Leibniz on Causation

First published Tue Feb 15, 2005; substantive revision Wed Sep 30, 2026

According to Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716), the basic, fundamental entities of the universe (simple substances or “monads”) are causally active in a distinctive manner, each possessing forces that are causally efficacious in bringing about all of their perceptual states respectively, while having no causal influence over the states of other, numerically distinct substances. They continually change their perceptions, and thus are constantly active. “It is in the nature of created substance to change continually,” writes Leibniz in a letter to Pierre Bayle (GP iv, 518). Moreover, substances continue to act forever, since even finite, created substances are naturally indestructible and thus immortal. To what or to whom do substances causally owe their activity? To themselves, to other created substances, or even to God? In Leibniz’s day, this question often centers around the causal role of God. Is God the only genuine causal agent in nature? Or does God’s causal contribution, at least in the ordinary development of nature, consist “merely” in the creation and conservation of created substances? We will see that Leibniz holds that both God and created substances are causally responsible for changes in the states of substances, and significantly, no created substance is causally responsible for changes in the states of other substances. There is another question particularly salient for the 17th century philosopher: What types of causes are present in substantial activity? Just twenty-three years after Leibniz’s death, David Hume stated that his own definition of cause entails that “all causes are of the same kind” (Treatise of Human Nature, 1.3.14.32), namely, efficient (i.e., productive) causes. Leibniz’s theory of causation, on the contrary, integrates efficient, final, and even formal causes, as it tries to explain away real causation among phenomenal things with the infamous pre-established harmony.

1. Competing Theories of Causation

Leibniz assumes that all events have causes—events do not just happen—and typically considers only three theories of causation worthy of philosophical consideration: physical influx, occasionalism, and parallelism. Leibniz also holds that there is an infinite number of substances, so any acceptable theory of causation must be able to accommodate them, that is, to account for their activity. And Leibniz seems to have thought that physical influx, occasionalism, and parallelism, all had at least this feature in common. Let’s then summarize in turn each of the theories.

According to the theory of physical influx, there is intersubstantial causation among finite (i.e., non-divine) substances, by way of some sort of inflow, transmission, or transference of being between one substance (the cause) and another (the effect). So, for instance, when Jimi Hendrix appears to strum his guitar, he really is the cause of the vibration of the strings. In this case, motion is a mode or property that Hendrix transferred or communicated to the body of his guitar. Interestingly, the term ‘physical’ notwithstanding, the theory of physical influx is not limited to material finite substances. For physical influx sometimes is invoked to explain the causal interaction among immaterial finite substances (e.g., minds) and material finite substances (e.g., bodies). So, for instance, immateriality alone does not preclude influx. Accordingly, it is more accurate to take the term ‘physical’ in this context to mean natural rather than material. There is some controversy about this, but Francisco Suarez, Thomas Hobbes, Pierre Gassendi, and Robert Boyle all either subscribed to or were committed to some variety of physical influx. (For an examination of the history of the theory of physical influx as well as what Leibniz himself understood by this term, see Eileen O’Neill 1993.)

Occasionalism denies causation not only among finite substances, and so rules out any inflow between cause and effect, but also within finite substances. In other words, regarding finite substances, there is neither intersubstantial nor intrasubstantial causation. Taken individually or jointly, finite substances have no genuine causal efficacy. When the strings of Hendrix’s guitar vibrate, Hendrix is not the real cause of the vibration. Nor are his fingers, wrist, and arm real causes. Is the vibration then uncaused for the occasionalist? No, for there is God. God, thought by many of Leibniz’s contemporaries to be the only infinite substance, is considered to be the only real cause. God causes the strings on Hendrix’s guitar to vibrate on the occasion of Hendrix’s volition—itself caused by God—to strum the strings on his guitar. Al-Ghazālī, Nicolas Malebranche, and Louis La Forge, among others, were occasionalists.

Like occasionalism, the theory of parallelism—taken to its extreme—holds that there is no intersubstantial causation among finite substances. And like occasionalism, when the strings of Hendrix’s guitar vibrate, Hendrix is not the real cause of the vibration. Nor, again, are his fingers, wrist, or arm real causes. Nevertheless, it is not God who is the total real cause of this vibration. According to parallelism, finite substances can be real causes. Rather the strings themselves are causing themselves to vibrate. Due to the harmony between Henrdix’s mind, body, and his guitar strings, and not because of any direct causal relation, when Hendrix is in a state of willing his fingers to strum the strings on his guitar, his fingers are in a state that would result in their strumming, and the strings are in a state that would result in their vibration.

Leibniz was and still is the most famous proponent of parallelism. However, there are not many other parallelists to compete with. Further, there is some debate as to when Leibniz came to fully reject both influx and occasionalism and actually formulated his own positive account of causation (Kulstad 1993), namely “pre-established harmony.” Paul Lodge, for instance, argues that “Leibniz became committed to the preestablished harmony sometime between 1679 and 1682” (Lodge 1998, 293). Leibniz’s “pre-established harmony” is stated in many passages including this one: “Each of these souls expresses in its own manner what occurs outside itself, and it cannot do so through any influence of other particular beings (or, to put it a better way, it has to draw up this expression from the depths of its own nature); and so necessarily each soul must have received this nature—this inner source of the expression of what lies without—from a universal cause, upon which all of these beings depend and which brings it about that each of them perfectly agrees with and corresponds to the others” (New Essays A vi, 6, 440). The doctrine of pre-established harmony is usually interpreted to encompass five main tenets:

  1. no change in the states of a created substance is due to another created substance (i.e., there is no intersubstantial causation);
  2. all (non-initial, natural) change in the states of a created substance is due, at least in part, to that substance itself (i.e., there is intrasubstantial causation);
  3. each created substance has a “blueprint” (i.e., a complete concept or law of the series) that “lists” or includes all of its states,
  4. each “blueprint” conforms with the blueprints of all other created substances (i.e., each of a created substance’s natural states cohere with all the natural states of every other created substance); and,
  5. this conformity between the states of substances is set up by a universal cause, namely, God.

For expression of these five tenets, see, for example, Leibniz’s letters to Antoine Arnauld, Nov. 28/Dec. 8 1686 and Apr. 30 1687 and Monadology §81.

As to be expected, there is some controversy regarding the interpretation of these tenets; for instance, tenet 2 is sometimes extended to also include non-initial states (Whipple 2015, 206). There is another important aspect of the pre-established harmony. A substance’s expressions arising “from the depths of its own nature” are also called perceptions by Leibniz. Perception is “[t]he passing state which involves and represents a multitude in a unity” (Monadology §14 GP vi, 608/AG 214). On the pre-established harmony, for any particular substance there is an isomorphic mapping of perceptions and bodily motions. Whenever a substance has a perception x there will be a corresponding bodily state y expressing that perception x. So when I perceive myself as putting a log in the fire “[my] animal spirits and [my] blood [take] on, at exactly the right moment, the motions required to correspond to the passions and the perceptions of [my] soul” (New System GP iv, 484/L 458).

Note, however, that the five main tenets of Leibniz’s pre-established harmony leave room for God’s supernatural causal activity even in the actions of finite substances. In other words, pre-established harmony, in Leibniz’s hands at least, is a form of concurrentism. More of this will be addressed in the section on divine causation, but for now it is enough to say that God’s causal role in the actions of finite substances at the very minimum is to pre-establish the concomitance or conjunction between causes and effects, without which God’s aim of producing universal and maximum harmony (Monadology §§85ff) would be frustrated.

Why is Leibniz drawn to the rather bizarre-sounding pre-established harmony? In other words, why does he reject the more terrene physical influx and the more celestial occasionalism?

2. Why does Leibniz reject Physical Influx?

While Leibniz sometimes appears to allow influx as a way of explaining body-on-body motion, such talk is most likely a “heuristic device” (Clatterbaugh 1999, 142). For Leibniz not only rules out any kind of causation in which one substance transmits or transfers something to another substance but also influx on the level of bodies. Leibniz offers at least three distinct reasons for rejecting influx: it is impossible; it is superfluous; and, with respect to mind-body causation, it violates the law of conservation of motion.

Leibniz thinks that intersubstantial influx is impossible: “according to my view,” he says, “what are truly called substances … have no influence on one another,” adding that “I think that [this] doctrine is necessary” (LDV 275). It is fairly clear that Leibniz typically takes “influx” to refer to the transmission or transference of accidents (or modes, modifications—Leibniz often uses these terms interchangeably)—what today we might call tropes or property-instances—as when a guitarist’s fingers “give” an instance of motion to a struck guitar string. The reason Leibniz most often gives is that it is not possible for one substance to transmit or transfer accidents to another substance, or at any rate, that this would be inconceivable: “The way of influence belongs to that of the common philosophy. However, since it is impossible to conceive of material particles or of species or immaterial qualities that can pass from one of these substances into the other, the view must be rejected” (GP iv, 498f). We cannot fail to run into trouble when “entertaining something as inconceivable as an accident’s passing from one subject to another” (New Essays A vi, 6, 224). Leibniz criticizes influx in this way for most of his career. In his twenties, he dismisses the Scholastic Francisco Suarez’s term “influx” as a “barbaric expression … metaphorical and more obscure than what it defines” (Preface to an Edition of Nizolius GP iv, 150/L 126). (Whether Suarez actually held the view Leibniz ascribes to him is another matter entirely, and is debated by scholars such as Eileen O’Neill (1993) and Davis Kuykendall (2016).) In his middle years, he complains that “we have a bad habit of thinking of our soul as if it received certain species as messengers and as if it has doors and windows” (Discourse on Metaphysics §26 GP iv, 451/AG 58). And two years before his death, he writes that “[m]onads have no windows, through which anything could come in or go out. And accidents cannot detach themselves and stroll about outside of substances, as the Scholastics’ sensible species used to; so neither substance nor accident can come into a monad from outside” (Monadology §7 GP vi, 608/FW 268). (For further discussion of this kind of anti-influx argument, see Clatterbaugh 1999, 142–143; Jorati 2017, 42–44; Kuykendall 2019; Flattery 2020, 366, 372ff; and Flattery 2023, 100–101. Kuykendall (2019) also contends that Leibniz’s argument against the transfer of accidents is in conflict with his own views on the production of substantial forms.)

Leibniz also gives a different sort of argument for rejecting the possibility of substance-to-substance influence, an argument that arose during his long correspondence with the philosopher and mathematician Burchard de Volder. When Leibniz found himself under sustained pressure from De Volder to defend the claim that intersubstantial causal interaction is impossible, and when it became clear that De Volder was not convinced by the general argument against the transmission or transfer of accidents, Leibniz gave what Tobias Flattery has called the “Infinitist Argument” against intersubstantial influence (2020, 385). Roughly speaking, this argument can be understood as an adaptation and extension of one way of formulating the causal interaction problem for Cartesian substance dualism. According to the latter problem, any interaction between two substances must in some way involve one or more modifications of these substances. But two substances can interact only if each has the same fundamental nature, since interaction requires compatible modifications, i.e., modifications of the same kind of fundamental substance nature. Flattery calls this the “Same Nature Criterion” (2020, 382f). Since on a Cartesian dualist ontology thinking substances (i.e., minds) and extended substances (i.e., bodies) have different fundamental natures, the Same Nature Criterion rules out the possibility of mind-body interaction. Leibniz accepts the Same Nature Criterion, but he also thinks—at least in his later, idealist stage—that “all substances are of different natures” (LDV 291); “the primitive constitution of each spirit [i.e., monad] is different from that of all the others” (GP iv, 565–566/L 581). Moreover, Leibniz thinks there are an infinity of these substances (LDV 291, 303; GP iv, 492/AG 147). So, since no two of the infinity of substances have the same fundamental natures, there are no two substances that can satisfy the Same Nature Criterion, and thus none that can causally interact.

Leibniz also sometimes argues that intersubstantial influx is superfluous or overdetermined: “in general one particular substance has no physical influence over another; furthermore, it would be useless, seeing that each substance is a complete entity, self-sufficient to determine by virtue of its own nature everything that is to happen to it” (GP ii, 71). In fact, he claims, the pre-established harmony can explain all the changes in the world without the metaphysical baggage of “property passing”: “So there will be a perfect accord between all these substances which produces the same effect that would be noticed if they all communicated with each other by a transmission of species or of qualities, as the common run of philosophers imagine” (New System GP iv, 484/L 457f). Thus, not only is causation via influx impossible; we also do not need it.

Another argument Leibniz offers, with respect to minds and bodies in particular—as opposed to being about simple substances (i.e., monads) or substances generally—is this: if the mind were to act on the body thereby causing bodily motion, there would be an increase in motion in that region of the world after the mind’s action on the body not compensated for by a decrease in motion in another region. This is an obvious violation of the law of the conservation of motion. Therefore, there is no physical influx. The Monadology includes the following passage:

Descartes recognized that souls cannot impart a force to bodies because there is always the same quantity of force in matter [i.e., the material world]. However, he thought that the soul could change the direction of [force in] bodies. But that is because the law of nature, which also affirms the conservation of the same total direction in matter, was not known at that time. If he had known it, he would have hit upon my system of pre-established harmony. (Monadology §80 GP vi, 620f/AG 223)

Similarly, but instead focused on a lack of quantifiable proportion between minds and bodies, Leibniz tells Arnauld that “we should not worry about how the soul can give some motion or some new determination to animal spirits, since, in fact, it never gives them any at all, insofar as there is no proportion between mind and body” (Letter to Arnauld, April 30, 1687/AG 83, italics added). (For further discussion of this line of argument, see Camposampiero 2021.)

Part of what troubles Leibniz about the doctrine of physical influx is that it entails that in activity, from cause to effect, the cause is drained. According to Leibniz, real causation entails that the cause not lose any of its efficacy after exercising its causal power. Leibniz depicts the production of our thoughts, for instance, as involving emanative causation: “it is very evident that created substances depend upon God, who preserves them and who even produces them continually by a kind of emanation, just as we produce our thoughts” (Discourse on Metaphysics §14 GP iv, 439/AG 46). Other commentators have put it this way: “[S]ubstances are to be understood as enjoying a lawful primitive force of action whereby accidents emanate from the substance, from within” (Cover & O’Leary-Hawthorne, 181).

It is difficult to tell why Leibniz is troubled by any theory that involves the potential loss of causal efficacy in substances. Part of it might have to do with his belief that even finite, created substances are naturally indestructible (i.e., immortal) (Principles of Nature and Grace §2 GP vi, 598/P 195). For then created, finite substances, continually acting according to the physical influx model, might eventually lose their causal efficacy and would no longer be able to act. And for Leibniz, “substances cannot be conceived in their bare essence, devoid of activity; that activity is of the essence of substance in general” (New Essays A vi, 6, 65). So, physical influx would entail the natural mortality of substance, a view that Leibniz wholly rejects.

3. Why does Leibniz reject Occasionalism?

Occasionalism puts forward a view where God must act for any substance that does not have the causal power itself to act. Leibniz challenges occasionalism publicly in A New System of Nature, Specimen Dynamicum, On Nature Itself, and the Theodicy (§61, §§383–403). Leibniz’s critique of occasionalism has been studied by, among others, Sleigh (1990), Rutherford (1993), Jolley (2005), and Lodge (2015).

However, in the early part of his career—the 1660s and 1670s—Leibniz adopted a limited form of occasionalism, that is, physical occasionalism. Christian Henkel writes: “Focusing on the period from 1668 to 1676, … Leibniz’s position leads to physical occasionalism in the Confession of Nature Against the Atheists (1668) taken together with the Catholic Demonstrations, and in the correspondence (in 1668/69) with his former teacher, Jakob Thomasius. Slightly later, Leibniz more determinately endorses physical occasionalism in the Pacidius Philalethi” (Henkel, 487; also, see Garber 2011, 191–193). In other words, during these early years, Leibniz held that God is the only true cause of bodily motion. Causation among or within immaterial substances was a separate matter. But Leibniz came to reject even this limited form of occasionalism, since if no other substance besides God has the causal power to act for itself, or even in conjunction with other finite substances, God must continually intervene in the course of the world. Leibniz sees this as a serious problem for the occasionalist account of causation.

Since occasionalism entails that God must continually intervene in the course of nature, Leibniz takes this to mean that he must perform continuous miracles—an occupation not entirely worthy of God’s name. Leibniz explains:

Let us see, however, whether the system of occasional causes really does not involve a perpetual miracle. [Pierre Bayle] said that it does not, because the system holds that God acts only according to general laws. I agree that he does, but in my view that isn’t enough to remove miracles. Even if God produced them all the time, they would still be miracles, if the word in understood not in the popular sense, as a rare and marvelous thing, but philosophically, as something which exceeds the power of created things. It is not sufficient to say that God has made a general law, for in addition to the decree there has also to be a natural way of carrying it out. It is necessary, that is, that what happens should be explicable in terms of the God-given nature of things. (Explanation of Bayle’s Difficulties §7 GP iv, 520/FW 205)

Note Leibniz’s definition of a miracle: it is simply an event that results from God and not from finite substances (Letter to Arnauld, 30 April 1687, G ii 93/AG 83). However, Leibniz adds, a world in which God is required to perform continuous miracles is a world less perfect, and thereby less praiseworthy, than a world that “unfolds” naturally without the direct intervention of God (Theodicy §61). The idea is that the doctrine of occasionalism must hold that God did not initially get creation right (even if the occasionalist themself is not willing to make such an assertion) and so must continually step in and repair things to get them to go the way God intends. Some have called Hendrix’s guitar playing “miraculous,” but this is not because his playing was due only to God. Hendrix was a real cause of his guitar work. (This is, of course, not to say that for Leibniz there are no miracles whatsoever. He does speak of events that “surpass all the force of creatures” (Theodicy §249 H 280), including the Creation and the Incarnation.)

For Leibniz, a world of genuinely active substances is more perfect than a world of purely passive or causally inert substances, whose activity is not properly ascribed to them but to God. Ascribing such activity to God alone, Leibniz believes, leads inexorably to Spinozism, where God is the only real substance and where any other thing is just a mode of God or else must invoke a deus ex machina, which for Leibniz is an ad hoc solution (Primary Truths C 521/P 90; GP iv, 515/WF 221). In order to avoid what he thinks is unadulterated Spinozism, Leibniz is keen to emphasize that we must be able to distinguish the actions of God from the actions of created substances.

Interestingly, Leibniz also offers a methodological reason for rejecting any view that unnecessarily invokes miracles to explain phenomena: “In philosophy we must try to show the way in which things are carried out by the divine wisdom by explaining them in accordance with the notion of the subject we are dealing with” (New System §13/FW 150).

4. Intersubstantial Causation

Since Leibniz seems to think that intersubstantial causation requires physical influx and physical influx is unacceptable, he concludes, logically enough, that we must reject intersubstantial causation. But Nicholas Jolley notes that Leibniz does not always argue this way. For while consistently rejecting the existence of influx, sometimes Leibniz will not at the same time reject outright the existence of intersubstantial causation. “Leibniz sometimes suggests that our ordinary statements about causal interaction can be understood in such a way that they come out true” (Jolley 1998, 595). Nevertheless, Jolley continues, “When Leibniz simply denies the existence of causal interaction between created substances, he tends to accept the influx analysis; he does not look around for a better analysis that would preserve the truth of our ordinary causal statements” (Jolley 1998, 595). Tobias Flattery (2020, especially 387) also raises the question as to why Leibniz seems to think that transmission or transference of accidents is the only way to account for interaction among substances. So, on the whole, Leibniz does not take seriously other alternative accounts of intersubstantial causation.

Perhaps because he thinks he already has an account that will work for him—the pre-established harmony—Leibniz does not believe that a plausible theory of causation need be intersubstantial in kind. In other words, Leibniz does not face a problem so many of his contemporaries face: his metaphysics—unlike their own—includes the necessary (and sufficient?) elements to sustain a properly and purely intrasubstantial theory of causation; a Leibnizian created substance is self-sufficient (possessing an inner principle of change that explains all of its property-instances), permanently causally efficacious (acting does not diminish its power), ​​and equipped with an internal law of the series of its perceptions that conforms to the internal laws of all other created substances (perceiving or representing one and the same universe). Thus, it makes sense that Leibniz would not feel compelled to defend or hunt for a theory of intersubstantial causation. Like a reference to continuous miracles, it would be an unnecessary or superfluous move (even if it is possible), and therefore methodologically invalid.

A difficult problem in giving an account of intrasubstantial causation concerns the explanation of the difference between causation among systems and causation within a system. Causation among systems involves interactive cause-and-effect relationships between distinct entities, e.g., how a shift in nighttime ambient lighting causally affects bird migration patterns. Causation within a system involves internal mechanisms and dependencies between aspects of a single entity, e.g., how the internal gearing of a watch causes the second hand to advance. However, do the internal works of a watch constitute a truly isolated system? For even Rolexes, constructed for deep-sea divers, are affected at extreme temperatures and depths. So there is a problem giving an account of causation within a Rolex. A similar problem arises for a seventeenth century philosopher who holds a mechanistic and materialist notion of substance, for such substances can never be fully isolated from external mechanical and material forces. But Leibniz has no problem with explaining the difference between systems that are causally isolated and systems that cannot be made absolute; his monadic ontology is readily equipped to handle causally isolated units or unities. For his substances are “windowless,” not at all causally compromised by external substances.

There is … no way in which it could make sense for a monad to be altered or changed internally by any other created thing. Because there is nothing to rearrange within a monad, and there is no conceivable internal motion in which it could be excited, directed, increased, or diminished, in the way that it can in a composite, where there is change among the parts. Monads have no windows, through which anything could come in or go out. And accidents cannot detach themselves and stroll about outside of substances, as the Scholastics’ sensible species used to; so neither substance nor accident can come into a monad from outside. (Monadology §7 GP vi, 608/FW 268)

In other words, Leibniz writes, “substances can never prevent one another from performing those works in this universe as far as is possible” (Letter to Arnauld April 30, 1687 §6/FW 125).

It is worth noting that in some passages Leibniz appears to grant that there is intersubstantial causation, at least in a certain sense, which he calls ideal causal interaction. And such passages are not only found in early works. In a letter to Des Bosses from 1713, for instance, Leibniz writes, “The modifications of one monad are the ideal causes of the modifications of other monads” (GP ii, 475/L 608). And a year later he writes, “in simple substances the influence of one monad over another is ideal only” (Monadology §51/PM 187).

Interpretive questions thus arise: does Leibniz think that ideal causal interaction is real, genuine interaction, or merely apparent interaction? And if it is a form of genuine interaction, is Leibniz caught in a contradiction, given his many denials of intersubstantial causal interaction? At least one commentator interprets Leibniz’s ideal causation as a “genuine form of causal influence” (Puryear, 764) in a way that can render ordinary ways of thinking about objects interacting in the world logically consistent with Leibniz’s denials of physical influx (see Puryear 764f). But the most common view is that, for Leibniz, ideal interaction is merely apparent, and thus there is no threat of contradiction (see, e.g., Sleigh 1990b, 162). When two substances are said in “the popular sense” to interact causally, it is just that “​​one of these two substances depends upon the other ideally, insofar as the reason of that which is done in the one can be furnished by that which is in the other. This had already happened when God ordered beforehand the harmony that there would be between them” (Theodicy §§65–66). With this sort of account, we can still sensibly talk in terms of intersubstantial causation, and thus “Ordinary ways of speaking are also preserved” (New System GP iv, 486/AG 145). As Leibniz says, “I attempt as much as possible to accommodate common usage, salva veritate” (Letter to Huygens GM ii, 199/AG 308).

While it is most likely the case that Leibniz denies the reality of intersubstantial causation, it is very evident, however, that he has a clear commitment to the reality of intrasubstantial causation.

5. Intrasubstantial Causation

Whatever can be predicated of a Leibnizian substance is either an attribute (a permanent and common characteristic (GP ii, 227, 257ff)), sometimes called “property” (GP ii, 258/L 533), or an accident (a transitory and individual characteristic (GP ii, 458/L 605; GP iv, 363)), sometimes called a “mode” or “modification” (G ii, 258/L 533; GP ii, 503f). In contemporary lingo, we would call an attribute a “property” and accident a “property-instance” or “trope.” Action is an attribute of substance, for Leibniz defines substance as “a being capable of action” (GP vi, 598). A perception is an accident of a substance, for the action of substances consists precisely in the fact that they are always changing their perceptions. Now, an attribute must not be considered a substance, since it would be a mistake to equate action with what is acting, or extension with what is extended (New Essays A vi, 6, 210f). Neither is an attribute to be considered an accident, for “an attribute may be predicated of several substances at the same or at different times while an accident can never inhere in more than one substance at the same or at different times” (Clatterbaugh 1973, 3).

For Leibniz, every created substance is by its very nature active, in the sense of being continually in process of change of its perceptions (Letter to De Volder, January 21, 1704, LDV 289; cf. NE 65). The accidents (tropes or property-instances) of a substance are its perceptions. The change in a created substance must be caused (Primary Truths C 519/L 268), yet there can be no transeunt (i.e., intersubstantial) causation (Discourse on Metaphysics §14, GP iv, 439/L 312/FW 66f). For causal interaction between created substances (i.e., monads) is in principle inexplicable (New System GP iv, 483/L 457), as we saw earlier. Therefore, the cause of change of perceptions in a created substance is either to be located in an uncreated substance, namely God, or in the substance itself. But, as we have already seen, Leibniz rejects the view that God alone is the real causal power driving change in substances; as previously shown, he is no occasionalist (Notes on a Reply of Foucher, GP i, 373f/L 155). So, putting God aside for the moment, perceptual change is caused by the substance itself. But surely we want to know what it is about the substance or in the substance that drives perceptual change.

What exactly causes the change of perceptions of a substance? Leibniz holds that both the “primitive active power” of a substance and its perceptions or perceptual states play crucial causal roles in the changes of a substance. (As we shall see, furthermore, God is no minor player in this effort as well.) The primitive active power of a substance, Leibniz tells us, is “a nature or an internal force that can produce in it, in an orderly way … all the appearances or expressions it will have, without the help of any created being” (New System GP iv, 486/AG 144). It is important to realize that for Leibniz, a causal force is not merely a potential power in the sense of only acting if certain conditions were present, but rather an active power that does act unless prevented from doing so. “Active force … contains a certain act or entelechy and is thus midway between the faculty of acting and the act itself and involves a conatus. It is thus carried into action by itself and needs no help but only the removal of an impediment” (GP iv, 469/L 433). Active force is described as involving a conatus or striving toward action. Moreover, “the present state of each substance is a natural result [consequence] of its preceding state” (Clarification of Difficulties concerning Monsieur Bayle GP iv, 521).

There are two types of active force, according to Leibniz: the primitive and the derivative (Lee 2014, 130). Leibniz describes each in his correspondence with De Volder:

I think that it is obvious that primitive forces can be nothing but the internal strivings [tendentia] of simple substances, strivings by means of which they pass from perception to perception in accordance with a certain law of their nature. (Letter to De Volder 1704 or 1705/AG 181)

Derivative force is the present state itself insofar as it tends toward a following state, i.e., preinvolves a following state, just as everything in the present is pregnant with the future. But the persisting thing itself, insofar as it involves all cases, has primitive force, so that primitive force is like the law of a series, and derivative force is like a determination that designates some term in the series. (Letter to De Volder January 21 1704/LDV 287)

Both primitive and derivative forces then are strivings. It is difficult to know exactly what the difference is, besides one being more fundamental than the other. A common approach is to identify primitive forces with the powers of substances, and derivative forces with appetitions. (Rutherford 2005, 165, 2017, 189, Adams 1994, 380, and Kulstad 1990, 136, all consider appetitions to be derivative active forces.) Regarding primitive forces, each substance has the power of causing each of its subsequent perceptions or perceptual states according to its internal law. Primitive forces are not merely dispositional. They are not merely tendencies; accordingly, they sound like efficient (i.e., productive) causes. And, regarding the latter, given that in simple substances there are only perceptions and appetites (Letter to De Volder June 30 1704/AG 181), this tending toward or preinvolvement of the substance’s future state seems to be the aspect of the present state that corresponds to appetites. Leibniz writes that “[t]he action of the internal principle which brings about the change or passage from one perception to another can be called appetition; it is true that the appetite cannot always completely reach the whole perception toward which it tends, but it always obtains something of it, and reaches new perceptions” (Monadology §15/AG 215). Appetition has a teleological ring to it, so it makes sense to associate derivative forces with final causes. But it is difficult to know exactly what is going on, for Leibniz makes none of this clear for the reader. Sukjae Lee’s 2014 paper demonstrates well the interpretive obstacles.

Whatever the final details of Leibniz’s account happen to be regarding primitive and derivative forces, and perceptions and appetites, one thing is clear: Leibniz’s account runs seriously counter to David Hume’s regarding causation. In 1739, Hume stated that his definition of cause entails that “all causes are of the same kind” (Treatise of Human Nature, 1.3.14.32), whereas Leibniz incorporates efficient, final, and formal causes in his theory of causation. Before discussing these different kinds of causes, however, let us consider a particularly vexed issue in Leibniz’s account of causation: divine causation.

6. Divine Causation

Not all systems of pre-established harmony are the same. Leibniz’s own version represents a form of concurrentism, since he rejects the view that the change in perceptual states of a created substance is due solely to that created substance itself. As he writes, “Each substance is the true and real cause of its own immanent actions, and has the power of acting … although it is sustained by the divine concourse” (A iv, 4, 1640/S 68). According to Leibniz, both God and created substances are causally responsible for changes in the states of created substances. But God is no minor player in this effort; God is “immediately” and “continually” causally present in every aspect of the universe, even in those effects normally attributed to created substances. Consider this text:

God continually produces all that is real in created things. But I also hold that to do so he continually produces or conserves in us that energy or activity which according to me constitutes the nature of a substance, and the source of its modifications. (GP iv, 588/WF 152; also, see NE 222)

Leibniz argues for this view in the Theodicy: “the action of God in conserving should have some reference to that which is conserved, according to what it is and to the state wherein it is; thus his action cannot be general or indeterminate” (Theodicy §27). So even though Leibniz rejects occasionalism, Leibniz does agree with the occasionalist Nicolas Malebranche, with whom he corresponded, that God must be given his causal due. It is certainly not a mere afterthought. In fact, both agree that “conservation is continual creation.” Consider another passage from Leibniz:

[T]he duration of things (the multiplicity of momentary states) is the total of an infinity of divine fulgurations, of which each one at each instant is a creation or reproduction of everything; which strictly speaking leaves no continuous passage from one state to the next. This provides a perfect proof of that famous truth of Christian theologians and philosophers, that the conservation of things is a continual creation; and it gives a very special way of verifying the dependence of every changeable thing on the unchangeable divinity …. (Letter to Sophie Charlotte GP vii, 564f; also, see Theodicy §31)

Commitment to continual creation is thus an important constraint on Leibniz’s theory of causation. Ultimately, Leibniz adopts a form of concurrentism in which the natural change in the perceptual states of a created substance is due to the involvement of both the created substance and God. In other words, created substances possess genuine causal powers even while God’s own causal power is flexed everywhere in creation, including that of created substances and their states.

Since God’s causal activity complements created substances, including our own, Leibniz does not count such activity as miraculous. Genuine miracles are interventions in the natural course of events (Letter to Masham, May 1704, A vi, 2, 221–22/WF 206). Properly speaking then, this activity is not intervention on God’s part, but divine cooperation or concurrence (Discourse on Metaphysics §30/AG 63).

Some commentators (e.g., David Scott, especially §4) are not convinced that Leibniz consistently advocates concurrentism, for if the doctrine of continual creation were taken seriously (that is, that God continuously produces all things), then how could anything but occasionalism be the natural upshot? The problem, however, is that Leibniz certainly does reject occasionalism and specifically tries to show (unsuccessfully, according to Scott) that continual creation is consistent with the genuine causal activity of created substances. Perhaps it is inescapably philosophically untenable, but no doubt we cannot escape Leibniz’s attachment to the view that “[God’s action] cannot be general or indeterminate. … Conservation by God consists in the perpetual immediate influence which the dependence of creatures demands” (Theodicy §27).

It may be tempting to say that for Leibniz we know that God does act on created substances continually, but we cannot understand how he does this. Consider what Leibniz writes in the New Essays: “[A]ll monads were created by God and depend on him; yet we cannot understand in detail how this was done; and fundamentally the preservation of monads is nothing but a continual creation, as the Scholastics knew very well” (NE 443). Perhaps Leibniz simply adopts the Cartesian stance—that God is a sui generis cause, the likes of which we would be rash to think we can learn anything meaningful. At some level, this is surely the case. But Leibniz gives us some pretty good clues as to how “continual creation” works. Let’s begin by looking at one way in which it does not work.

It may be tempting to think of continual creation as continuous in the following sense—as the literal recreation of a created substance from nothing at each and every moment. Jeffrey McDonough aptly calls this the “cinematic view” (McDonough 2007, 52) since it renders creaturely existence as analogous to a film consisting of a series of discrete frames or pictures, where each substance goes in and out of existence incessantly, from one moment to the next. In alignment with Theodicy §27, quoted above, God’s conservative action is thus perpetual, specific, immediate, determinate, and explains the dependence that creatures have on God. But Leibniz rejects such a view of continual creation, since it conflicts with some of his metaphysical commitments. Leibniz identified one of the great problems of metaphysics to be the composition of the space-time continuum: How can the whole or continuum of nature be composed only of individual or discrete parts? Julia Jorati explains why the cinematic view conflicts with Leibniz’s views on the continuum: “Continued creation understood as a literal recreation at each instant presupposes that the temporal continuum is composed out of temporally unextended instants (Theodicy §384), which Leibniz denies. According to Leibniz, just as lines are not composed of points, temporal continua are not composed of temporally unextended instants, points are always the endpoints of lines or line segments; they are mere modalities of lines. The same holds, mutatis mutandis, for instants and periods of time” (Jorati 2022, 125).

Nevertheless, unlike Descartes, Leibniz does try to explain how God acts on creatures: “created substances depend on God, who conserves them and even produces them continually by a kind of emanation as we produce our thoughts” (Discourse on Metaphysics §14 GP iv 439/PM 26). Also, in a much later work, Leibniz writes: “This simple primitive substance [God] must eminently (eminemment) include the perfections contained in the derivative substances which are its effects” (Principles of Nature and Grace §9/AG 210). This suggests Leibniz’s preferred way of reconciling God’s creation and concurrence with creaturely activity. Continual creation is to be understood in terms of God’s emanative activity. Emanation is how God sustains the activity of substances.

Leibniz’s appeal to emanation needs some explanation, however, since some find it “astonishing” (Bennett 2001, 245). Leibniz’s analogy between substantial thought or perception and God’s conservation reveals two important aspects of emanation: (1) that God’s causal influence on us is continual (just as substances always perceive); and (2) that this influence does not diminish God’s causal power (just as thinking does not seem to diminish our ability to think) (Mercer, 189).

Regarding the first aspect of emanation, there is some interpretive debate regarding what Leibniz means by “continual” creation in the context of divine concurrence via emanative activity. The main question is how it is that God is the efficient cause of something and also the substance itself is an efficient cause of the same thing? To answer this question, Julia Jorati argues that for Leibniz “God merely contributes to the production of an effect that the creature specifies and strives for, and [God] does so because the creature specifies and strives for it” (Jorati 2017, 106). God’s role as the “efficient co-cause” of the actions of created substances does not explain why they act as they do. “In virtue of providing the final and formal cause of the action,” created substances “single-handedly explain the properties of the action” (Jorati 2017, 111), and this is sufficient for the causal efficacy and independence of substances. Jorati thus denies the “complete productive spontaneity” of substances (Jorati 2017, 111).

Does God, in concurring with the actions of created substances, perform multiple causal acts (one per action or perception of each created substance) or a single causal act for all actions of created substances? Leibniz has typically been understood to adopt the former view: God’s continual creation requires an infinite number of acts that are still ongoing because there exists an infinite number of created substances, each having an infinite number of perceptions. However, Fatema Amijee argues for the latter view: The states of any created substance are caused by God in a single act. “God’s concurrence with creaturely activity is irreducibly plural: the natural effects or states of any created substance are brought about together, as a collective” (Amijee, 1).

Regarding the second aspect of emanation, the active principle in a substance offers thoughts to itself—thoughts produced by emanation (Mercer, 325, 366f)—and neither infinite substance (namely, God) nor finite substance is diminished causally when acting. But this is intrasubstantial causation. What about intersubstantial causation that involves emanation, as when God acts on us? Leibniz gives no indication that we are subsequently diminished causally; and in fact, God’s emanative activity sustains us (Discourse on Metaphysics §28/PM 37).

We can attribute to Leibniz the following view: God’s role in intersubstantial causation is an emanatory one. An emanative mode of causal activity is one in which the cause includes, in some “eminent” or higher form, what it gives to its effect, without losing the ability to produce the same kind of effect in the future. But a substance, undergoing this kind of intervention or causal process, need not lose its natural causal efficacy. The implication is not that we are modes of God—as Rutherford puts it, “[i]n defending [his] account of the dependence of created substances on God, Leibniz delicately balances claims for God’s immanence and God’s transcendence” (Rutherford 2021, 17)—but that our causal agency is analogous to God’s. Causally speaking at least, we are made in the image of God.

Moreover, Leibniz is not suggesting that something that has real causality must necessarily have productive causal power, since final causes figure somehow into his account of the causal activity of created substances: “perceptions in the monad arise from one another by the laws of appetites, or by the laws of the final causes of good and evil, which consist in notable perceptions, ordered or disordered” (Principles of Nature and Grace §3 GP vi 598/AG 207). Final causes appear to be genuine causes in Leibniz’s metaphysics, helping serve to “distinguish the actions of God from those of creatures” (Discourse on Metaphysics §8); however, echoing Aristotle, final causes are not productive causes.

Leibniz wants to reconcile continual creation with creaturely causal power and activity in order to defend concurrentism, and now we can see that a promising answer (at least as a way of understanding Leibniz) is to understand continual creation as a kind of emanation. And so, continual creation need not be understood as an occasionalist doctrine. But in what sense precisely are created substances genuine causes? What grounds the causal power, activity, and (relative) autonomy of creatures? We need to gain a better sense of Leibniz’s account of intrasubstantial or immanent causality.

7. Efficient Causation

To understand Leibniz’s theory of intrasubstantial causality better (and also to acquaint ourselves with some interpretive difficulties), let us first focus on considerations having to do with efficient causation. Then, in the following section, we will discuss final and formal causation.

A point of terminological clarification is needed. According to Leibniz, the terms ‘efficiently cause’ and ‘produce’ are synonymous: “It must be admitted that in saying that ‘efficient cause’ is what produces and ‘effect’ is what is produced, you are merely dealing in synonyms” (NE 228). Elsewhere, Leibniz defines ‘efficient cause’ as ‘active cause’ (A vi, 2, 490; C 472).

From at least 1686 and on, Leibniz consistently refers to the causal efficacy or productivity of substances. Here is a representative text:

Anything which occurs in what is strictly a substance must be a case of action in the metaphysically rigorous sense of something which occurs in the substance spontaneously arising out [arrive] of its own depths. (NE 210)

Whether passive substances truly exist or not, active agencies “are responsible for whatever activity is attributed to the former” (Shapere, 45). Leibniz’s principle (which has its ancestors principally in Stoicism) is this: “Whatever is fundamentally explanatory must be an active principle” (Shapere, 45). The purely passive cannot do anything unless it is acted upon. At times, Leibniz seems to think that only the truly active exists: “we can show from the inner truths of metaphysics that what is not active is nothing, for there is no such thing as a mere potentiality to act without any initial action” (“On the True Method in Philosophy and Theology” W 64 (1686)). If all things that exist are substances, and the essence of substance is activity, then passive “substances” do not truly exist, since they are passive, that is, not active (Shapere, 46).

Consider this passage where Leibniz not only attributes causal efficacy or activity to finite substances, but also causal efficiency or productivity:

Bayle asserts, for instance, that by purely philosophical meditations one can never attain to an established certainty that we are the efficient cause of our volitions. But this is a point which I do not concede to him: for the establishment of this system demonstrates beyond a doubt that in the course of nature each substance is the sole cause of all its actions, and that it is free of all physical influence from every other substance, save the customary cooperation of God. (Theodicy §300)

However, Nicholas Jolley, among others, insists that “[a]lthough Leibniz may say that it is substances which produce their states, this is only a loose way of speaking; in strictness, it is perceptual states which causally produce other perceptual states of the same substance” (Jolley 1998, 605; see also Rutherford 2017). But does Leibniz indeed take perceptions or perceptual states to be efficient causes? The answer is surprisingly unclear. One problem is that (almost) invariably the language Leibniz employs to describe the relationship among perceptions or perceptual states is not explicitly causal (in the efficient or productive sense at least). Leibniz predominantly uses terms such as ‘consequence’, ‘suite’, ‘sequitur’, ‘résultat’, ‘tend’, and ‘derivantur’, when speaking of the passage from one perceptual state to another (GP ii 47, 91f, 372; GP iv 440, 521), terms which should make us hesitate in automatically attributing to Leibniz a theory of causally efficacious perceptions or perceptual states. Here are two representative texts:

Everything occurs in each substance in consequence of [en consequence du] the first state that God gave it in creating it … (Letter to Arnauld, April 30, 1687, GP ii, 91)

… subsequent [perceptions] are derived [derivantur] from preceding ones (Letter to Des Bosses, GP ii, 372)

This is just not the kind of language we should expect to find from Leibniz when speaking of perceptions as efficient or productive causes (Bobro and Clatterbaugh 1996). Further, when Leibniz does claim that perceptions or perceptual states produce other states, often it is difficult to be sure if such a claim is to be taken strictly. Consider these claims:

And it can further be said that the representation of the end in the soul is the efficient cause of the representation of the means in the same. (LS 23)

… the representation of the present state of the universe in the soul of the dog will produce in it the representation of the following state of the same universe, just as in objects the preceding state effectively produces the following state of the world. In a soul, the representations of causes are the causes of the representations of effects. (GP iv, 533/WF 78)

Laurence Carlin takes these passages to mean that “deliberation of means depends on perceptions of ends in the sense that the latter are the efficient causes of the former” (Carlin 2006, 226). Now, neither the term “perception” nor “perceptual state” is used in these passages, but in alignment with Carlin’s interpretation Leibniz defines perception as “the internal state of the monad representing external things” (Principles of Nature and Grace §4/AG 20) and “the passing state which involves and represents a multitude in the unity” (Monadology §14/AG 214). However, there is another passage from the Theodicy that may indicate that these passages are not to be taken strictly:

When we say that an intelligent substance is moved by the goodness of its object, we do not assert that this object is necessarily a being existing outside the substance, and it is enough for us that it be conceivable: for its representation acts in the substance, or rather the substance acts upon itself, insofar as it is disposed and influenced by this representation. (Remarks on King §21 in Theodicy)

This passage can be read to mean that speaking of a substance’s representation, acting as an efficient cause, is only a loose way of speaking; strictly speaking, it is the substance, or better, the power or active force of the substance, that acts in accordance with this representation, which is presumably functioning as a final cause (Bobro 2008). Carlin makes what looks to be the same point: “it appears that it is force that is the proper efficient cause of perceptual states, as opposed to previous perceptual states themselves, which presumably (qua static representative states) are causally inefficient” (Carlin 2004, 369). But there is some ambiguity here: What type of active force is causally efficient? While Bobro and Clatterbaugh (1996), Bobro (2008), and Julia Jorati (2015, 2017) locate efficient causality in the substance and its primitive active force (as defined above in §5), Carlin finds efficient causality in its derivative force.

In sum, there is a philosophical worry with attributing causal efficacy or productivity to perceptions on Leibniz’s metaphysics. The question is whether perceptions can function as active agencies (and so efficient causes) for Leibniz. In Leibniz’s ontology, it appears that what is active is a true, enduring unity and a center of force—namely, a substance. Leibniz writes that “everything that acts is an individual substance” (“On Nature Itself” AG 160). To understand perceptual states as causally ordered, in the sense that efficient causal and not merely lawful or regular or final causal relations obtain among them, is to subscribe to an event oriented model of causation. But Leibniz, not only like his medieval predecessors but also many of his contemporaries, subscribes to a rather different model—one in which a real cause must be a substance or a power of that substance. (More on this in the section on causal models—§9.) Therefore, unless perceptions are genuine substances and thus not events, it seems to follow that, for Leibniz, perceptions are, in themselves, causally inefficacious.

8. Final and Formal Causation

If Leibniz does not think that perceptions can function as efficient or productive causes, why does Leibniz even speak of later perceptions as natural consequences of earlier perceptions, if not causally? There seem to be two good reasons for this. First, there is a purpose or end guiding the unfolding of perceptions in each substance. The substance (or primitive power) acts efficiently in order to fulfill this end. Such an end may be called a final cause. But there is no consensus on this. At least one scholar thinks that, for Leibniz, created substances have only efficient causation, not final causation (see Bennett 2001, 270 and 2005, 139f). We will discuss this a bit later.

Second, Leibniz wishes to ground his Law of Continuity—that all change in nature is continuous (i.e., in nature there are no gaps). This points to formal causation in substances. In other words, the picture we come away with in Leibniz is that a substance’s perceptions, representing final and formal causes, rationally determine that substance’s future states. The object of a perception is a final cause insofar as each perception specifies why certain states should be produced rather than others. Perceptions themselves are formal causes insofar as they specify the content of a substance’s future states.

Let us first consider how the objects of perceptions operate as final causes. Leibniz speaks of perceptual states as unfolding spontaneously in monads according to a metaphysically basic order of causal relations. But the fact that perceptions are automatically and irreducibly causally ordered need only mean that “prior” perceptions contain the reason for subsequent perceptions. This is the way Jan Cover puts it: Temporal priority depends on a relation of “involves a reason for” (Cover 1997, 317). Now, according to Leibniz, “A reason is a known truth whose connection with some less well-known truth leads us to give our assent to the latter. But it is called reason, especially and par excellence, if it is the cause not only of our judgment but also of the truth itself—which makes it known as an a priori reason” (NE 475). As mentioned earlier, Leibniz also speaks of appetitions as a substance’s “tendencies to go from one perception to another” (GP vi, 598/AG 207). That perceptions come and go according to final causes is apparent in the following passage from the Principles of Nature and Grace §3: “perceptions in the monad arise from one another by the laws of appetites, or by the laws of the final causes of good and evil, which consist in notable perceptions, ordered or disordered” (GP vi, 598/AG 207). Leibniz writes in the same work: “the future can be read in the past; the distant is expressed in the proximate” (GP vi, 605/AG 211). The moral is that perceptions function as teleological explanations, which is reminiscent of Aristotle’s account of final causation, where natural processes are completed and regulated by a final state or end, towards which they tend.

It is also worth noting that Leibniz does not limit his doctrine of final causation to the conscious activity of rational agents, for he holds that a mental state can function as a final cause without our being aware of it (Jorati 2013, 47ff; 2015; 2017, 81). In a letter to Sophie Charlotte, Leibniz writes: “So that even in our instinctive or involuntary actions, where it seems only the body plays a part, there is in the soul an appetite for good or an aversion to evil which directs it, even though our reflection is not able to pick it out in the confusion” (GP iii, 347/WF 224f). And, following Aristotle, nor does Leibniz restrict final causation to rational agents. The final cause of a plant or an animal is not a plan or intention. Rather, it is whatever lies at the end of the regular series of developmental changes that it undergoes.

Some have denied the presence of real final causation in created substances. While final causes are involved in perception, strictly speaking genuine final causes are not in created substances. Rather final causes are in God, and created substances unfold causally (in the efficient sense) according to their internal laws. Thus, on this interpretation, final causality is explained in terms of God’s decisions. So while appetite (roughly, the desire to meet a need) has a distinctly teleological flavor—which Leibniz himself confirms: “the laws of appetites are the laws of the final causes of good and evil” (Principles of Nature and Grace §3/FW 259)—arguably Leibniz goes too far in describing appetites as teleological. Jonathan Bennett, following Robert Adams, argues that Leibniz’s “fundamental theory says only that the individual monad runs through its history in accordance with laws given to it by God, laws that govern the efficient causality of its unfolding” (Bennett 2005, 139). So, strictly speaking, what governs the perceptual changes in substances is not based on the desirability of subsequent perceptions (as the teleological reading of appetite would suggest) but rather the following of laws of nature (Adams, 318).

Whether or not teleology plays an important role in Leibniz’s metaphysics, it definitely plays a role in his physics, especially regarding optics. In contrast to Descartes and Spinoza, who famously reject final causality and speak very little of it, even in opposition to it (although, for a partly contrary reading of Descartes, see Simmons 2001), Leibniz insists that final causes may be ‘‘useful not only for admiring the ingenuity of the great workman, but also for discovering something useful in physics and medicine’’ (Discourse on Metaphysics §22/FW 74). This is not an offhanded comment; “Leibniz returns to the topic with an almost obsessive regularity” (McDonough 2009, 506).

For instance, Leibniz employs teleology in the form of his “Most Determined Path Principle,” to ground his own derivation of the two main laws of geometrical optics, namely, the Law of Reflection and the Law of Refraction. Leibniz also explains how his conception of teleology within nature can ward off other sorts of objections; for instance, Ockham’s Razor type of objections. Leibniz is keen to advertise how teleological explanation can apply neatly to a wide range of natural events (McDonough 2009, 507).

McDonough (2008) argues that Leibniz’s explanations of events via efficient causation are in harmony with explanations of natural events via (broadly speaking) final causes. These two lawful orders or explanations are co-fundamental; contrary to Hirschmann (1988), Adams (1994), and Bennett (2005), Leibniz is not stuck with one order dissolving back into the other. Hirschmann, for instance, thinks that, really, Leibniz is stuck with the efficient causal laws being reducible to the teleological ones, while Bennett, on the other hand, seems to think Leibniz is stuck with the reverse reduction.

While Cartesians thought that Leibniz went too far in invoking teleology in explaining natural phenomena, it is evident that Leibniz is not asking us to go back to an Aristotelian or Scholastic way of engaging in natural philosophy, that is, to a “thick” conception of natural teleology (McDonough 2009, 520f). Leibniz instead adopts a “thin” conception of natural teleology, to use McDonough’s term.

Let us now explain the presence of formal causation in perception. Some thinkers contemporaneous with Leibniz, most notably Pierre Bayle, found the apparent lack of continuity among our perceptions to be deeply problematic. We are often genuinely surprised by the content of our perceptions, some of which seem utterly disconnected from and radically unlike prior perceptions. But, given the Law of Continuity, Leibniz cannot allow perceptions to arise in a monad that are radically unlike preceding perceptions. To solve this problem, Leibniz offers his theory of “petites” or unconscious perceptions and says that this apparent lack of continuity in the perceptions of the individual substance results from our overlooking the complex multitude of unconscious perceptions, which flow, at every moment, from the individual’s nature. But the doctrine of petite perceptions alone is not sufficient to ground continuity. Rather, it is the rational relation among perceptions that serves to guarantee continuity in perceptual content. Leibniz speaks of the “marks [les marques]” that each perception of a substance contains for all other perceptions that substance will ever have (Discourse on Metaphysics §8/AG 41). We take it that this relation among perceptions points to perceptions being formal causes; that is to say, a substance’s present states specify fully the content of its future states.

So, to summarize, what causes the changes in perceptions? Three species of cause: efficient causes (in accordance with laws of mind and active forces), final causes (in accordance with the law of “appetites” and ultimately God’s aim of universal and maximum harmony), and formal causes (in accordance with the Law of Continuity). Leibniz’s account of intrasubstantial causation therefore involves a tight connection between efficient, final, and formal causes (Rozemond 2009, 294). This should not be surprising, since Leibniz tells us that “[a] cause in the realm of things corresponds to a reason in the realm of truths, which is why causes themselves—and especially final ones—are often called reasons” (NE 475).

None of this should be surprising. Hume may have endorsed just one species of cause—efficient—but final and formal causation did not die with the advent of mechanistic science and philosophy in the seventeenth century. And not only with Leibniz: Gassendi, Boyle, and Newton all accommodated final or teleological causation in their systems. Spinoza is really the only known philosopher in the seventeenth century who truly has no place for final causation in his philosophy, except in the sense that artifacts have final causes (e.g., chairs serve a purpose and carpenters create them in part to achieve that purpose). On the other hand, it remains an open question whether Spinoza endorses formal causation in his metaphysics of substance.

9. Causal Models

It has been noted that “[p]erhaps the greatest difference between a contemporary concept of causation and a seventeenth century concept is one of model. Following in Hume’s footsteps, contemporary philosophers customarily conceive causation as a relation between events (e.g., my flipping the switch caused the light to come on) while seventeenth century philosophers thought of it more as a relation among substances, their qualities, and their ‘powers’ (e.g., I cause my idea of justice)” (Frankel, 57).

Yet this earlier model of causation possesses at least one virtue that the contemporary one does not. It has the distinct advantage of avoiding any problematic regress of causal explanation. Once a causal sequence of events is laid out, we can always ask why that sequence, and not another, occurred. But an explanation of this sequence, according to an event/event model of causation, does not preclude the same question “Why that sequence of events?” being asked of it again and again. On the other hand, Leibniz does not think that the power or will, which are not events at all, but faculties of an agency or agent, need any explaining. The regress of explanation stops abruptly with the substance. In a letter to De Volder (June 30, 1704), he writes: “To … ask why there is perception and appetite in simple substances is to inquire about something ultramundane, so to speak, and to demand reasons of God why he has willed things to be such as we conceive them to be” (GP ii, 271/L 538). Furthermore, the central message of Leibniz’s essay, Against Barbaric Physics (c. 1713), seems to be that since the actions of substances are in fact spontaneous, there is no way of explaining change in monads unless we posit some force or power that drives substantial action. If it turns out that substances just are forces or powers, as Julia Jorati (2015, 2017) and John Whipple (2015) maintain, it is no violation of this causal model. At any rate, without this agency in monads, there would be no cause sufficient to determine the whole sequence of events and thus no adequate causal explanation of the totality of actions (i.e., perceptions) on the part of substances. And, besides failing to break out of the cycle of explanation that appears to plague event/event models of causation, such a picture appears to violate Leibniz’s Principle of Sufficient Reason:

Thus the sufficient reason, which needs no other reason, must be outside this series of contingent things, and must be found in a substance which is its cause, and which is a necessary being, carrying the reason of its existence with itself. Otherwise, we would not yet have a sufficient reason where one could end the series. (Principles of Nature and Grace §8 GP vi, 604/AG 210)

Hence, we should understand Leibniz’s statement in a letter to Arnauld (May 1686) that “there is always something to be conceived in the subject which provides the explanation why this predicate or this event belongs to it, or why a particular event happened rather than not” (GP ii, 45/PM 60), not in terms of some ideal event contained in the subject as carrying the correlative explanatory role, but the power or principle of change of the subject. Note the equation of predicate with event. Events are not subjects.

Further lending credence to the claim that Leibniz postulates a substance-accident model of causation, it appears that whenever Leibniz describes the causal relation found within substances, even those depictions that are best understood as metaphorical, those depictions themselves point to a non-homogeneous account of the intrasubstantial causal relata. That is, intrasubstantial causal relata do not involve components of the same kinds. Whether he speaks of the actualizations of an essence, predicates of a subject, values of a function, perceptions of an appetite, cogitations of a will, ends of reason, harmonies of a rule of order, it is clear that Leibniz envisions “effects” which are different in kind from their “causes.” The essence of a substance is not itself an actualization; the function of a substance is not itself a value of a function (Cover & O’Leary-Hawthorne, 229); a substance’s appetite is not itself a perception; the will of a substance is not itself a cogitation, it is a faculty; the reason governing the substance is not itself the end to which it strives; and the rule of order is not itself an instance of the harmonious agreement among substances.

All told, it seems that Leibniz ascribes to a heterogeneous account of causation, where the cause is different in kind from its effect. Ultimately, Leibniz offers a theory of intrasubstantial causation that incorporates both efficient, final causes, and formal causes, where only substances—or perhaps their powers—can be efficient causes and perceptions have a teleological as well as a formal function.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

Leibniz’s Works

[A] Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz: Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe. Edited by the German Academy of Science. Darmstadt and Berlin: Berlin Academy, 1923–. Cited by series, volume, and page.
[AG] Philosophical Essays. Edited and translated by Roger Ariew and Daniel Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.
[C] Opuscules et Fragments Inédits de Leibniz. Edited by Louis Couturat. Paris: Felix Alcan, 1903.
[FW] Philosophical Texts. Edited and translated by Richard Francks and Roger Woolhouse. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
[GM] Leibnizens Mathematische Schriften. Edited by C. I. Gerhardt. Berlin: Weidman, 1875–90. Cited by volume and page.
[GP] Die Philosophischen Schriften von Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin: Weidman, 1875–1890. Cited by volume and page.
[H] Theodicy. Edited by Austin Farrer and translated by E.M. Huggard. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1952.
[L] Philosophical Papers and Letters. Edited by Leroy Loemker, 2nd ed. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1969.
[LDV] The Leibniz-De Volder Correspondence: With Selections from the Correspondence Between Leibniz and Johann Bernoulli. Edited and translated by Paul Lodge. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013.
[LS] The Leibniz-Stahl Controversy. Edited and translated by François Duchesneau and Justin E. H. Smith. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2016.
[PM] Philosophical Writings. Translated and edited by Mary Morris and G.H.R. Parkinson. London: Dent, 1973.
[NE] New Essays on Human Understanding. Translated and edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1982.
[S] The Shorter Leibniz Texts. Translated and edited by Lloyd Strickland. Bloomsbury Academic, 2006.
[SCH] Leibniz: Monadology and other Philosophical Essays. Translated by Paul Schrecker and Anne Martin Schrecker. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill Company, 1965.
[W] Leibniz: Selections. Edited by Philip P. Wiener. New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1951.
[WF] Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts. Edited and translated by Roger Woolhouse and Richard Francks. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1997.

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