Supplement to Martin Heidegger
Heidegger and the Other Beginning (Dwelling and the Fourfold)
Much of Heidegger’s later work is concerned with “overcoming metaphysics” and “the need to prepare for an other beginning” (GA65: 504). A ‘metaphysic’ for Heidegger is a universal and all-encompassing ontological style. It determines how entities show up, and how human beings understand themselves and define their aims. Heidegger argued that history could best be understood as a succession of metaphysical worlds, culminating in the current technological age where everything shows up as a resource to be optimized. Heidegger was particularly concerned with finding a way beyond the pathological nihilism of the technological age.
The “other beginning” that Heidegger envisioned moves beyond metaphysics by retrieving possible modes of thinking and possible modes of human existence that were opened up in early Greek thought, but eclipsed by the development of western metaphysics. With this other beginning, Heidegger thought, we could grasp more clearly our true dignity as human beings: to be preservers and guardians of the disclosure of being. Heidegger’s effort to prepare for the overcoming of metaphysics thus involved the articulation of an ethos rooted in our relationship to being. To be human, Heidegger argues, is (1) to play a role in disclosing being, (2) to be capable of a plurality of different forms of life (i.e., understandings of being), and (3) to be a “dweller”—that is, to be defined by our particular relations to the entities that emerge in the local places we help disclose. Heidegger’s later work on human dwelling is an attempt to articulate a form of existence in which we move beyond metaphysics to realize “the dignity of responsibility” (GA73.1: 854)—responsibility, that is, for disclosing our local world and embracing the fundamental pluralism of human existence.
1. The Other Beginning
Given that the “other beginning” is an as-yet-unrealized event, it is not surprising that Heidegger’s description of the transition to the “other” beginning is lacking in detail. “The transition”, Backman notes,
is a multi-faceted process that Heidegger never exhaustively systematized. Heidegger is mostly content with tentatively pointing out individual aspects of the transition. (Backman 2020: 191)
The few commentators who address Heidegger’s account of the other beginning focus on different aspects of that account. Backman, for instance, focuses on
the move from the Aristotelian-scholastic understanding of the transcendental universality of being to a postmetaphysical perspective on the singularity of being, or rather on being as singularization—as a spatiotemporal instantiation that is never “the same” in two different instants but rather renders every instance of being intelligible as a unique constellation of meaningful presence. (Backman 2020: 191–2)
Polt likewise emphasizes the recognition of ontological singularity as a feature of the other beginning:
[i]n the metaphysical tradition, beingness is a pale universal; but in the other beginning each happening of be-ing is richly unique. (Polt 2001: 94)
Thomson takes a core feature of thinking in the other beginning to be an attunement to the historicality of being. Thomson thus defines the other beginning as
the reintroduction of being as such into history, eclipsed and forgotten since its metaphysical reduction to the being of entities in the “first beginning” of the West. (Thomson 2011a: 188; see also Ruin 2005: 370)
This emphasis on the historical is in line with Heidegger’s oft-expressed view that
the other beginning is only possible on the basis of the most intrinsically historical thinking…. The most mysterious ground for asking the question of being as a historical question, lies in the fact that being is now to be experienced and grounded in terms of (adaptation) as that which is most singular and most nonrepeatable. (GA94: 270)
Fell and Malpas emphasize the “placed” or locally situated character of thinking in the other beginning:
the proper future of ontology is not an advance to something essentially new but a remembering of the event of the place in which things have always appeared and can appear. (Fell 1979, 266; compare Malpas 2016: 170ff.)
Polt has argued that, at least during his entanglement with National Socialism, Heidegger’s thought on the other beginning had a decidedly political (and nationalistic) cast. For Heidegger in this period, Polt claims, the other beginning involved a
rejection of the universalism, the egalitarianism, and the idealism that he sees as rooted in the thinking inaugurated by Plato, adopted into the Judeo-Christian tradition, and culminating in the secular liberalism of the Enlightenment and the radical socialism of Marx. For Heidegger, this means resolutely belonging to a particular place, a particular time, and a particular people with its particular destiny. It means embracing the radical finitude of being human and a radical boundedness to human community. It means polemos as Aus-einander-setzung: setting oneself out and apart from other peoples in confrontation, the self-assertion (Selbstbehauptung) of a people as distinct, separate, and incommensurable with other peoples. It means the end of humanist universalism, human rights, and respect for persons as created in the image of God (or secularized correlates, such as Kant’s respect for persons as ends in themselves). (Polt 2020: 11–12)
Ruin, however, notes that Heidegger is “evasive as to the more concrete effects of this transformation. No specific politics or ethics, no specific institutions, religions, or works are anticipated” (Ruin 2005: 371).
“The first step of the preparation” for the other beginning, Heidegger explained, “is the ‘overcoming’ of metaphysics” (GA96: 137). Consequently, we can think of the other beginning as involving the undoing of the features that Heidegger identifies as characteristic of metaphysics (see main Heidegger entry section 5.1).
For instance, Heidegger takes it as a definitive feature of a metaphysical age that it tends toward a universal and all-encompassing style of being. Despite the apparently endless (ontic) variety of commodities offered to us in the technological age, Heidegger maintains that the technological world is driving toward ontological uniformity and sameness because it reduces everything to a resource.[102] But “from the other beginning on”, Heidegger claims, “that unshaken and never questioned determination of being—unity—can and must become something questionable” (GA65: 460). In the other beginning, there will be no new world-historical epochs—the technological understanding of being will be the last unified and all-encompassing ontological style. Instead, each locality will have a “distinctive character”, as each one “gathers together in its own way the people who dwell there, and shapes and attunes them in their actions and omissions, their poetry and thinking” (GA16: 731). As Zimmerman explains, “such a world would be intrinsically ‘local’, bound up with place in a way wholly foreign to the planetary reach of modern technology” (Zimmerman 1990: 151). Wrathall and Lambeth point out that, in this respect, the other beginning will be similar to the pluralism that characterized the polytheism of ancient Greece (Wrathall & Lambeth 2011: 180). But, unlike the polytheistic Greeks, Fell notes, humans in the new beginning will recognize themselves as participants “in the creative Play (Geviertspiel) by which all beings come into presence” (Fell 1971: 215).[103]
Where the metaphysics of the first beginning thinks being on the basis of entities—it abstracts a conception of being from occurrent entities—the other beginning inquires “in terms of beyng itself, and no longer about entities and in terms of entities” (GA74: 8). This allows thinking in the other beginning to recognize the priority that beyng has over entities:
in metaphysics, entities were determined by a ground (a cause—a condition for explanatory representing). In the history of the other beginning, beyng itself first determines the essence of the ground. (GA66: 275)
“In the first beginning”, Heidegger notes, “only presencing was held firm as a comprehensible standard for all interpretation of entities” (GA65: 260–1). With the overcoming of metaphysics in the other beginning, thinking will attend to the interplay of presence and absence:
one day, thought will not recoil from the question whether the clearing … is not that within which alone … everything presencing and absencing has the sheltering place that gathers everything together. (GA14: 81 / OTB 66)
Where metaphysical thought thinks of entities as objectively fixed and stable, in the other beginning we think again of essences as something that have to come about. Thus, Heidegger explains, “from the first beginning”, the “guiding question of western ‘metaphysics’” is the question: “what is the being?” (GA65: 179). “The question of the other beginning (the genuinely basic-question) is: ‘How does being essence?’ ‘What is the truth [i.e., unconcealment] of being?’” (GA66: 274).
But the question ‘How does being essence?’, Heidegger insists, cannot be separated from the question ‘Who are we?’ (GA65: 54). And in fact, a constant feature of Heidegger’s description of the other beginning is an emphasis on the new and essential relationship between human beings and being. Ruin notes: “the question of Dasein is, as [Heidegger] says at one point, the very ‘crisis’ between the first and other beginning”—the crisis turning on a “transfigured conception of man” (Ruin 2005: 367).
It is thus no surprise that Heidegger places a transformation of human existence at the heart of the other beginning. After all, a key aspect of Heidegger’s critique of metaphysics is his claim that metaphysics obscures the essential relationship between being and human beings. As being withdraws and is forgotten, we humans lose sight of our role in the unconcealment of being. Entities show up as simply and necessarily being what they are. And with that, we lose sight of our true dignity as human beings—to be disclosers of being, or to “guard over the truth of being” so that “entities appear in the light of being as the entities that they are” (GA9: 330 / P 251–2; see also GA71: 201):
In our retrospective sketch of the beginning of Western thought, we said that the human being is in the beginning determined to be the preserver of the unconcealment of entities. In the departure away from that beginning, the human being became the animal rationale. In the transition from the first end of Western thought to the other beginning, the question of who we are must be asked with an even greater urgency…. This question will point in the direction of the possibility that the human being is not only the preserver of the unconcealed entities, but rather is the guardian of the openness of beyng. (GA45: 189–90)[104]
Thus, Heidegger’s hope for an “other” beginning is the hope for a new ethos—a non-metaphysical form of life that involves taking a stand in our respective locales, and taking up our vocation as disclosers of that local world.
Much of Heidegger’s later work is aimed at preparing for this new ethos of rootedness by articulating his account of what a changed human essence would look like. The consummate form of human existence, Heidegger argues, involves (1) playing a role in disclosing being, (2) being capable of a plurality of different forms of life (i.e., understandings of being), and (3) being a “dweller”—that is, living in a way that gets its meaning and importance from our particular relations to the entities that show up in the places we help disclose. Heidegger’s later work on human dwelling is an attempt to articulate a form of existence in which we move beyond metaphysics to realize “the dignity of responsibility” (GA73.1: 854)—responsibility, that is, for disclosing our local world and embracing the fundamental pluralism of human existence.
2. Human being as a discloser of being
The history of metaphysics, Heidegger notes, has presented us with a sequence of quite distinct historical “interpretations” or “determinations” of the essence of human being, each of which corresponds to the prevailing style of being of the age. In the philosophical Greek world, to be human was to be a zōon logon echōn—a “living being capable of discourse” (GA20: 365). In the Roman world, to be human is to be an animal rationale, “a living being with reason” (GA29/30: 442). In the Christian world, to be human is to be (like all other entities except God himself), an ens creatum, a created entity. But the human being is a special creature—“the creature formed last”, the “crown of creation”, the “pilgrim on earth” with an immortal soul (GA54: 228; GA66: 141) In the modern epoch, as evidenced in Descartes’ work, the human being becomes a subject. Heidegger describes various different facets of the modern experience of humans as subjects. In Kant, for example, the subject is a person:
This makes man not just a rational being but a being capable of accountability…. The essence of person, the personality, consists in self-responsibility. Kant expressly emphasizes that the definition of man as rational animal does not suffice, for a being can be rational without being capable of acting on behalf of itself, of being practical for itself. (GA31: 180)
Other modern and late modern variants of the human being as a subject include
the human being that understands itself as a nation, that wills itself as a people, that breeds itself as a race, and that ultimately empowers itself to become the lord of the earth.[105]
The human being in Jünger’s late modernist / early technological thought is not a rational animal, but a “laboring animal”, a participant in “the unconditional objectification of everything present which comes into its essence in the will to will” (GA7: 68 / EP 85). Finally, in the full-blown technological epoch, human subjectivity is no longer seen as our essential character. Increasingly, the human essence is to be a resource like any other, a “stock piece in the inventory” (GA79: 44), distinguishable from other entities only insofar as it is the “functionary of technology” (GA5: 294).
Heidegger believes that if we attend to the part humans play in securing each of these historical understandings of being, however, we can discover a trans-historical essence to human being. To be a human being in the consummate sense, Heidegger concludes, is to be “a constant receiver of the endowment” of an understanding of being (GA14: 16 / OTB 12). And “the human being”, Heidegger insists, finds its “unique dignity in becoming the preserver of the truth of beyng” (GA55: 387; see also GA66: 269 and GA9: 330 / P 251). To capture this picture of the human essence, Dreyfus coins the phrase “world discloser”:
According to Heidegger our nature is to be world disclosers. That is, by means of our equipment and coordinated practices we human beings open coherent, distinct contexts or worlds in which we perceive, act, and think. Each such world makes possible a distinct and pervasive way in which things, people, and selves can appear and in which certain ways of acting make sense. (Dreyfus & Spinosa 1997 [2017: 198–9])
In his later thought, Heidegger tries to walk a fine line between idealism and realism by holding that being is not dependent on us, even though it needs us. “Being needs human beings” (See, e.g., GA5: 373 / OTBT 281; GA11: 116 / QCT 38; GA79: 69; GA50: 156), because it is only when human beings are disposed in a way appropriate to the emerging style of being, and are moved by a “claim” or “call” to develop practices and institutions appropriate to that style of being, that a new understanding of being can come to prevail. But being is not something we can control: “The human being is not the lord of entities; the human being is the shepherd of being” (GA9: 342). We allow being to be manifest and, when being is manifest, entities show up as what they really are: we “guard the truth of being, in order that “entities might appear in the light of being as the beings they are (GA9: 330 / P 252).
3. Dwelling
Heidegger’s account of the ethos of the new beginning is most fully developed in his essays on dwelling and the fourfold. While Heidegger does not explicitly connect dwelling and the fourfold to the other beginning, he is very clear about the fact that learning to dwell poetically in the fourfold will take us on “the path that leads us back into the locality where we can get over metaphysics, and thereby lets us journey through what is destined in an overcoming of nihilism” (GA9: 423).[106] Thus, Fell is right to emphasize that in the other beginning, part of what is recovered is an early sense of human beings “as only one member of a fourfold, each of whose members participated in the creative Play (Geviertspiel) by which all beings come into presence” (Fell 1971: 215).
As Jeff Malpas develops in convincing detail, Heidegger insists that human being is “intimately tied to place” (Malpas 2012: 67). Already in Being and Time, Heidegger had emphasized that human beings are essentially being-in-the-world, and that means that we only are who we are because we are involved with our world. In his later work, this thought develops into the claim that “dwelling is the essence of ‘being-in-the-world’” (GA9: 358). Or, as Heidegger puts it elsewhere, dwelling is “the basic character of human existence [Dasein]” (GA7: 183 / PLT 213).
But what does it mean to dwell?
According to Young, to dwell is to be “at home” in a “homeland” (Heimat). For Young, this means that there is a marked contrast between early Heidegger’s account of being-in-the-world, and his later account of dwelling. In Being and Time, Young explains, human beings are essentially “uncanny”, which means, they are essentially “not-at-home” (SZ 188). By contrast, Young argues, “[f]or later Heidegger, human beings are essentially dwellers” (Young 2021: 256).
This distinction between early and late views, however, is complicated by the fact that Heidegger’s conception of what it means to be at home changes. In Being and Time, to be at home would mean wholly to eliminate uncanniness, which would amount to finding a uniquely correct and objectively binding interpretation of how to be human. In Heidegger’s later work, by contrast, to be at home means to dwell in “the nearness to being” (GA9: 358). This is something that we do, precisely by being open to a plurality of different ways to be. This would suggest that dwelling is compatible with uncanniness. “In the work of building and saying and creating”, Heidegger says, “a people establishes its historical dwelling—becoming at home in entities in order to take seriously the uncanniness of beyng” (GA80.2: 576). Or elsewhere, he notes that “dwelling arises from becoming at home in being uncanny” (GA53: 173).
Malpas thus argues that a “homeland” could be found in any and all locales[107]:
The “homecoming” of which Heidegger speaks is a return to the nearness of being. That nearness is not a matter of coming into the vicinity of some single, unique place, but rather of coming to recognize the placed character of being as such. Such a recognition is always articulated in and through the particular places in which we already find ourselves, and no one such place can have any priority here. Moreover, in this return to place, we are also returned to the essential questionability of being. (Malpas 2006: 309)
To dwell in Heidegger’s specific sense, then, involves being shaped or “conditioned” (bedingt) by the place in which we live: “the essence of dwelling”, Heidegger explains, “is defined by the place to which the dwelling is allocated” (GA80.2: 1067). At the same time, as Thomson notes, poetic dwelling involves “a poetic sensitivity and openness to other possible meanings” (Thomson 2011a: 87 n. 31).
From the fact that “[t]o be a human being …. means to dwell” (GA7: 149 / PLT 145), it does not follow that all humans are always dwelling well. As Edwards notes, on Heidegger’s account of dwelling as the essence of human being, “one can dwell by explicitly refusing to dwell, one can also dwell in disabling ignorance of what one’s proper dwelling is” (J. Edwards 2005: 456). And, in fact, ignorance of our proper dwelling is, according to Heidegger, the normal human condition:
the authentic plight of dwelling lies in the fact, that mortals always again and again are searching for the essence of dwelling, that they first have to learn how to dwell. (GA7: 163 / PLT 159)
Nevertheless, dwelling in a heightened sense is for Heidegger the consummate form of human life, and as such it is the basis both for his critique of the technological age, and his antidote to the pathologies of that age. Heidegger calls this heightened form of dwelling “poetic dwelling”.
Heidegger distinguishes between poetry in a “narrower” and in a “broader” sense (see, e.g., GA5: 62 / OBT 46 / PLT 72; see also supplemental section on Heidegger on Language and Poetry). In the narrower sense, poetry is a linguistic work of art or “poesy” (Poesie). Poetry in the broader sense is “that happening in which entities are first disclosed as entities for human beings” (see, e.g., GA5: 62 / OBT 46 / PLT 72). Such poetry “invites things to matter to human being as things” (GA12: 19 / PLT 197). Not all poesy is poetry in this broader sense—there are things we describe as poems that play no significant role in drawing our attention to the ontological structure of things.
It is poetry in the broader sense that is at stake when Heidegger develops his ethos of “living poetically”. Thus, living or dwelling poetically is not a matter of drafting metrical compositions. Rather, poetic dwelling “is a kind of building” (GA7: 183 / PLT 213)—it brings into existence a meaningful order, creating the things that sustain a meaningful form of life.
Poetic dwellers live in a way that is attuned to what really matters given their form of life. They let a sense for the sacred or the “shining” shape their day-to-day activities:
The human being who dwells poetically brings everything that shines—earth and heaven and the holy—into the all-preserving illumination that stands on its own, and brings it, in the form of the work, to a secure stand. (GA4: 162)
In securing the “shining” exemplary aspects of our life, we are in a position “take the measure” of the situations we encounter and the deeds we perform: “the taking of measure is what is poetic in dwelling. Poetry is a measuring” (GA7: 190 / PLT 219). It is a measure-taking because it evaluates life in terms of an insight into what really matters. It is a measure-taking because it is essentially receptive, responding to the features that are definitive of one’s locale. To dwell well is to recognize that, as Young explains,
our world is not a human achievement but is rather “gifted” to us in the “adaptation” (Ereignis) of beyng….In a state of spiritual health, we experience a deep and festive “gratitude” (das Danken, GA52:197) for the “favour” (Gunst) that has been bestowed on us (GA9:310 / P 236), for “the wonder that around us a world worlds, that there is something rather than nothing, that there are things and we ourselves are in their midst” (GA52:64). (Young 2021: 257)
Poetic dwelling thus means being at home in a place because we recognize and care about what is essential to the unique and distinctive place that it is. But this recognition brings with it an obligation to act to establish and protect the place. Heidegger calls such action ‘conserving’ (Schonen):
Conserving does not itself consist only in the fact that we do not harm that which is conserved. Authentic conserving is something positive and takes place when we leave something beforehand in its own essence, when we specifically bring something back into its essence, when we free it in the proper sense of bringing it into a peaceful open place…. The fundamental character of dwelling is this conserving. (GA7: 150 / PLT 147)
Conserving involves playing an active role in creating and preserving the infrastructure that sustains a particular form of life.[108] To dwell well, then, requires an activity of building—“erecting the edifices”, “cultivating the growing things”, and “producing the tools” that safeguard and sustain the character of the place (GA7: 195 / PLT 215). “Of course”, Young observed,
as human beings we must and should make changes to our environment. But such changes will have the character, not of violation, but rather ‘bringing forth’ (poiēsis), completion. (Young 2021: 258)
Trish Glazebrook sees in the receptive and conservational aspects of poetic dwelling “a context to think through the problem of anthropocentrism”, and thus argues that Heidegger’s account “has much to offer ecofeminism” (Glazebrook 2001a: 247):
Heidegger’s argument that human being dwells poetically is the claim that human being can dwell in nature thoughtfully, creatively, and symbiotically rather than exploitatively and destructively. (Glazebrook 2001a: 246)
Zimmerman has similarly noted important affinities between Heidegger’s account of dwelling and deep ecology.[109] But Zimmerman has also come to believe that Heidegger’s relationship to ecological thought is politically problematic:
insofar as Heidegger developed no ethics, and insofar as compassion is not explicitly included in his discussion of insight into Ereignis, the central core of his thought provides inadequate guidance for environmental philosophy, even though—due to motives that lie outside the core of his thought—Heidegger certainly did exhibit concern about the destruction of nature by modern technology. (Zimmerman 2003: 95)
Zimmerman’s reassessment of Heidegger’s usefulness for the deep ecology movement was motivated in part by his confrontation with Heidegger’s National Socialism. And for many critics of Heidegger, his account of dwelling is an expression of a nationalistic and politically reactionary outlook—an indication perhaps of Heidegger’s allegiance to the National Socialist’s brand of a politics of place and belonging (see Zimmerman 1993: 205). As Malpas notes,
Heidegger’s Nazi associations, coupled with the evident centrality of place and associated notions in his thinking (especially notions of belonging, rootedness, homeland, and so forth) seem often to be taken as providing a self-evident demonstration of the politically reactionary and “dangerous” character of place-based thinking. (Malpas 2006: 18)
The paradox of this, as Malpas points out, is that Heidegger only gives central place to his notion of dwelling after 1947:
Thus the addresses from the early 1930s in which Heidegger seems to align himself with elements of Nazi ideology combine the vocabulary of Being and Time with ideas and images also present in Nazi rhetoric, including notions of “Volk” and of “Blut und Boden”, but they do not deploy any developed notions of place or dwelling as such. (Malpas 2006: 20)
Heidegger’s turn toward dwelling seems, if anything, a repudiation of his entanglement with National Socialism. Dwelling is not the task for an ethnic people (Volk), but for human beings (Mensch) who recognize their mortality. Dwelling is articulated not in the language of a people like German or French, but in a local dialect (Mundart) like Schwabian. “The dialect”, Heidegger writes, “is infinitely different from a common language of the world”, and for this reason dialects “are more poetic than common language” (“Language and Homeland”, GA13: 175–6). And, finally, the place of dwelling is not the nation state, but the locality.
4. The Fourfold
Drawing on his reading of Hölderlin, Heidegger identifies four dimensions of the locality that sustain human poetic dwelling.[110] He refers to these four dimensions collectively as “the fourfold”. They include the earth, the sky, mortals, and the divinities (die Göttlichen—more literally, “the god-like ones”). These dimensions manifest themselves differently in any given locale. For instance, a Black Forest farmhouse stands within a very different terrain, endures different weather and seasons, and organizes different human practices than an adobe hut in the deserts of the American southwest. The local character of the locale is a function of the particular character of the earth, sky, mortal practices, and divinities in that place. As Rorty explains, the fourfold
offer[s] a relationalist, contextualist account of things. In this account, things are what they are by virtue of their relation to everything else. This means that they have different features depending on the context in which they are put. (Rorty 2005: 274)
And this, Rorty argues, makes Heidegger’s relationalist account of the fourfold
an attractive alternative to the substantialism that we inherit from Aristotle—the doctrine that relations to other objects are mere accidents, which leave unchanged the essence of the self-contained, autonomous object. (Rorty 2005: 274; see also Mitchell 2015: 3)
In general terms, Heidegger’s thesis of the fourfold is that a local place “essences”—that is, it acquires a unified, coherent style for organizing entities—by arriving at a mutually well-adapted configuration of the four into a unity, a single integrated fourfold. The specific form of adaptation of the four dimensions to one another is sustained by a special class of things, things that embody the specific coherence of the locally-prevailing earth, sky, human practices, and sacred or divine claims. Humans come to dwell in a world by becoming familiar and at home with the things that embody the fourfold (Wrathall 2021d: 335).
But when it comes to the particulars of understanding the fourfold, scholars offer quite different accounts.
For Charles Taylor, the four are the elements of the description of the conditions that establish a distinctive style of existence. The mortals names the “rich web of practices” that make up a form of life. The divinities are the “strong goods, the matters of intrinsic worth” upon which a form of life is based. The earth is the “unformed matter” from which entities emerge and upon which they are continuously dependent. And the sky names the “greater cosmic forces which are beyond the domain of the formable, and which can either permit them to flourish or sweep them away” (Taylor 1992: 264).
According to Dreyfus and Spinosa, the fourfold is a description of what is involved in the practices that “set up local worlds”; following Borgmann (1984), they describe these as “focal practices”. The earth, on their account, names “the taken-for-granted practices that ground situations and make them matter to us” (Dreyfus & Spinosa 2017: 206). The sky names “the disclosed or manifest stable possibilities for action that arise in focal situations” (Dreyfus & Spinosa 2017: 207). The divinities are manifest when a focal event
is working to the point where … one feels extraordinarily in tune with all that is happening, a special graceful ease takes over, and events seem to unfold of their own momentum—all combining to make the moment all the more centered and more a gift. (Dreyfus & Spinosa 1997 [2017: 207])
And we humans are named mortals when we understand ourselves as disclosers of meaning, because Heidegger “thinks that death primarily reveals our disclosive way of being to us” (Dreyfus & Spinosa 1997 [2017: 207]).
According to Mitchell, “the earth names the sensuous” or “a kind of non-quantifiable sensuous appearing” (Mitchell 2015: 8). Sky is “the earth’s medium”, that is “a space traversed by weather patterns and variable lighting” (Mitchell 2015: 8). Divinities names the fact that “things are inherently meaningful”, and “that all things are exposed to the surprise of grace” (Mitchell 2015: 9). And the mortals are those who are capable of death and thus have their being in the world.
For Young, the fourfold is what “‘measures out’ a place for dwelling” by fixing the dimensions within which dwelling occurs. In a word, the four dimensions are climate (sky), social norms or an “ethical heritage” (divinities), time (mortals), and the “(part of) the planet” we inhabit (earth) (Young 2021: 258; Young 2002: 98).
Wrathall resists any tendency to treat the four as metaphors. For him, the earth is the earth beneath our feet, the earth that spreads out all around us as mountains and in trees, in rivers and streams. The sky is the sky above our heads, the stars and constellations, the sun and the moon, the shifting weather that brings the changing seasons. We are the mortals—we and our companions—living our lives and dying our deaths. And the divinities (the most elusive members of the fourfold in this secular age) are “holy beings that draw us out of our mundane concerns and call us to respond to the sacred—they are the ‘beckoning messengers of the Godhead’” (see Wrathall 2021d: 335, quoting GA7: 144, 170). Along similar lines, Malpas argues that
the Sky is that very sky that arches above us, and the Earth that which lies beneath our feet, here, now, in this place, and it is also here, in “this” place, and only here, that the encounter between Mortals, and between Mortals and Gods (whether in their absence or presence) also occurs. Mortals thus play a role in the coming to be of places, although not exclusively so, and places themselves play a role in the appearing of Mortals. (Malpas 2012: 153)
There is a dynamism to the four, and changes in each are reflected in changes to the others (just as changes in weather patterns affect human practices, and the flora and fauna of the earth). Heidegger’s name for the process through which each dimension comes to be mutually adapted to the others is “mirroring” or “reflection” (Spiegeln).[111] Mirroring or reflecting consists in each member of the four becoming “lighted” (i.e., intelligible) in the process of reflecting the others. Heidegger describes this process of coming to reflect one another as a kind of wrestling with each other—a tangible, concrete encounter where each constrains and alters the others. In a well-adapted nexus of the fourfold, then, each of the four will be infused by the others so that, for instance, the temporal cycles are articulated into holy days in terms of which the landscape and terrain will solicit specific human activities.
At work here, as Malpas recognizes, is “a conception of the human as inextricable from the complexity of the world, and as fundamentally constituted through the places of human dwelling” (Malpas 2012: 156). Malpas explains:
Rather than presenting human being as deterministically constrained, such a conception opens up a view of the human as enmeshed in an essentially reciprocal relation with the world in which it is also situated. The human thus cannot be assumed in advance, nor can it be taken to arise out of only one set of structures or elements alone. Indeed, even the movement of history must be understood as arising out of the interplay of activity and environment, of process and context, of temporality and spatiality. (Malpas 2012: 156)
As the fourfold are joined or integrated into a onefold, this constitutes the “worlding” of a local world—i.e., the process through which activities and events come to belong together because they bear a coherent character or style. Heidegger describes this process as “the gathering-adapting staying of the fourfold” (versammelnd-ereignenden Verweilen des Gevierts; GA7: 165 / PLT 172). Staying is a temporal notion that denotes, not the absence of all motion, but rather a pause or a hold on some changes in order to permit certain other activities. When a court issues a stay of execution, this temporarily pauses the enforcement of a judgment in order to make it possible to perform specific acts (like, file an appeal). When Heidegger writes about the “staying of the fourfold”, he means it in a similar sense—the staying holds the four in their harmoniously synced character in order to sustain the ongoing activities that characterize a particular world. In this staying, the four are gathered and able to more fully become adapted to each other.
The stabilization of the dynamic interplay between the four is effected by a special class of entities that Heidegger calls “things”. “Things” in the essays on dwelling and the fourfold should not be confused with Heidegger’s discussion of mere things in “The Origin of the Work of Art” (GA5). Things are also to be sharply contrasted with the objects of modernity and the resources of the technological age. Unlike an object, a thing is no longer thought in terms of its possession of independent substantiality. Unlike a resource, a thing is not placed at our disposal, but demands respect and reverence from us. In a bit of a pun, Heidegger explains that the distinctive character of things—Dinge, in German—is that they condition—bedingen—us and everything else around them. There is thus a reciprocal grounding relationship between things and the world: the world “bestows on things their essence. Things give birth to the world…. Because world and things do not subsist side by side. They pass through each other” (GA12: 21–22; see GA12: 19). In “bearing” or “giving birth” to a world, the thing establishes a concrete presence into which the different aspects of significance can settle. The thing “gathers the fourfold’s tarrying, its while, into a particular for-a-while” (GA7: 165 / PLT 172)—a specific way of experiencing how things matter that abides for a while.
Heidegger’s account of poetic dwelling with the fourfold underwrites his critique of the technological age. To dwell poorly is to be “homeless”—i.e., to be maladapted to the particularities of our place, so that we do not participate in disclosing and conserving that place. This state of homelessness is pronounced in our technological age, because technological practices and technological devices are designed precisely to function anywhere, to be used in a maximally unconstrained set of ways, without any specific reference to the locality in which they are placed. Heidegger’s example is a highway bridge, which “is inserted into the network of long-distance traffic that is calculating and moving at the greatest possible speed” (GA7: 147 / PLT 150). The highway bridge is maximally indifferent to the particular terrain of the earth: “now in a high arch, now in a low, the bridge overshoots river and gorge” (GA7: 147 / PLT 150). Although Heidegger doesn’t note this, highway bridges are also maximally indifferent to the particularities of the sky—they are artificially-lighted to erase the difference between day and night, and in the near future will be built to automatically melt ice and snow off their own surface (thus freeing themselves from the constraints of the weather). Finally, technological highway bridges, “disguise or even push away the presence of the divinities” (GA7: 147 / PLT 151) because they help create in us a sense that we are in control of our own welfare. In a technological world, mortals lose sight of their mortality and
forget that they, always already on their way to the last bridge, are fundamentally seeking to transcend the customary and miserable in order to bring themselves before the salvation of the divinities. (GA7: 147 / PLT 150–1)
In such a world, “the mutuality of the four ‘voices of destiny’ no longer rings out” (GA4: 178/202).
Unlike technological resources, then, things in the heightened sense depend on an integrated nexus of the four regions in order to function. Such things make demands on us and, in the process, condition us, because we can only use them well—be at home with them, dwell in and amongst them—to the degree that we are ourselves adapted to that particular integration of the four. One danger of the technological age is that we are turning everything (things, earth, sky, our own mortality, divinities) into entities that cannot condition and thus cannot matter to us. The way to counteract the technological age, then, is to allow ourselves to be conditioned.