Origen

First published Mon Mar 10, 2014; substantive revision Tue Jul 21, 2026

Origen (c. 185–c. 253) was a Christian exegete and theologian, who made copious use of the allegorical method in his commentaries, and (though later considered a heretic) laid the foundations of philosophical theology for the church. He was taught by a certain Ammonius, whom the majority of scholars identify as Ammonius Saccas, the teacher of Plotinus; many believe, however, that the external evidence will not allow us to identify him with the Origen whom Plotinus knew as a colleague. He was certainly well-instructed in philosophy and made use of it as an ancillary to the exposition and harmonization of scripture. This was the task that he undertook in most of his extant writings, and the more systematic theology is founded on the ecclesiastical doctrines of the Trinity, the incarnation, salvation after death and the inerrancy of scripture.

Origen was the first Christian to speak of three “hypostases” in the Trinity and to use the term homoousios (though only by analogy) of the relation between the second of these hypostases and the first. The Father, or first person, is nevertheless the only one who is autotheos, God in the fullest sense, whereas the Son is his dunamis or power and the Spirit a dependent being, operative only in the elect. All three are eternal and incorporeal, the Son being known as Wisdom in relation to the Father and Logos (reason, word) in relation to the world. In this capacity he is the shepherd of rational beings the logikoi, who, according to his later critics, were said in his lost writings to have been in origin incorporeal beings coeval with the world if not eternal, and currently imprisoned in material bodies only because of a cooling in their love. It is not so easy to demonstrate from his extant works that he held the material world in such contempt, though he certainly holds it to be created out of nothing and suspects that the concept of matter is philosophically redundant. Souls, in his view, are sent down into bodies (perhaps never more than once, though again some critics impute to him a doctrine of transmigration or chronic falling away from bliss). The soul remains indefeasibly free in its choices, and the misuse of this freedom is the cause of its captivity to the devil.

The deliverance of the soul is effected by the incarnation of the Logos, or second person of the Trinity, who assumes real body but remains fully God. His death on the Cross is a ransom to the devil, and his resurrection prefigures that of the saints, though he seems to imagine the body after death, in Platonic terms, as a tenuous vehicle of the soul. Scholars differ as to whether he envisages a final absorption of the body into incorporeal spirit. It is clear that he expects the vast majority of souls to endure a fiery purification after death, and that no soul will be excluded by God’s will from this purgatory. While he thinks it possible that some may be too debauched by their sins to repent, he also opines that the devil himself will at last make peace with God, though he cannot attain beatitude. In the present life, an anticipation of bliss in the presence of Christ can be enjoyed by the exegete who has fully mastered the spiritual meaning of the scriptures. These are the word of God to us because Christ the word is ubiquitously present in them, investing them with a threefold sense as he himself assumed body, soul and spirit for our sake in his sojourn on earth.

1. Origen’s Life and Work

The Greek name Origenes signifies “born of Horus,” an Egyptian falcon-headed deity. The Christian scholar of this name was a native of Alexandria (Eusebius, Church History 6.1), though it is only his detractor Epiphanius who says that he was also by race a Copt (Panarion 1.1). Eusebius records the jibe of the Neoplatonist Porphyry that Origen, though a Greek by education, became a Christian, whereas his philosophy teacher Ammonius, having once been a Christian, converted to a more lawful way of life (Church History 6.19.7). Although most scholars assume that this is Ammonius Saccas, the teacher of Plotinus, there was another philosopher of the same name, who is credited with “unequalled polymathy” by the philosopher Longinus at Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 20.49–50. (For further information see Edwards 1993: 179.) Eusebius, moreover, asserts that both Origen and his teacher were Christians throughout their lives (6.19.10); as evidence of the latter’s Christianity in his youth, he records that his father Leontius died as a martyr in 202, and that Origen himself, then 17, not only exhorted Leontius to persevere but thirsted for the same death (6.2.7). His mother could curb his enthusiasm only by hiding his clothes so that he was ashamed to leave the house (6.2.6). Eusebius also tells us that his sexual diffidence or his ascetic temper induced Origen to make himself literally a eunuch for the kingdom of heaven (6.8.2); the act is not unparalleled (Markschies 2007: 15–34), but Epiphanius was unable to verify the story (Panarion 64.2).

After his father’s death, Origen devoted himself to scholarship and became a notable teacher, perhaps succeeding Clement as head of the catechetical school in Alexandria (Eusebius, Church History 6.3.1 and 6.7–8.1; but cf. Osborn 2008: 19–21). He appears to have studied Hebrew with a converted Jew (First Principles 1.3.4 etc.), and one of his letters alludes to his studies in philosophy with an unnamed teacher (Eusebius, Church History 6.19.13). Among the works Eusebius says that he composed at this time, dictating to “more than seven stenographers” (6.23.2), were the first five books of his Commentary on John, eight books of a Commentary on Genesis, two books On the Resurrection and his major surviving work, a synthesis of scriptural teaching under the name First Principles (6.24). Of these the last survives entire, but only in the Latin of Rufinus. A few books of the Commentary on John survive in Greek, while portions of the work on the resurrection were preserved in a rejoinder by Methodius of Olympia, which itself survives only in the excerpts and epitomes of later authors (see Dechow 1977). It was also in Alexandria, in imitation of the Homeric scholars of the Hellenistic era, that Origen addressed himself to the preparation of his great Hexapla, in which a corrected edition of the Septuagint, the original, allegedly inspired translation of the Hebrew scriptures (3rd c. BC?), stood in parallel to the Hebrew and the renderings of other Greek translators (Eusebius, Church History 6.16. See further Neuschäfer 1987; Dorival 2013).

According to Eusebius, his talents excited the jealousy of Demetrius, the Bishop of Alexandria, who cited his self-castration as a reason for refusing to ordain him as a presbyter (Eusebius, Church History 6.8.4–5). Nevertheless, when Origen left Alexandria in 216 to escape the ferocity of the Emperor Caracalla, Demetrius recalled him from Caesarea, where he had already begun to increase his reputation (6.19.16–19). On a subsequent visit to Caesarea he was ordained a presbyter, and took up residence in the city (6.8.5; 6.23.4). Having commenced a commentary on the Song of Songs in the course of a sojourn in Athens (6.32.2), he completed this in Caesarea, together with his Commentary on Matthew and his refutation of the True Logos, a pagan satire on Christianity written around 170 by an otherwise unknown Celsus (6.36.2). Never rising above the rank of presbyter, he was often employed, according to the custom of the times, as a mouthpiece of orthodoxy in trials of heretics before an episcopal synod. Eusebius commends his refutation of Beryllus of Bostra (6.33), adding that he was summoned to play a similar role in Arabia (6.37), and that in his books he tore the mask from heresies old and new. To this period of his life we should also date the Dialogue with Heraclides, discovered at Tura in 1951 (Chadwick 1959). Yet even at the height of his career, his orthodoxy was impugned. Jerome knows of a letter in which he rebuts the accusation that he had prophesied the salvation of the devil (Crouzel 1973); the same letter indicates, according to Jerome, that his teachings had given offence to Heraclas, his former student who had now succeeded Demetrius as bishop of Alexandria. It is clear at least that no censure was extended to Dionysius, the successor of Heraclas and another of Origen’s pupils. In Caesarea the ageing theologian suffered tortures under Decius in 251 (Eusebius, Church History 6.39.5) and, according to Eusebius, died as Gallus came to the throne in 253 (7.1.1). His assertion that Origen was then in his seventieth year is inconsistent with the date implied for his birth (185), which is of course the more likely of the two dates to have been estimated rather than known.

His library in Caesarea was inherited by his admirer Pamphilus, then by Eusebius as a disciple of Pamphilus and bishop of that city. It also fell to Eusebius to finish the Apology which Pamphilus had begun to write against Origen’s first detractors. From this work and the philippics of such enemies of Origen as Jerome, Theophilus of Alexandria, Epiphanius of Salamis, and the Emperor Justinian, we can cull fragments of writings that have otherwise perished (see further Clark 1992). We also possess an anthology of choice excerpts from his writings the Philokalia (McLynn 2004), and two short texts On Prayer and To the Martyrs. Much had already been lost by attrition in the time of Eusebius (died c. 339); more may have perished after Origen was anathematized in or around the year 553. Many of Origen’s Commentaries and Homilies, like the First Principles, survive only in the Latin of Rufinus, who translated him in the fourth century with reverence but not always with fidelity (see further Pace 1990). The following synopsis of Origen’s thought is based primarily on the extant corpus in Greek and Latin, making use of polemical matter only with the caution that is now enjoined by the most learned scholars.

2. The Intellectual Milieu

Scholars are apt to speak casually of Origen’s Platonism, more technically of his “middle” Platonism, most commonly, and not often with conscious paradox, of his Christian Platonism. The Lutheran theologian Anders Nygren (1953), who protested that a Christian Platonist is not a Christian, differed only in his judgment of the facts, not in his reading of them, from his critics J.M. Rist (1964) and Catherine Osborne (1994), who maintained that Platonism in Origen’s hands was not so much an adulteration as a salutary refinement of the gospel. Nevertheless, whatever the merits of Nygren’s theology, Origen would have agreed with him in the matter of nomenclature. The majority of his explicit references to Plato are to be found in the work Against Celsus, a reply to a dead polemicist who is nowadays characterized as a middle Platonist, though Origen hints that he may have been an Epicurean (Against Celsus 1.8; see further Bergjan 2001). Origen undertakes to show that the simplest disciple of God’s word knows him better than the philosophers who seek him by their own methods (Against Celsus 7.42), that Plato misrepresents the fall and diminishes the Creator, that if his myths are deep, the biblical allegories are deeper and less perverse, and that Numenius, the foremost Platonist of recent times, has spoken of both Moses and Jesus with esteem (Against Celsus 4.51 etc.).

The Bible (consisting for Origen only of the New Testament and the Septuagint) is the matrix of every argument in this as in all his writings; while it would be naive, and a contradiction of his own practice, to deny that his exegesis was conditioned by philosophical assumptions, the propaedeutic to biblical study in his school at Caesarea was not Platonism but a professedly unprejudiced survey of all the Greek schools which admitted a doctrine of providence ([Gregory Thaumaturgus], Thanksgiving 13.151–152; on authorhip see Rizzi 1992 and Celia 2019, 133–172 ). In a latter to Gregory Thaumaturgus he assigns to Greek thought an ancillary role in the elucidation of the scriptures; while he was less inclined than his predecessors to accuse the Greeks of plagiarizing their philosophical views from the books of Moses, he held that, since every exercise of reason is inspired by Christ the Logos, a Christian has as much right to the tools of pagan philosophy as the Israelites had to reimburse their labour from the “spoils of the Egyptians” (Philokalia 13; see further Martens 2012: 29–33). His non-Chrstian sources included Philo (Cover 2025), Alexander of Aphrodisias (Ramelli 2014), the elder Stoics (Limone 2018: 188–193) and perhaps the lexicon of Herophilus (Markschies 2007; cf. Limone 2018: 225–304). It has even been argued that the hidden wellspring of his philosophy is Anaxagoras (Tzamalikos 2016). Nevertheless the author whom he cites most frequently, and with whom he feels most affinity, is incontrovertibly Plato, and he has often been styled a Christian Platonist (Ramelli 2009 etc.).

The epithet “Platonist” will of course be warranted if Origen the Christian is identified with the Origen whom Porphyry represents as one of the privileged disciples of Ammonius Saccas, the Alexandrian teacher of Plotinus. According to Porphyry (Life of Plotinus 3.20–38) this Origen swore an oath with Plotinus and a third disciple, Herennius, not to reveal the esoteric doctrines of Ammonius after the latter’s death in 243 A.D. This story implies both personal intimacy and geographical proximity, yet Origen the Christian was at this time almost sixty (twenty years senior to Plotinus), had left Alexandria for Caesarea some years before, and already had a multitude of books to his name as a Christian teacher. Porphyry does not allude to these lucubrations in his Life of Plotinus, but says that the Origen he refers to breached the pact by issuing first a treatise On Daemons, then another, with the title That the King is the Only Maker, in the reign of Gallienus (253–268). He includes in the Life a letter, written in 262 or 263 by his former tutor Longinus, which ascribes to Origen only the work On Daemons (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 20.36–45). All scholars agree that Origen the Christian could not have written anything in the last years of Gallienus; if we can trust Eusebius, he did not live to see this reign at all, but died in that of Gallienus’ predecessor Gallus (251–253). So, if this Origen is our author, Porphyry must at least have misstated the period at which he violated the agreement. Those who contend that there was only one Origen reply that it is the chronology of Eusebius that must be flawed because, although his account of Origen’s youth implies that he was born in 185, he asserts that his death occurred in his seventieth year, and hence not earlier than 254, the first year of Gallienus (see further Beatrice 1992). The same apologists argue that Porphyry fails to mention his Christian writings either because he despised them or (more cogently) because the publication of them did not violate the oath (cf. Ramelli 2009). If this argument is to prevail, a reason must also be furnished for the silence of Longinus on this part of Origen’s work, the Christian works of Origen must be regarded as aids (in some degree) to the reconstruction of the teaching of Ammonius, and something must be said to explain the failure of Origen’s Christian detractors in late antiquity to cite the two works—still extant, according to Proclus—which he added to the Neoplatonic canon. The current trend is to argue for both the fluidity and the mutual receptivity of Christianity and Platonism (Riedweg 2018; Gemeinhardt 2018), but Origen betrays little awareness of either in Against Celsus, the one work in which he repeatedly cites philosophers by name.

3. Doctrine of God

The opening chapter of Origen’s First Principles is a paradigmatic instance of his application of philosophic reasoning to biblical exegesis. He assumes here what he asserts elsewhere, that the nature of God is known to us only by his own revelation in the sacred text. The scriptures tell us both that God is fire and that God is spirit, but Origen warns us not to deduce, from a literal construction of these terms, that he is a body (Princ. 1.1.1). It is possible but not certain, that he has in mind the Stoicizing theology of Tertullian: God, after all, is Spirit at John 4.24 and a consuming fire at Deuteronomy 4.24, and few of Origen’s contemporaries would have doubted the corporeality of fire or spirit. In urging the contrary position, that God is incorporeal. Origen speaks not only for the Platonists but for all the Greek apologists of the church: the prevalent thought of his time (and perhaps of ours) required that if God is to be invisible, immutable, eternal, omnipresent, and irresistible in power he must not be confined to one place or composed of labile matter. The philosophical sympathies of Origen become evident when he goes on to equate this bodiless god with nous or intellect. In Plato, nous had been an occasional synonym for the Demiurge, while Numenius of Apamea, half a century before Origen, had subordinated the Demiurge, as a second nous, to the “first nous”, which is Plato’s form of the Good. Although the Good in Plato is superior to ousia or being, Numenius like the majority of Platonists before Origen, appears to have posited nothing higher than intellect; Origen too—in this respect a good Platonist—is less inclined to apophatic theology than Philo the Alexandrian Jew or his Christian predecessors in Egypt, Clement and Basilides. To explain the selective use of the definite article in John 1.1, he characterizes the Father (ho theos) as autotheos, very God, in contrast to the Son who is merely theos (CommJohn 2.7.16–18); when he suggests, however, that the Father is higher than nous (Against Celsus 7.45), he does not develop a metaphysical theory, any more than he develops his hint in the same work that God may be the Aristotelian “thought of thoughts” (see further Whittaker 1969). Tobias Böhm’s ingenious suggestion (2002) that for Origen the being of God is his nous, and his unity that which is higher than nous, assumes that he was acquainted with the first and second hypotheses of the Parmenides, a dialogue of which he evinces little knowledge in his extant works.

Whether he is noetic or supranoetic, Origen’s God cannot be known to us in his essence, nor is it by his ousia, or essence, but by his dunamis, or power, that he acts upon other beings (On Prayer 25.3). His dunamis, which is infinite and mediated by the second person of the Trinity, is the source of every dunamis that is exercised by his creatures, even by those who have fallen into apostasy and rebellion (CommJohn 1.39.291). On the other hand nothing, not even the second person, proceeds directly from the immutable ousia of God (CommJohn 13.25.153 and 20.18.157: see below). Yet, while he asserts that God is by nature impassible—in the sense that he is the agent, not the patient, in every transaction and cannot be moved by any external force—Origen is one of the first theologians to assert that he can suffer, in a sense, as God, and not only by virtue of the incarnation (Homilies on Ezekiel 6.1; see Osborne 1994: 164–184). This suffering takes the form of commiseration for the plight of his sinful creatures, never of sorrow on his own account. Compassion supposes knowledge, and Origen appears to have been untroubled by the difficulties that arise from the ascription of contingent knowledge to an eternal being. That God transcends the temporal order is evident from his answer to those who ask what God was doing before he created the world: the question, he argues, presupposes a time before the beginning of the world, but reflection teaches us that time and the revolutions of the cosmos are coeval (Princ. 3.5.3). This is a Platonic doctrine, but it had now become common for Platonists to argue, in submission to Aristotle, that the temporal world has neither end nor beginning and is “generated” only in the sense that it is a theatre of vicissitude, in which all that exists has come into being and will pass away.

The agent whom we call the Second Person of the Trinity is “another god” at Dialogue with Heraclides 2 and a “second god” on two occasions in his work Against Celsus (5.39, 5.61). This appellation is not attested in earlier Christian prose, though it is anticipated in Philo and Numenius. It does not occur in works addressed by Origen to Christians of sound faith, not even in those which show no fear of subordinating the Son to the Father—an indication perhaps that it was avoided because it savoured of polytheism and not because it belied the equality of the divine persons (Edwards 2006). It seems that in Numenius it is the contemplation of the first intellect by the second that gives rise to the forms, or Platonic ideas; Origen, as a Christian, holds that the contemplation is mutual, since “no-one knows the Son but the Father and no-one knows the Father but the Son” (Matthew 11.27). Thus he maintains, on the one hand, that the Son, as truth (John 14.6), knows all that is in the mind of the Father; the infamous proviso that the Son does not see the Father signifies only that within the Godhead vision is not mediated by our physical organs (Princ. 1.1.8). On the other hand, when we read that the Son is the wisdom and power of the Father (1 Corinthians 1.24) and that the world was created through him (Hebrews 1.2), we are to understand that he is that divine helpmate who declares at Proverbs 8.22 that the Lord created her in the beginning of his ways, and at Wisdom 7.26 that she is the mirror of his unspotted majesty. The verb “created” in this text (which Origen prefers to the alternative reading “possessed”) does not imply that the Son has a temporal beginning, but that, having no other substrate than the Father’s will, he expresses that will more perfectly than the things that are “made” from matter. It is inconceivable that the Father could ever have lacked wisdom, and equally inconceivable to Origen that this wisdom could ever have taken a different form from the one that it now possesses as the second person or hypostasis of the Trinity (Princ. 1.2.2). He is the first theologian to state unequivocally that the “three hypostases” which constitute the Trinity are eternal not only in nature, but in their hypostatic character; there was never a time when wisdom was the latent thought of the Father and had not yet come forth as speech.

Though Origen rejects it, this was in fact the prevailing thesis of most Christian writing in the second century when it undertook to explain the Fourth Evangelist’s assertion that the one who became incarnate was the Logos who had been with the Father as theos (god) if not ho theos (God) from the beginning (John 1.1). Since it was this speech or word that created the world, it was argued, there would have been no reason for it to exist before the creation as a distinct hypostasis. If he existed at all, it was as the logos endiathetos, the word within, which had not yet emerged from the mind as logos prophorikos, or verbal utterance. In this latent phase he could be identified (as Philo had already argued) with the paradigm, or world of forms, which supplies the Platonic demiurge with his pattern for the creation. Clement of Alexandria accepts this equation, albeit perhaps without denying the hypostatic eternity of the Logos (Edwards 2000). Origen, however, resists the interpretation of Logos as “speech” because there are some who take this to imply that the second person is merely a function or epiphenomenon of the first (CommJohn 1.24.151; Orbe 1991). Logos, in his view, is one of the numerous designations (epinoiai) which are conferred on the second person to define his relation, not to the Father (as “Son” and “Wisdom” do) but to his creatures (CommJohn 2.9.66 etc.): he is Logos as the paradigm and parent of all the logikai, or rational beings, who exercise reason only by participation in him. Before him Philo, Alcinous, and Clement of Alexandria had construed the forms as thoughts in the mind of the Demiurge, while Alexander of Aphrodisias held that they gave content to God’s eternal contemplation of himself (Armstrong 1960). Origen himself opines that all genera, all species and even the archetypes of all particular things are eternally present in the mind of God (Princ. 1.4.5), but he holds this as a Christian antidote to difficulties which arise from the temporality of the world (on First Principles 2.3.6 see below).

4. The Created Order

These difficulties, as Origen perceived, had not been fully resolved by the argument that since the world is coeval with time we need not ask what God was doing before he created it (see further Tzamalikos 2006: 179–271). From Genesis 1.1 we learn that God created the world in the beginning, and from John 1.1 that the Logos was with him in the beginning; but as we are also told that God created all things in wisdom, Origen takes this beginning to be not a temporal origin but the eternal desideratum of existence who is also the second person of the Trinity (CommJohn 1.39.289). It follows, however, that if this temporal world is the only one, an infinite cause has exhausted itself in a finite effect. Perhaps it was in the hope of evading this paradox that Origen interpreted Solomon’s dictum, “there is nothing new under the sun” (Ecclesiastes 1.10) to mean that worlds have existed before the present one (Princ. 3.1.6). This manoeuvre, however, will bring no escape unless one posits an infinite succession of worlds before and after the present one, and even Origen’s enemies do not say that he went so far. An endless series, after all, would be sempiternal rather than eternal, and the Stoics might have replied that their belief in the perpetual reduplication of the same cosmos—a belief disowned by Origen (Cels. 4. 68)—comes closer to matching timeless activity with a timeless product. A better solution than either of these, in Origen’s view, was to posit a noetic realm, created but eternal, populated by logika, or rational entities, under the hegemony of the logos, and preceding ours in the ontological hierarchy rather than in the temporal continuum (Princ. 2.9.4). Evidence for this conceit could be found in the creation of a heaven and earth at Genesis 1.1 before the creation of the visible firmament (Genesis Homilies 1.5). To the modern mind this is forced exegesis, representing the triumph of philosophy over philology; the philosophy, however, is not that of any Greek school, but of a Christian who has set himself a conundrum by his fidelity to Moses. It is a striking observation, however we explain it, that the forms of particular things which coexist in the mind of Origen’s God with the genera and species are not attested in any pagan Platonist before Plotinus, his younger contemporary and (as most believe) a fellow-pupil of Ammonius Saccas (cf. Plotinus, Enneads 5.7).

As the absolute and transcendent dunamis of the Father (Cels. 1.66; CommJohn 1.18.107 etc.), the second person is properly the lord of every dunamis in heaven and earth (Cels. 5.45). At the same time, it can be said that he is the food of the celestial dunameis who have remained true to the Creator, while Satan is the food of those who have fallen (On Prayer 27.12). It is the angelic dunameis who keep watch over his cradle at the time of his nativity (Cels. 1.61), and who sometimes form a retinue at the scenes where he performs those works of power which we call miracles (CommJohn 2.4.40). This polysemic usage of the term, which mirrors that of the New Testament, presents no difficulty so long as every other dunamis is conceived as a lower or local manifestation of the undivided power which appertains to him as Logos. As we have seen, this term defines his hegemonic relation to the created order; Wisdom is another of his biblical appellations, yet this Wisdom is the beginning in which the Logos was with God (CommJohn 1.39.289; see further Tzamalikos 2006: 119–178). However one accounts for these obscurities, it seems unlikely that Origen could have signed the Nicene Creed of 325, in which the Son is declared to be from the ousia of the Father, and therefore homoousios (of one essence, substance or nature) with him (cf. CommJohn 20.18.157). His reluctance may arise, as Ip 2022: 161–162 suggests, from his fear of making the ousia divisible, and this falling into the Valentinian error of conceiving the Godhead as a material continuum. A community of nature between the two is asserted, however, at CommJohn 2.10.76); and in his Commentary on Hebrews, he deduces from Wisdom 7.26, where Wisdom is styled an aporroia or emanation of the Father, that the relation between the two persons of the Trinity is analogous to that which holds between an ointment and the exhalation which is homoousios with it (Pamphilus, Apology 99–104; see Edwards 1998). Pamphilus, in the translation of Rufinus, also credits him with the statement that the Son is from the substantia of the Father (cf. Tertullian, Against Praxeas 7.9); since this too is a comment on Hebrews 1.3 it is clear that substantia translates hypostasis, and Origen may have been the first to deduce a doctrine of three hypostases from this dictum that the Son is the impression of the Father’s hypostasis. While the term is biblical, his reading of it may have been informed by philosophical precursors: Ramelli 2012: 304 and 324 notes, for example, that the insistence that the Son has his own hypostasis at CommJohn 1.24.151 is foreshadowed by the phrase oikeia hypostasis at Alexander of Aphrodisias, Commentary on the Metaphysics, p. 83.23.

To say that the Son is from the Father’s substance, or even that he shares his nature, does not preclude the Son’s subordination to the Father, and we have little evidence that Christians in the time of Origen shrank from this position; if anything, they were more afraid of assertions of coeternity or equality that might seem to imply that the Son did not depend for his existence on the Father. Origen stipulates in his treatise On Prayer (15.1) that the Son should not receive the prayer of adoration which is offered to the Father because he differs from the Father in ousia and in substrate (hupokeimenon); the latter word is best understood with reference to the body that he assumed in the incarnation, and we cannot therefore be sure whether the ousia of which Origen speaks is that of the exalted Christ in his eternal or his human character. It is generally true that he takes fewer pains than later Christian authors to winnow what is said of the Son as second person of the Trinity from what is said of him as Jesus of Nazareth. When he compares the Father to a statue of infinite magnitude and the Son to a smaller statue accommodated to our perceptions, he begins as though the visible were a metaphor for the invisible, but ends by quoting Philippians 2.7 on the manifestation of Christ in the form of a slave (Princ. 1.2.6). Until the concerted assault on his reputation in the last quarter of the fourth century, Origen’s doctrine of the Trinity was less often cited with censure than with approval by champions of the Nicene Creed (Ramelli 2011)—though it should be observed that the Creed itself takes no view on subordinationism.

Origen strongly affirms the ontological dependence of the Spirit, or third hypostasis of the Trinity, on the second. To say otherwise would be to deny that he was brought into being, since the author of all that was brought into being, according to John 1.3, is the Son or Logos. It would be truer, however, to say that the Spirit did not come into being without the Son than that he came into being through him (CommJohn 2.12.17–19). The Spirit, as hypostasis, is not only eternal but incorporeal in the strictest sense: this follows from First Principles 1.6.4, where Origen finds it impossible to imagine that any being apart from the members of the Trinity can subsist without a body. If these persons were incorporeal only in the looser sense that Origen recognises in First Principles, proem 10, he could not have drawn such an antithesis between the Godhead and the angelic creation. The powers and operations of the Spirit are not so clearly delineated in his writings, as those of the other two persons; the same could be said of almost any writer before Nicaea, and the cause, no doubt, is the absence of unanimity in the scriptures. It is the Spirit who moves (or broods) on the face of the waters before creation at Genesis 1.2; at John 1.3 the Logos supplants the Spirit, which is now said at John 7.39 to have been given only when Jesus was glorified at the end of his ministry. Origen follows John when he writes that the Father is at work in the entire creation, the Son in those beings who possess logos or reason, and the Spirit in the elect (Justinian, To Menas; cf. Princ. 1.3.5). It may be that this restriction of the Son’s office implies a Greek rather than a biblical understanding of the term logos, but Greek thought knows of no supernatural being who acts in the realm assigned by Origen to the Spirit (pace Dillon 1982). This Trinitarian hierarchy has been compared with that of the noetic principles being, life and mind in the system of Proclus, for whom being encompasses all that exists, life the more limited sphere of living creatures and mind the still more limited sphere of the rational. The correspondence, however, is far from exact, and, as Proclus wrote two centuries after Origen and under later influences, more compelling arguments will be required before we assign to a Platonic source the doctrine that Origen draws so effortlessly from the scriptures. No evidence has been produced to show that the Spirit functions in Origen as the soul of the world; he surmises on one occasion that the Logos is the soul of God (Princ. 2.8.5), but only because he needs to account for an anthropomorphic metaphor at Psalm 84.6. .

That the Godhead is incorporeal—and therefore, in Origen’s lexicon, immaterial—is, as we have seen, an unassailable premiss of his theology. (Markschies 2016: 98–106 and 334–340) If the second person has any substrate—any matter, as we might say—it is the will of God the Father. The significance of this doctrine becomes apparent when we recall that Christ is wisdom and that in the myth attributed to the Gnostic Ptolemaeus, the error of wisdom lies in her acting without the assent of her consort Thelema, or Will (Irenaeus, Against Heresies 1.1–4). The Father’s will, on the other hand, is not the substrate but the cause of the material universe, which Origen held, with every orthodox Christian of his day, to have been created out of nothing. For most Christians this did not entail that God creates without matter, but that the matter from which he shaped the world was the first of his creations. Matter had seldom been defined in Christian prose before Origen, but for him, as for Aristotle, as he has often been interpreted, it is the unqualified receptacle of all qualities, a mere potentiality for existence in contradistinction to essence, of which nothing can be predicated until it is actualised as determinate being. But then follows Bishop Berkeley’s question: if matter is not something, why not conclude that it is nothing? Origen is perhaps the first extant writer who informs us that this question had been posed in his time, though in his accustomed manner he neither affirms it at First Principles 4.4.7 nor names its proponents. We must say “perhaps”, because the Philokalia, a florilegium of his writings, contains a short dialogue in which the redundancy of matter is established by Socratic interrogation (Philokalia 24). In view of his diffidence in First Principles, it seems more likely that this text is the work of Maximus, a second-century author to whom it is also attributed in our manuscripts.

5. Theodicy and Sin

It is clear at least that Origen’s God creates the world from nothing and without toil or opposition (Princ. 2.1.5). Because he asserts that such a world will inevitably be finite, as God himself cannot comprehend the infinite, Origen was later accused of slighting the omnipotence of the Creator. His meaning, however, is not that there are limits to the power of God, but that any particular exercise of it must logically have some limit. The infinite is by nature incomprehensible; hence it is no shortcoming in God that he cannot comprehend it, and he remains omnipotent in the sense that there is no finite enterprise that lies beyond his power. In contrast to the Gnostics, therefore, who held that our world is the residue of a rupture or fall within the Godhead, Origen maintains that a single God is the creator of both the intellectual and the material cosmos. He also purports to demonstrate the priority of the intellectual Adam to the material Adam, first by giving an allegorical sense to the firmament which divides the waters at Genesis 1.7, then by a literal reading of Genesis 1.26–2.22. In this text the creation of humanity as male and female in the image of God, as the crown of his handiwork, is succeeded by a narrative of quite a different tenor, in which God fashions the body of the first man from the soil and then, after populating the garden with beasts and plants and infusing the spirit into his nostrils, derives the body of the first woman from his rib (Genesis 2.1–7; 2.21–25). It is not clear whether a temporal, as well as an ontological, priority is accorded to the inner man, or whether the protoplasts owe their creation to his fall.

That the denizens of the present world have sinned, and will sin again, is a ubiquitous premiss of Origen’s theodicy. Misadventures which the world ascribes to fortune, fate or the malice of our superhuman guardians will always in fact be trials of virtue, chastisements for sin (perhaps forgotten) or correctives to hidden injustice. Thus if we cannot divine (for example) why God loved Jacob and hated Esau, the explanation must lie in causes prior to the conception of either (First Principles 2.9.7 and 3.1.20 ). The Greek of 3.1.20 makes it clear (pace Edwards 2008) that he is not thinking of sin in the womb such as was posited by his Jewish contemporaries; on the other hand, he was not prepared to entertain the Platonc doctrine of transmigration, with its corollary that our lot in the present world has been determined either by the soul’s choice or by that of the gods in the light of the merits and errors of a previous incarnation. He is in fact willing to consider the biblical evidence both for transmigration from humans to beasts (First Principles 1.8.5) and from humans to other humans (CommJohn 1.11), but he repudiates the former at Against Celsus 3.75 and elsewhere, while declaring that the “man of the church” cannot entertain the latter. It appears therefore that the sin must have occurred in some state prior to any embodiment in the present world. In Koetshcau’s authoritative text of First Principles, an amalgam of Greek witnesses, none purporting the quote the exact words of Origen, is inserted alongside Rufinus’ Latin version of First Principles 1.8.1. As Rombs 2007, Behr 2017: xxvii–xxvii and Ramelli 2022: 279 observe, it is from this passage (commonly known as Koetschau Fr. 15) that textbook accounts of Origen derive the claim that he held all rational beings to have been at first pure intellects which would have remained for ever in the presence of God, had they not fallen away through koros or surfeit. Each of the delinquents, the narrative continues, received a body corresponding to the gravity of the original sin: those who fell least became angels, those who fell most became demons, and human souls constitute order in keeping with the mediocrity of their transgressions. This thesis was already ascribed to Origen in the fifth century by Antipater of Bostra (Patrologia Graeca 96.504–505) and by Augustine, who pronounced it incoherent because it implied that the bodies of demons, who inhabit the air above us, are grosser than ours. Of course it is not impossible that Origen held it without being conscious of this inconcinnity, and those who assume that he was at heart a Platonist will argue that he is combining the account of the fall of souls from the “supercelestial place” in the Phaedrus with the speculation of Philo that souls come to earth because they are weighed down by a surfeit (koros) of divine pleasures (Heir of Divine Things 240). Nevertheless, it should be observed that if this is indeed his position, Origen did not hold it on the Platonic ground that soul, as the cause of motion, cannot be brought into being and hence must be immortal; his object, typically Christian, is to vindicate biblical teaching and at the same time to show that it cannot be used to support any Gnostic or pagan animadversion on divine justice (Martens 2015). Nor is there clear attestation in his extant works of a fall into the body by reason of koros: at First Principles 1.4.1 he does indeed say that satietas is the commonest cause of falling, but the word satietas seems to mean here something closer to fatigue or boredom, the consequence of which is that the soul becomes unmindful of its own knowledge in the manner of the “akratic” or incontinent man at Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics 1147a-b. As Martens 2015: 614n. 73 demonstrates, a reader who was ignorant of the use that scholars have made of this passage (Dively Lauro 2004; Edwards 2021; 161n.3) might assume that First Principles 1.3.8–1.4.1 described not the cause of embodiment. but the fall of the soul when embodied.

Elsewhere the sin which determines the mode of embodiment is more commonly Latinised as negligentia, as for example in First Principles 2.9.1, which perhaps affords the closest parallel to Koetschau’s Fr. 15. Here we read that God at the beginning appointed rational beings to rule the world, but that some, on account of their natural mutability, neglected the service of God and turned to baser objects with the consequence that while some became thrones, dominions, principalities or powers in accordance with their merits, others received positions of lesser glory, or even of misery. It is clear that the fall of angels is being described here, but as Origen takes occasion to denounce the Gnostic tenet that humans are born with different natures which determine whether or not they will be saved, and then goes on to discuss the unequal fortunes of Jacob and Esau, it would seem that he is also constructing a theodicy for human souls. It is not the same theodicy as that of Koetschau Fr 15, for the presence of minds in the world is decreed from the outset and indeed even the defection of certain minds fulfils God’s purpose of creating a diversity of creatures, each of which receives the profit or penalty of its own free decisions. From this text alone one might conclude that humans are fallen angels, though not that angels and humans alike are fallen intellects. Other texts in Origen, however suggest that the fall of angels and that of humans stand in an analogous rather than a continuous relation. Humans are simply introduced as a third group at First Principles 1.8. after the origin of demons as apostate angels has been recounted; at Against Celsus 6.43 the birth of evil from “some who have lost their wings” is a clear allusion to the downfall of Satan and his minions, and is surely the truth “superior to Plato’s fable of the soul’s shedding of wings” of which Origen boasts cryptically at Against Celsus 4.40. At CommJohn 32.18.234 the words of Psalm 82.6, “I have said you are gods .. but you shall fall as men” are taken to mean that the fall of Satan resembles that of Adam. Origen does not endorse the conjecture that John the Baptist was an angel who became a man at God’s behest (CommJohn 2.31.186), and tacitly disavows it when he adduces the Baptist’s leaping in the womb as a proof that all embryos are ensouled (First Principles 1.7.4) nevertheless, he would surely have put the question differently had he held that all human beings are angels in disgrace. The passages which appear to say that the righteous will become angels after death are not so worded as to imply that they are recovering a status which has been lost. Origen has no prooftext for such a position, whereas Jesus himself avers that in heaven the saints are isangeloi, “equal to angels” at Mark 12.25.

Some passages are most naturally read to imply that souls come directly from God. At First Principles 3.5.6, and again in his fragmentary commentary on Ephesians (Esegesi, pp. 134–136), the noun katabolê at Ephesians 1, normally taken to signify the foundation of the world, is interpreted instead as an allusion to God’s sending down of souls into bodies. On the other hand, the intimation that some souls are “from God” is construed at CommJohn 20.162 to mean that some souls are not from God. This again has no bearing on the time of their creation, and even the assertion that the soul of Christ adhered to the Word with indissoluble love ab initio creationis may signify either “from the beginning of the creation” or “from the beginning of its creation” (Princ. 2.6.3–4). When Origen speaks at Commentary on the Song 2.8.4 of “all the souls who were (fuerunt) since the beginning of the world”, this need not imply that all souls have existed collectively since the beginning; “all souls who have existed at any time since the beginning” would be an equally plausible gloss. At Commentary on Matthew 16.35 Origen entertains the theory that souls await embodiment in Sheol, the place from which the soul of Samuel was raised by the Witch of Endor; since he believed that Samuel’s soul was detained in Sheol only in order to prophesy (Homily 5 on 1Kingdoms 8.4), and cannot have thought that it went on to inhabit another body, we should not build too much on a highly complex passage (Heine 2010: 243–248) which may have been designed primarily as a refutation of a Gnostic conceit (Irenaeus, Against Heresies 1.1.3). The souls that have certainly dwelt in the present world since its inception are those of the elements, which are here for our sake rather than to expiate our sin. If the earth were soulless or evil God would not call it to witness at Isaiah 1.2,; we must therefore assume that, when Job exclaims, “the stars are not clean in his sight” he means that the sun and moon were made “subject to vanity” for the sake of those who inhabit the physical cosmos (Princ. 1.7.2; cf. CommJohn 1.17.98 with Tzamalikos 2025: 367–368).

In Origen’s extant writings, then, the doctrine of the soul’s fall through satiety, after centuries of beatitude as a “pure intellect”, is never so clearly stated as in later indictments of his heterodoxy. Many hold none the less that the charges are true, and that Origen’s advocacy of these doctrines is concealed from us by the loss or mutilation of the incriminating texts. Others, relying chiefly on the texts that have been preserved, maintain that for Origen the fall of souls was a tentative and occasional speculation or a myth, in Plato’s sense, that was later mistaken for a dogma (Harl 1987). It has also been argued that his preserved words testify only to Origen’s belief in the fall of angels (Princ. 1.5.3) and to the creation of the soul before its descent into the body; on this view, readers who came to his work with formulaic expectations mingled his own opinions with the Platonic tenets to which they bore a calculated but incomplete resemblance. No hypothesis has yet accounted for all that is said in the surviving corpus of Origen’s works. If, as Origen seems to hold (Princ. 3.6.1), the likeness of God was not yet conferred on the intellectual man who was created in the image of God, should we infer that Adam’s body was given to him as a means of acquiring the likeness, just as the Neoplatonist Porphyry, fifty years later, taught that souls are implanted in bodies in order to learn what is truly good through the experience of evil (Augustine, City of God 10.30)? On the other hand, if our initial state was in some respects unlike the present one, we may find it hard to interpret Origen’s dictum that the end, or consummation (apokatastasis), is “the same as the beginning” (Princ. 1.6.2). The provenance of the noun apokatastasis is more easily established than its meaning, for even in the New Testament it may signify not so much the restoration of that which was once the case as the realisation of that which ought to be (see further Tzamalikos 2007: 237–356; Ramelli 2013: 129–221).

At First Principles 4.4.1 Origen scoffs that only a fool would suppose that God had really planted a garden in Eden and its denizens had been expelled for nothing more than the eating of a fruit. This has been taken to mean that he regards Eden not as a physical locality but as the state in which all souls enjoy the presence of God before they descend to bodies (Martens 2013). On the other hand, Origen’s denial that God descended in a bodily sense to destroy the tower of Babel (Against Celsus 4.15–21) is not taken to imply that he thinks the tower itself fictitious, although he admits that other details of the story should not be interpreted literally. We should therefore not be too ready to assume, with the malignant Epiphanius, that he denies the historicity of the Fall when he adopts a metaphorical construction of God’s sewing of coats of skin for Adam and Eve at Genesis 3.21 (Epiphanius, Panarion 64.4.1; cf. Heidl 2003: 138); Tzamalikos 2022: 108–125. If he also doubts that the trees of Eden were botanical plants, he is equally willing to give up other details in the story of Babel, but not the event itself. In a fragment preserved in a Greek catena, he cites Adam’s exclamation “This is bone of my bone and flesh of my flesh” at Genesis 2.24 as proof that even before the fall he possessed a body (Commentary on Genesis, Fr. 22, p. 190 Metzler); from the sequel, as from Homilies on Leviticus 6.2, we may conclude that he held this body to be a different texture from ours, but in his own parlance this would be an instance of “homonymy”, the use of a scriptural term in different senses which are equally literal (see Commentary on the Song, proem, pp. 148–156 Moreschini and Limone). While the sin of Adam is a precedent for all subsequent transgressions in his Commentary on Romans, this claim does not preclude, and has even been thought to presuppose, the physical descent of all human beings from this one ancestor (Bammel 1989). At Against Celsus 7.39 the protoplasts fall from a state of immediate knowledge of God to one in which the mind is blinded by the senses but nothing is said to imply that they then became corporeal agents for the first time. Of course many ambiguities remain, and grammar alone will not determine whether the phrase “all saints who have lived since the foundation of the world” (Martens 2013: 532) implies that every soul has existed from the beginning or only that from the beginning to the present new souls are coming into existence with their bodies. It appears then that the descent of souls to bodies is in itself not so much an evil as an expedient of divine governance. On the other hand, all souls that descend, with the exception of that of Christ, fall prey to negligence, and their lot at birth is proportioned to their guilt (see further Arruzza 2009). Furthermore, the bodies which our souls occupy have incurred mortality and corruption as a result of the choice made by the first humans in Eden . At Homilies on Leviticus 8.3, the universal defilement which accompanies birth from sexual intercourse appears to be moral as well as physical (on antecedents see Beatrice 2013: 171–186). However the soul’s detention in the present world is accounted for, its freedom to choose its own goods, and its own god, is an indefeasible premiss of Origen’s philosophy. Astrologers who pretend to read our fates from the stars can be answered with a quip from Epicurus: if all that comes to pass is predestined, so is the belief in predestination, and we therefore have no reason to think it true (Philokalia 25.4). Even if the stars vouchsafe some premonitions of the future to the saints, we are not to suppose that they are the causes of what they signify, or that God, who inscribes his own knowledge in the heavens, is the cause of everything that he foresees (Commentary on Genesis, Fr. 7 Metzler; Hall 2021: 84–90). Following Alexander of Aphrodisias, Origen holds that it is essential to our freedom that when we make a choice we had the power to do otherwise; he does not infer, with Alexander that divine foreknowledge must be stochastic rather than perfect (Edwards 2020), but neither can he agree with the Gnostics that we are destined at birth to be vessels of honour or of dishonour (First Principles 3.1.7 on Romans 9.21). It is we, however, who make his knowledge true by our own choice of good or evil; the Gnostics misconstrue the apostle’s statement that God “makes” us vessels of honour or dishonour when they argue that the damned and the elect are of unlike natures. None of us is born virtuous but each of us (as Aristotle says and common experience goes on telling us) has the power to advance in virtue by performing virtuous acts (Princ. 3.1.4).

6. The Work of Christ

Nevertheless, since the fall has darkened our minds and subjected our bodies to corruption, we cannot effect our own salvation without the assistance of God’s word made flesh. For Origen the virgin birth is a datable event, an appropriation by the Word of full humanity in body, soul and spirit. The union can be described as an anakrasis or mixture (Cels. 3.41), a voluntary cleaving of the flesh or soul to the Word, and (in defiance of chemical facts) as the sublimation of the humanity by the divinity, as iron loses its form when held in an incandescent flame (Princ. 2.6.4) The humanity, for all that, is not annihilated, and Christ can speak at times as man and at others with God without being guilty of dissimulation (CommJohn 19.2.6). His own words “my soul is sorrowful unto death” reveals his possession of a soul, which mediates between the flesh and the divinity which would otherwise destroy it. While the soul (for Christ as for us) is invariably the seat of passion, some of his passions originate in his spirit, which, though human, is divinely irradiated by the Word. By virtue of this irradiation, he foresees his own death, and his prescience gives rise not to a commotion of the spirit but to a commotion in the spirit, which is experienced as a passion of the soul (CommJohn 32.18.221–224). The body which clothes him before the crucifixion is as palpable as ours, and equally vulnerable to physical affections. After his resurrection, he does not show himself to Caiaphas and Pilate because he is visible only to the eye of faith (Cels. 2.60–65). This means not, however, that his body is no real body, but that it no longer suffers the consequences of the fall.

The blood of Christ, first in his circumcision and then on the Cross, is a ransom paid to Satan (Commentary on Romans 2.13.29; cf. 1 Corinthians 6.23), whose prisoners we become, willingly if unwittingly, when we allow his image to oust that of god in our souls (Genesis Homilies 1.13). Yet Satan is never master of our wills: if he enters the soul of a Judas Iscariot, it is because the thought that he plants there has received assent and ripened into a sinful disposition (CommJohn 32.281–285; see further Layton 2004: 129–131.) We are taught to suppress such thoughts and to refrain from sin, by the teaching of Christ, the chief of his bounties during his earthly sojourn, which we now receive in even greater measure through the scriptures. As the primordial Word of God, he is present in every word from God that the church has canonised under the direction of the Spirit; the many words of scripture, in fact, are one (Philokalia 5.4). When we are instructed to eat the flesh and drink the blood of the Son of Man, it is clear that the words cannot be taken literally; while Origen does not deny the allusion to the eucharist, he argues that the higher sense—but also the quotidian sense—of the saying is that believers must draw nourishment from the scriptures in which Christ “as it were, takes flesh and speaks with a literal voice” in order to draw us on to the invisible mysteries (Cels. 4.15; On Prayer 27.10–14). The scriptures, then, are the daily bread for which Christians are taught to pray; to accept eating as a metaphor for reading is to acknowledge that whenever the scriptures speak of tasting, hearing or seeing God, they are not only imparting what we might call a spiritual sense to these words, but appealing to our own spiritual senses (Princ. 1.1.9), the loftier faculties which were freely exercised by Adam and Eve before the fall (Cels. 7.39; see further Rahner 1979).

To distinguish only two senses of scripture is to forget that Christ, the true Word, became incarnate in a threefold human nature. At First Principles 4.2.4, Origen asserts that the body, the soul and the spirit of the human reader find their respective analogues in the text that is being read. The body is the plain text, whether narrative or didactic, construed according to common grammatical or semantic norms. The spirit, which must generally be sought beneath the surface, acquaints us with the work of Christ and the mysteries of faith, and thus corresponds to the typological sense in mediaeval and modern exegesis. The soul of scripture is illustrated by Paul’s translation of the Mosaic precept, “thou shalt not muzzle the ox which treadeth the corn”, to ministers of the church (Princ. 4.2.6). For this reason, and because the church is the bride of Christ in Origen’s exposition of the soul of the Song of Songs, the term “ecclesiastical” has been applied to this intermediate plane of reference. In works which survive in Latin certain passages are said to be amenable to a literal, a moral and a spiritual exposition, but we cannot say whether Origen employed a Greek equivalent to the term “moral”. It is possible that he offers us a further clue to the content of the psychic sense in the prologue to his Commentary on the Song of Songs (ed. Baehrens 1925: 75), where he argues that each of the three books ascribed to Solomon in the Hebrew canon corresponds to a branch of Greek philosophy, and also to one stage in the believer’s progress from the foothills to the summit of understanding. Ethics is represented in this itinerary by Proverbs, physics by Ecclesiastics, the science of contemplation (theorics, epoptics or enoptics) by the Song. The first of these texts is phrased and may be understood somatically; the third, in which Solomon forgoes his own name and becomes the bridegroom, lifts the veil between the enlightened soul and her Redeemer (see further King 2005: 222–263). If we pursue this seductive analogy, the second book of Solomon, which reveals our place in the cosmos, is a mine of cosmological or sapiential teaching which may be said to represent the soul of scripture.

This pattern would appear to have been suggested not by the usual division of philosophy into ethics, physics and logic, but by a passage in Clement of Alexandria, where three edifying senses are accorded to the scriptures, the last of which is the epopteia, or discernment of the mysteries (Stromateis 1.176.1–2). Origen may also have been aware that certain teachers had sorted Plato’s dialogues into different categories, each suited to a different level of aptitude in the pupil (Edwards 1997). If, as some manuscripts indicate, he gave the name “theoric” (either instead of or in addition to “epoptic”) to the most elevated level of understanding, he may have had in mind a Platonic or Pythagorean division of philosophy into ethics, physics and theology, which is attested in a commentary by Iamblichus on Nicomachus of Gerasa’s Introduction to Mathematics, p. 125 Pistelli (not in Hadot 1979). In attributing this taxonomy to the Hebrew king, however, he is making a claim for the chronological primacy of the scriptures. No Platonist before him had undertaken a sustained allegorical reading of any text, as Porphyry confessed when he inaccurately charged him with forcing Stoic techniques of exegesis on a barbarous text (Eusebius, Church History 6.19). Commenting line by line on a sacred text was not, so far as our evidence goes, a typical enterprise for a Stoic. Among the Greeks the commentator who most resembles Origen is Alexander of Aphrodisias; his concern, however, is to smooth the surface of Aristotle, not to dig beneath it (see further Bendinelli 1997). Origen’s true predecessor is Philo of Alexandria, who had teased moral and metaphysical profundities from the Torah, verse by verse, in order to demonstrate that nothing taught among the Greeks had been concealed from the Lawgiver of the Jews (see further Dawson 1992).

Philo is called a mystic because of passages which thirstily anticipate the mind’s bacchanalian ecstasy in the presence of the ineffable. For Origen the term mystikos denotes the most arcane sense of the scriptures, and the encounter with the Bridegroom, “which no-one can understand who has not experienced it”, is described in his Homilies on the Song of Songs (I.7 [ed. Baehrens 1925: 39]). Whether it is a true ecstasy or a sense of hermeneutic illumination (Louth 2000: 69), this transient rapture foreshadows the culmination of the soul’s journey after death, when God will at last be all in all. In answer to the jibes of Celsus, Origen asserts that, while the church teaches the resurrection of the body, the “spiritual body” of which Paul speaks will be of a rarer and hence more durable texture than the gross flesh which now ensheathes the soul (Cels. 5.18–5.23). In a dialogue which now survives only in excerpts, the soul is said to retain the eidos, or form, of the body, perhaps a counterpart to the tenuous vehicle which the soul carries into the afterlife in the eschatology of some Platonists (Methodius, On the Resurrection 22 [ed. Bonwetsch 1899: 93]; see further Schibli 1992). Most souls, having failed to purge their sins in this life, will be required to pass the flaming sword that bars the entrance to the earthly paradise (see further Crouzel 1972). Once its cleansing there is complete, the soul will pass through the seven planetary spheres, acquiring a more comprehensive knowledge of the cosmos and our place in it than is vouchsafed to us in this world (Princ. 1.11.6). Once again, kindred notions can be found in Platonic and Hermetic literature; the posthumous itinerary mirrors the transition from the ethical to the sapiential teachings of Solomon, and we see here in an inchoate form the purgative and illuminative ways of the western mystical tradition. A body of some kind is presupposed by this celestial topography; nevertheless, at the point where God becomes all in all, we hear nothing of a body, but only that soul will be entirely subsumed in spirit. Some scholars hold that a body must be either retained or imparted to us, since only the persons of the Trinity can subsist without one (e.g., Crouzel 1980); others, invoking the maxim that the end will be like the beginning, argue that we shall return to the incorporeal state in which we were first created (e.g., Scott 2012, with further discussion of this intricate topic in Blosser 2012 and Rankin 2017). If that is so, the final state must lie beyond the paradise of the saints, of which Origen says in the plainest terms that the church does not hold it to be incorporeal (First Principles 2.3.6; cf. Koeckert 2008: 73). This assertion cannot simply be ignored, as Martens 2019: 187 seems to contend, because the passage also attacks the notion of a world of Ideas existing only in phantasia. Corporeality and phantasia were in fact interlocking themes in a contemporary debate between commentators on the Phaedo as to whether the scenes of the afterlife are set in the ideal realm or a phantastic antechamber (Edwards 2021). Origen gives his own view of this dialogue at Against Celsus 7.28–29, where he maintains that, although paradise is called a “land” or “earth” it is not contiguous with the earth that we know, as Plato imagined in the Phaedo; in what sense it is an earth he declines to tell Celsus, in keeping with his customary reticence in this treatise with regard to the deeper mysteries of the faith (Against Celsus 4.45 etc.).

This purgatory after death is not confined to those who have died at peace with God; if any should fail to be saved, it is not because the opportunity to repent has been withdrawn, but because the soul has become so brutish that it is incapable of amendment (Princ. 1.5.5). This is the only truth that Origen thinks can be ascribed to Plato’s doctrine of transmigration into beasts (Princ. 3.4.3), and it cannot be presumed that even the demons will remain obdurate for ever. Commenting on Paul’s promise that “the last enemy, death” will be vanquished, Origen surmises that death will not be annihilated but will cease to molest the saints (Princ. 3.6.5). It is generally assumed that the proper subject of this passage is the devil, and the word diabolus does indeed occur in a ninth-century quotation (Eriugena, Periphyseon, Patrologia Latina 122, 930C). On the other hand, in a letter to his friends in Alexandria, Origen is said to have exclaimed that only a lunatic would prophesy the salvation of the devil (Crouzel 1973). Perhaps he means only that Satan is not destined for beatitude; this need not preclude his release from torment on the last day after his peaceful acquiescence in the victory of God (see Edwards 2010).

7. Conclusion

By convention Origen is a “Christian Platonist of Alexandria”. In fact, his native city was only intermittently his place of residence; on the other hand, his intellectual home throughout his life was one in which Plato was never his compatriot but an honoured guest. There is no doubt that he knew the works of the great Athenian intimately, and credited him at times with more than a superficial grasp of the highest truths. Nevertheless, no Greek philosopher possessed for him the authority that he accorded to the scriptures; Plato was only the most prominent of the dead pagans who assisted him in the exegesis and harmonisation of this infallible text. The work in which Origen makes most frequent reference to Plato, his reply to Celsus, as noted above, is also the one in which he asserts that Christ takes flesh in the written word, disclosing mysteries that no human intellect has fathomed without revelation (Cels. 4.15). He was never troubled, as a mediaeval schoolman might be, by a conflict between ecclesiastical dogma and the best thought of the ancients, because the Word who taught the ancients from afar is, for him, the daily shepherd of the Church.

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