But is it Reason with a capital “R”, the philosophers’ abstraction alone, that is to be renounced, or reason itself too? Feyerabend is on weak ground when he claims that “Reason” is a philosopher’s notion that has no content, for it is precisely the philosopher who is willing to attach a specific content to the formal notion of rationality (unlike the layperson, whose notion of reason is closer to what Feyerabend calls the “material” conception, where to be rational is “to avoid certain views and to accept others” (1987, p. 10).

Relativism is a result of cultural confrontation, an “attempt to make sense of the phenomenon of cultural variety” (1987, p. 19). Feyerabend is well aware that the term “relativism” itself is understood in many different ways. At some points, he merely endorses views that no one would deny, but which do not deserve to be called relativist (such as the idea that people may profit from studying other points of view, no matter how strongly they hold their own view (1987, p. 20). At others, he does manage to subscribe to a genuinely relativist view but fails to show why it must be accepted (for a detailed analysis of Feyerabend’s forms of relativism, see Kusch 2016).

It was only in 1988, on the 50th anniversary of Austria’s unification with Germany, that Feyerabend became interested in his past (p. 1). The Feyerabends left California for life in Switzerland and Italy in the fall of 1989 (p. 2). It was during this move that Feyerabend re-discovered his mother’s suicide note (p. 9), which may have been one of the factors that spurred him to write his autobiography (the Waldheim affair was another). Feyerabend looked forward to his retirement, and he and Grazia decided to try to have children. He claimed to have forgotten the thirty-five years of his academic career almost as quickly as he had earlier forgotten his military service (p. 168).

5.4 Feyerabend in the Nineties: “Potentially Every Culture is All Cultures” (1994)

In the early 1990s, Feyerabend truncated his Berkeley lecture into a series of five lectures entitled ‘What is knowledge? What is science?’. These were originally delivered to a general audience, but Feyerabend edited the lectures into a monograph, which was published as The Tyranny of Science (2011). The main themes of the book are as follows. Scientists and philosophers sometimes present science as a unified worldview, a monolith (or a monster, depending on one’s preferences). It is not. Science is both incomplete and quite strongly disunified. It does not speak with a single voice, therefore appeals to the abstraction ‘Science’ are out of place. The ideology known as objectivism, or scientific materialism, which takes science to be our ultimate measure of what exists, is therefore ungrounded. Its defenders, who portray themselves as the defenders of Reason, are often the kind of intellectual imperialists whose attitudes and advice in the past led, or would have led, to the destruction of first-nation communities.

Other equally popular philosophical claims about science are also flawed. The idea that science is successful needs interrogation. Science does have some successes, but these can be detached from the ideology that seems to support them. The idea that science starts from facts, and eschews theories until the facts are gathered, is a myth. The same can be said of the idea that science is value-free, and also of the idea that scientific results are relevant to our most urgent social problems.

One aspect of the disunity of science is that ‘scientists’ should not mean merely theoreticians: science also (and essentially) features experimentalists. In their work, the importance of hands-on experience, and of what Michael Polanyi called ‘tacit knowledge’, is most obvious. But in fact, these sorts of experiences and knowledge play an important role throughout the sciences, even in their most obviously theoretical parts. The Platonic-rationalist picture of science as pure thinking about the nature of reality is a distortion.

One of Feyerabend’s central complaints is that a particular abstract, theoretical, ‘objectivist’ kind of science, together with an associated kind of thinking about science, now dominates our thinking, and thereby excludes more human modes of thought. Scientism, the belief that science has the answer to all meaningful questions, is also a main target (on Feyerabend and scientism, see Kidd 2021). Feyerabend’s typical strategy is to take some hallowed idea (e.g., that the success of science is due to observation and experiment), and ask: how did it arise? Tracing its ancestry back to ancient Greek thinkers (usually Plato, Parmenides, or Xenophanes), he assesses their arguments for it and finds them eminently resistible. His complaint is not that their arguments are invalid, though—that would be already to take on a quasi-scientific mode of assessment. Instead, Feyerabend makes it clear that he prefers ‘stories’ (or even ‘fairytales’) to arguments, and that rival stories are to be assessed in terms of how interesting, appealing, or revealing they are. The sorts of stories the ancient Greek tragedians told, being more obviously human, fare better on such measures than those of the ancient Greek philosophers, so we should not assume that philosophers are our best guides in such matters.

Feyerabend continued his investigation of “The Rise of Western Rationalism”. He tried to show that Reason (with a capital “R”) and Science had displaced the binding principles of previous worldviews not as the result of having won an argument, but as the result of power-play. While the first philosophers (the pre-Socratic thinkers) had interesting views, their attempt to replace, streamline, or rationalize the folk wisdom that surrounded them was eminently resistible. Their introduction of the appearance/reality dichotomy made nonsense of many of the things people had previously known. Even nowadays, indigenous cultures and counter-cultural practices provide alternatives to Reason and an imperialistic Western science.

In most of his work after Against Method, Feyerabend emphasized the “disunity of science”. Science, he insists, is a collage, not a system or a unified project. Not only does it include plenty of components derived from distinctly “non-scientific” disciplines, but these components are often vital parts of the “progress” science has made (using whatever criterion of progress you prefer). Science is a collection of theories, practices, research traditions, and worldviews whose range of applications is not well-determined and whose merits vary to a great extent. All this can be summed up in his slogan: “Science is not one thing, it is many.”

Likewise, in Conquest of Abundance, the supposed ontological correlate of science, “the world”, consists not only of one kind of thing but of countless kinds of things, things which cannot be “reduced” to one another. There is no good reason to suppose that the world has a single, determinate nature. Rather we inquirers construct the world in the course of our inquiries, and the plurality of our inquiries ensures that the world itself has a deeply plural quality: the Homeric gods and the microphysicist’s subatomic particles are simply different ways in which “Being” responds to (different kinds of) inquiry. How the world is “in-itself” is forever unknowable. In this respect, Feyerabend’s work can be thought of as aligned with social constructivism.

Feyerabend also published a surprisingly large number of little reviews and papers in the 1990s (although many of them are very short, with overlapping content). Several appeared in a new journal, Common Knowledge, in whose inauguration he had a hand, and which set out to integrate insights from all parts of the intellectual landscape. Although these papers were on scattered subjects, there are some strong themes running through them, several of which bear comparison with what gets called “post-modernism” (see Preston 1998). Often, they have provocative titles, such as “Atoms and Consciousness” (1992a), “Nature as a Work of Art: A Fictitious Lecture Delivered to a Conference Trying to Establish the Increasing Importance of Aesthetics for Our Age” (1992b), and “Potentially Every Culture is All Cultures” (1994). They take “Ethics as a Measure of Scientific Truth” (1992c).

6. Conclusion: Last Things

A remarkable feature of Feyerabend’s philosophical development is how directly connected it was to the tumultuous times through which he lived – from logical positivism to post-modernism. He was occupied with his autobiography right up until his death on February 11th, 1994, at the Genolier Clinic, overlooking Lake Geneva. At the end of the book, he expressed the wish that what should remain of him would be “not papers, not final declarations, but love” (p. 181). A third volume of his Philosophical Papers appeared in 1999, as did The Conquest of Abundance, the final unfinished book he had also been working on. In 2009, his long-lost, Naturphilosphie was published (in English The Philosophy of Nature, 2016), which was written in the early to mid-1970s as a companion to Against Method, followed by his 1992 Trentino lecture series that he had edited into book form as The Tyranny of Science in 2011. A fourth volume of his Collected Papers, Philosophy and Physics was published in 2016. The first volume of his collected correspondence, Feyerabend’s Formative Years (Feyerabend and Popper. Correspondence and Unpublished Papers), was published in 2020. The second volume (Feyerabend on Logical Empiricism, Bohm and Kuhn) was published in 2024.

Feyerabend came to be seen as a leading cultural relativist, not just because he stressed that some theories and worldviews are incommensurable, but also because he defended a form of relativism in politics as well as in epistemology. From the mid-1970s to the first half of the 1990s, his denunciations of Western imperialism, his critique of scientism, his defense of the pursuit of alternative medicine, astrology, and voodoo, and his emphasis on environmental issues made him a hero of anti-technological countercultures.

Different components and phases of Feyerabend’s work have influenced very different groups of thinkers. His early scientific realism, contextual theory of meaning, and the way he proposed to defend materialism were taken up by Paul and Patricia Churchland. Richard Rorty, for a time, also endorsed eliminative materialism. Feyerabend’s critique of reductionism has influenced philosophers of science such as Cliff Hooker, Bas van Fraassen, and John Dupré, and his general point of view has been popularized by Alan Chalmers’ well-known introduction to philosophy of science What Is This Thing Called Science? (1978). Feyerabend has also had considerable influence within sociology, where many of what were once taken to be controversial views have become commonplace. While he has directly inspired books like D.L. Phillips’s Abandoning Method (1973), which attempts to transcend methodology, less directly, he has exerted enormous influence on a generation of sociologists of science through his relativism, social constructivism, and apparent irrationalism, according to which social history is a series of accidents, not something governed by laws or even teleological (directed at some pre-established goal). It is still far too early to say whether, and in what way, his philosophy will be remembered.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

Works by Paul Feyerabend

Books
  • 1975, Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge, London: New Left Books. Second revised and enlarged edition 1988. Third revised and enlarged edition 1993.
  • 1978, Science in a Free Society, New Left Books: London.
  • 1981, Realism, Rationalism and Scientific Method: Philosophical Papers, Volume 1, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1981, Problems of Empiricism. Philosophical Papers, Volume 2, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1984, Wissenschaft als Kunst [Science as An Art], Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Verlag.
  • 1987, Farewell to Reason, London: New Left Books.
  • 1991, Three Dialogues on Knowledge, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
  • 1995, Killing Time: The Autobiography of Paul Feyerabend, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1999, Conquest of Abundance: A Tale of Abstraction Versus the Richness of Being, B. Terpstra (ed.), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1999, Knowledge, Science and Relativism. Philosophical Papers, Volume 3, edited J. Preston (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 2009, Naturphilosophie, H. Heit & E. Oberheim (eds.), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Verlag, 2009. English Translation, 2016, The Philosophy of Nature, H. Heit & E. Oberheim (eds.), New Jersey: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • 2011, The Tyranny of Science, E. Oberheim (ed.), Cambridge: Polity Press.
  • 2016, Physics and Philosophy. Philosophical Papers, Volume 4, S. Gattei & J. Agassi (eds.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Papers and Shorter Works
  • Feyerabend, P., 1955, Review of Wittgenstein 1953, The Philosophical Review, 64: 449–483.
  • –––, “A Note on the Paradox of Analysis”, Philosophical Studies, 7: 92–96.
  • –––, “Eine Bemerkung zum Neumannschen Beweis”, Zeitschrift für Physik, 145: 421–423.
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  • –––, 1962a, “Explanation, Reduction and Empiricism” in Scientific Explanation, Space and Time, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. III, H. Feigl and G. Maxwell (eds.), University of Minnesota Press: Minneapolis, pp. 28–97.
  • –––, 1962b, “Problems of Microphysics”, in R. Colodny (ed.), Frontiers of Science and Philosophy, Pittsburgh: The University of Pittsburgh Press, pp. 189–283.
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  • –––, 1963b, “Mental Events and the Brain”, The Journal of Philosophy, 60: 11, 295–296.
  • –––, 1963c, “Materialism and the Mind-Body Problem”, The Review of Metaphysics, 17: 49–66.
  • –––, 1964, “Realism and Instrumentalism: Comments on the Logic of Factual Support”, in M. Bunge (ed.), The Critical Approach to Science and Philosophy: In Honor of Karl R. Popper, London: The Free Press of Glencoe, pp. 280–308.
  • –––, 1966a, “Herbert Feigl: A Biographical Sketch”, in P. Feyerabend & G. Maxwell (eds.), Mind, Matter, and Method: Essays in Philosophy and Science in Honor of Herbert Feigl, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, pp. 3–13.
  • –––, 1966b, “Dialectical Materialism and the Quantum Theory”, Slavic Review, 25: 414–417.
  • –––, 1969, “Linguistic Arguments and Scientific Method”, Telos, 3: 43–63.
  • –––, 1970, “Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge”, in M. Radner & S. Winokur (eds.), 1970, pp. 17–130.
  • –––, 1991, “Concluding Unphilosophical Conversation”, in G. Munévar (ed.), Beyond Reason: Essays on the Philosophy of Paul Feyerabend, Dordrecht: Kluwer, pp. 487–527.
  • –––, 1992a, “Atoms and Consciousness”, Common Knowledge, 1: 28–32.
  • –––, 1992b, “Nature as a Work of Art: A Fictitious Lecture Delivered to a Conference Trying to Establish the Increasing Importance of Aesthetics for Our Age”, Common Knowledge, 1: 3–9.
  • –––, 1992c, “Ethics as a Measure of Scientific Truth”, in W. R. Shea & A. Spadafora (eds.), From the Twilight of Probability: Ethics and Politics, Canton (MA): Science History Publications, pp. 106–114.
  • –––, 1994, “Potentially Every Culture is All Cultures”, Common Knowledge, 3: 16–22.

Audio and Video Recordings

Links to the audio recordings can be found at PKF Centennial 2024.

Secondary Sources

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  • –––, 1968, Concepts of Science, Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • Agassi, J., 1976, Review of Against Method, Philosophia, 6: 165–177.
  • –––, 2002, “A Touch of Malice” (Review of M. Motterlini (ed.) 1999), Philosophy of the Social Sciences, 32: 107–119.
  • Alford, C., 1985, “Yates on Feyerabend’s Democratic Relativism”, Inquiry, 28: 113–118.
  • Andersson, G., 1994, Criticism and the History of Science: Kuhn’s, Lakatos’s and Feyerabend’s Criticisms of Critical Rationalism, Leiden: Brill.
  • Athanasopoulos, C., 1994, “Pyrrhonism and Paul Feyerabend: A Study of Ancient and Modern Scepticism”, in Hellenistic Philosophy (Volume 2), K. Boudouris (ed.), Athens: International Center for Greek Philosophy and Culture, pp. 11–29.
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  • Ben-Israel, I., 1986, “Philosophy and Methodology of Military Intelligence: Correspondence with Paul Feyerabend”, Philosophia, 28: 71–101.
  • Bernstein, R., 1983, Beyond Objectivism and Relativism, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
  • Bhaskar, R., 1975, “Feyerabend and Bachelard: Two Philosophies of Science”, New Left Review, 94: 31–55.
  • Brown, H., 1976, “Reduction and Scientific Revolutions”, Erkenntnis, 10: 81–385.
  • –––, 1983, “Incommensurability”, Inquiry, 26: 3–29.
  • Brown, M., 2009, “Models and Perspectives on Stage: Remarks on Giere’s Scientific Perspectivism”, Studies in History and Philosophy of Science, Part A, 40: 213–220.
  • –––, 2016, “The Abundant World: Paul Feyerabend’s Metaphysics of Science”, Studies in History and Philosophy of Science (Part A), 57: 142–154.
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  • –––, 1978, What is This Thing Called Science, Milton Keynes: Open University Press.
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  • –––, 1981, “Eliminative Materialism and the Propositional Attitudes”, Journal of Philosophy, 78: 67–90.
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  • –––, 2022, “Ehrenhaft’s Experiments on Magnetic Monopoles: Reconsidering the Feyerabend-Ehrenhaft Connection”, International Studies in the Philosophy of Science, 35: 69–94.
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  • ––– (eds.), 2020, Feyerabend’s Formative Years (Volume 1: Feyerabend and Popper. Correspondence and Unpublished Papers), Cham: Springer.
  • –––, 2024, “Introduction”, in M. Collodel & E. Oberheim (eds.), Feyerabend’s Formative Years  (Volume 2: Feyerabend on Logical Empiricism, Bohm and Kuhn. Correspondence and Unpublished Papers), Cham: Springer, pp. 1–16.
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  • Couvalis, S., 1986, “Should Philosophers Become Playwrights?”, Inquiry, 29: 451–457.
  • –––, 1987, “Feyerabend’s Epistemology and Brecht’s Theory of the Drama”, Philosophy and Literature, 11: 117–123.
  • –––, 1988a, “Feyerabend, Ionesco, and the Philosophy of the Drama”, Critical Philosophy, 4: 51–68.
  • –––, 1988b, “Feyerabend and Laymon on Brownian Motion”, Philosophy of Science, 55: 415–421.
  • –––, 1989, Feyerabend’s Critique of Foundationalism, Aldershot: Avebury Press.
  • –––, 2001, “Recent Feyerabendiana”, Metascience, 10: 39–49.
  • Davidson, D., 1973, “On the Very Idea of a Conceptual Scheme”, Proceedings of the American Philosophical Association, 47: 5–20.
  • Devitt, M., 1979, “Against Incommensurability”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 57: 29–50.
  • Dürr, H-P. (ed.), 1980, Versuchungen: Aufsätze zur Philosophie Paul Feyerabend’s, Erster Band, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp.
  • ––– (ed.), 1981, Versuchungen: Aufsätze zur Philosophie Paul Feyerabend’s, Zweiter Band, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp.
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