Many-Worlds Interpretation of Quantum Mechanics

The Many-Worlds Interpretation (MWI) of quantum mechanics holds that there are numerous parallel worlds existing in the same space and time as our own. Recognizing the existence of these additional worlds makes it possible to remove fundamental randomness and action at a distance from quantum theory, and consequently, from all of physics. The MWI provides a solution to the measurement problem of quantum mechanics.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Definitions
  • 2.1 What is “A World”?
  • 2.2 Who am I?
• 3. Correspondence Between the Formalism and Our Experience
  • 3.1 The Quantum State of a Macroscopic Object
  • 3.2 The Quantum State of a World
  • 3.3 The Quantum State of the Universe
  • 3.4 FAPP
  • 3.5 Preferred Basis
  • 3.6 The Measure of Existence
• 4. Probability in the MWI
  • 4.1 Probability from Uncertainty
  • 4.2 Illusion of Probability from Post-Measurement Uncertainty
  • 4.3 Probability Postulate from Symmetry Arguments
• 5. MWI and (Non)Locality
• 6. Tests of the MWI
• 7. Objections to the MWI
  • 7.1 Ockham’s Razor
  • 7.2 The Problem of Preferred Basis
  • 7.3 The Wave Function is not Enough
  • 7.4 Derivation of the Probability Postulate
  • 7.5 Social Behavior of a Believer in the MWI
• 8. Why the MWI?
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction

The fundamental idea of the MWI, going back to Everett (1957), is that there are myriads of worlds in the Universe in addition to the world we are aware of. In particular, every time a quantum experiment with different possible outcomes is performed, all outcomes are obtained, each in a different, newly created world, even if we are only aware of the world with the outcome we have seen. The reader can split the world right now using this interactive quantum world splitter. The creation of worlds takes place everywhere, not just in physics laboratories—for example, in the explosion of a star during a supernova.

The MWI consists of two parts:

1. A theory which yields the time evolution of the quantum state of the (single) Universe.
2. A prescription which sets up a correspondence between the quantum state of the Universe and our experiences.

Part (i) states that the ontology of the Universe is a quantum state evolving according to the Schrödinger equation or its relativistic generalization. It is a rigorous mathematical theory and is not philosophically problematic. Part (ii) involves “our experiences,” which do not have a rigorous definition. An additional difficulty in setting up (ii) follows from the fact that human languages were developed at a time when people did not suspect the existence of parallel worlds.

The mathematical formalism of the MWI, part (i), does less explanatory work than the mathematical frameworks of some other interpretations, such as Bohmian mechanics. The Schrödinger equation itself does not explain why we experience definite results in quantum measurements. In contrast, the mathematical formulation of Bohmian mechanics yields almost everything, making the analog of part (ii) very simple: it is the postulate that only the “Bohmian positions” (and not the quantum wave) correspond to our conscious experience. The Bohmian positions of all particles directly yield the familiar picture of the single world we perceive. However, the simplicity of part (ii) in Bohmian mechanics comes at the cost of introducing problematic physical features into part (i), such as the nonlocal dynamics of Bohmian trajectories.

2. Definitions

2.1 What is “A World”?

A world is the totality of macroscopic objects—stars, cities, people, grains of sand, etc.—in a definite, classically described state.

The concept of a “world” in the MWI belongs to part (ii) of the theory; i.e., it is not a rigorously defined mathematical entity, but a term defined by us (sentient beings) to describe our experience. When we refer to the “definite classically described state” of, say, a cat, it means that the position and the state (alive, dead, smiling, etc.) of the cat are specified according to our ability to distinguish between the alternatives, and that this specification corresponds to a classical picture; e.g., no superpositions of dead and alive cats are allowed in a single world.

Another concept, closer to Everett’s original proposal and discussed by authors such as Saunders (1995), Wilhelm (2022), and Romagosa (2024), is that of a relative or perspectival world defined for every physical system and every one of its states; following Lewis (1986), we refer to this as a centered world. This concept is particularly useful when a world is centered on the perceptual state of a sentient being. In such a world, all objects perceived by the sentient being possess definite states, whereas objects not currently under observation may remain in a superposition of different classical states. The primary advantage of a centered world is that it is not split by a quantum phenomenon occurring in a distant galaxy. Conversely, the advantage of the macroscopic-object definition presented above is that it allows us to consider a world without specifying a center, meaning our conventional language remains perfectly adequate for describing worlds that existed long before the emergence of sentient beings.

The meaning of a “world” in the MWI is rooted in the everyday, commonsense understanding of the term; however, several key features diverge. Crucially, the traditional definition of a world as “everything that exists” does not hold in the MWI. “Everything that exists” constitutes the Universe, and there is only one Universe. This single Universe encompasses a vast multiplicity of worlds similar to the one we experience. While ordinary intuition dictates that our present world has both a unique past and a unique future, the MWI introduces a strict temporal asymmetry: a world defined at any specific moment in time traces back to a unique history in the past, but branches into a multitude of worlds in the future.

2.2 Who am I?

I am a macroscopic object, such as the Earth or a cat. “I” is defined at a particular time by a complete (classical) description of the state of my body and of my brain. “I” and “Lev” do not refer to the same things (even though my name is Lev). At present, there are many different versions of “Lev” in different worlds (not more than one in each world), but it is meaningless to say that now there is another “I”. I have a particular, well-defined past: I correspond to a unique “Lev” in 2020, but not to a unique “Lev” in the future, as I will correspond to a multitude of “Levs” in 2030. This correspondence is evident in my memory of a unique past: a “Lev” in 2026 shares memories with one particular “Lev” in 2020, but with multiple “Levs” in 2030. In the framework of the MWI, it is meaningless to ask: “Which ‘Lev’ in 2030 will I be?” I will correspond to them all. Every time I perform a quantum experiment with several outcomes, it only seems to me that a single definite result is obtained. Indeed, the “Lev” who observes this particular result thinks this way. However, this “Lev” cannot be identified as the only “Lev” after the experiment. The “Lev” prior to the experiment corresponds to multiple instances of “Lev” who obtain all possible results.

Although this approach to the concept of personal identity may seem unusual, it is plausible in light of Parfit’s (1986) critique of personal identity. Parfit considers several thought experiments in which a person splits into multiple copies, arguing that there is no coherent answer to the question: “Which copy is me?” He concludes that personal identity is not what matters when an observer divides. Saunders and Wallace (2008a) argue that, based on the semantics of Lewis (1986), one can establish a meaning for this question. However, in their subsequent reply (Saunders and Wallace 2008b) to Tappenden (2008), they clarify that their work addresses the serviceability of language rather than the ontological nature of “I”. Indeed, as will be explained below, an observer should behave as if “Which copy is me?” is a legitimate question. Note, however, that Quirke (2024) challenges the direct analogy between the splitting of an agent in Parfit’s scenarios and the Everettian splitting of “Lev” performing a quantum experiment.

3. Correspondence Between the Formalism and Our Experience

We should not expect a clear detailed and complete explanation of our subjective experience purely in terms of the wave function of \(10^{33}\) particles comprising us and our immediate environment. It is sufficient to provide a basic, conceptually coherent picture that is free of paradoxes. Numerous authors have attempted to explain our observations based on the MWI or its variants, including Lockwood (1989), Gell-Mann and Hartle (1990), Albert (1992), Penrose (1994), Chalmers (1996), Deutsch (1996), Joos et al. (2003), Schlosshauer (2007), Wallace (2012), Zurek (2018), Saunders (2021a), Gao (2022), and Vaidman (2022). What follows is a sketch of the connection between the universal wave function and our conscious experience.

3.1 The Quantum State of a Macroscopic Object

The basis for the correspondence between the quantum state (the wave function) of the Universe and our experience is the description that physicists give in the framework of standard quantum theory. There, the correspondence is between our experience and the collapsed wave function, since it is assumed that macroscopic objects are never in a superposition of macroscopically different states. The objects are composed of elementary particles. Elementary particles of the same kind are identical (see the elaborate discussion in the entry on identity and individuality in quantum theory). The essence of an object is the (massively entangled) quantum state of its particles, not the particles themselves. One quantum state of a set of elementary particles might be a cat, and another state of the same particles might be a small table. An object is a spatial pattern of such a quantum state. Clearly, we cannot now write down an exact wave function of a cat. We know, to a reasonable approximation, the wave function of the elementary particles that make up a nucleon. The wave function of the electrons and nucleons that together make up an atom is known with even better precision. The wave functions of molecules (i.e., the wave functions of the ions and electrons out of which molecules are built) are well studied. A lot is known about biological cells, and physicists are making progress in the quantum representation of biological systems (Cao et al. 2020). Out of cells we construct various tissues and then the whole body of a cat or a table. So, let us denote the quantum state of a macroscopic object constructed in this way \(\ket{\Psi}_\object\), see Vaidman (2022).

In our construction \(\ket{\Psi}_\object\) represents an object in a definite state and position. According to our adopted definition of a world, in each world the cat is in a definite state: either alive or dead. Schrödinger’s experiment with the cat leads to a splitting of worlds even before the box is opened. Note that in the centered world approach, the superposed Schrödinger’s cat remains a member of the observer’s single world before she opens the sealed box. The observer directly perceives the facts related to the experiment and mathematically deduces that the cat is in a superposition.

Formally, the quantum state of an object consisting of N particles is defined in a 3N-dimensional configuration space (Albert 1996, 2015). However, to understand our conscious experience, it is crucial to establish a connection to three-dimensional space (Stoica 2019). The causes of our experience are physical interactions, and in nature there are only local interactions in three spatial dimensions. These interactions can be expressed as couplings to certain macroscopic variables of the object. These variables are described by quantum waves well-localized in 3D space, which form a product with the states of the relative variables of the object such as the states of entangled electrons in atoms (Vaidman 2022). Another way to bridge the gap between the wave function of an object and our experience of it is through the three-dimensional density picture of the wave function of the macroscopic object’s molecules, which has the familiar geometrical form of the object. Note that in some other interpretations of quantum mechanics, similar densities are assigned additional ontological significance (Allori et al. 2014).

3.2 The Quantum State of a World

The wave function of all particles in the Universe corresponding to any particular world is a product of the states of the sets of particles corresponding to all objects in the world, multiplied by the quantum state \(\ket{\Phi}\) of all particles that do not constitute “objects”. Within a world, “objects” possess definite macroscopic states by fiat:

\[\tag{1} \ket{\Psi_\world} = \ket{\Psi}_{\object\ 1} \ket{\Psi}_{\object\ 2} \cdots \ket{\Psi}_{\object\ N} \ket{\Phi} \]

The product state applies only to variables that are relevant for the macroscopic description of the objects. There may be some entanglement between weakly coupled variables, such as nuclear spins belonging to different objects. In order to maintain the form of the quantum state of the world (1), the quantum state of such variables must belong to \(\ket{\Phi}.\)

Consider a textbook description of quantum measurements based on the von Neumann (1932) approach, according to which each quantum measurement results in the collapse of the wave function to the eigenstate of the measured variable. The quantum measurement device must be a macroscopic object with macroscopically distinct states that correspond to different outcomes. In this case, the MWI wave function corresponding to a world with a particular outcome is identical to that in von Neumann’s theory, provided the wave function collapses to this specific outcome. The von Neumann (1932) analysis helps clarify the correspondence between the wave function and our perception of the world. However, as Becker (2004) argues, the status of the wave function for von Neumann is not ontological—as it is in the MWI described here—but epistemic: it summarizes information about the results of measurements.

In most situations, only macroscopic objects are relevant to our experience. However, when interference experiments are performed with single particles, describing a world solely in terms of the states of macroscopic objects, such as sources and detectors, can become cumbersome. Vaidman (2010) argues that a more fruitful way to describe the relevant microscopic particles is through the two-state vector formalism. This approach utilizes the usual, forward-evolving state specified by a measurement in the past, paired with a backward-evolving state specified by a measurement in the future. This framework is particularly helpful in resolving several paradoxical situations where the forward-evolving quantum state alone provides no common-sense explanation for the weak traces left by particles (McQueen and Vaidman 2020).

3.3 The Quantum State of the Universe

The quantum state of the Universe (i.e., the universal wave function) can be decomposed into a superposition of terms representing different worlds:

\[\tag{2} \ket{\Psi_\universe} = \sum \alpha_i \ket{\Psi_{\world\ i}} \]

Different worlds are defined by distinct classically described states of at least one object. Because distinct classically described states map onto orthogonal quantum states, it follows that different worlds correspond to orthogonal states: all states \(\ket{\Psi_{\world\ i}}\) are mutually orthogonal and consequently, \(\sum \lvert\alpha_i\rvert^2 = 1\) . Note that in this context, we also include as a “world” a situation in which no macroscopic objects exist.

3.4 FAPP

The construction of the quantum state of the Universe in terms of the quantum states of objects presented above is merely approximate; it is valid only for all practical purposes (FAPP). Indeed, the concept of an object itself lacks a rigorous definition: should a mouse recently swallowed by a cat be considered part of the cat? The concept of a “definite position” is also only approximately defined: how far must a cat be displaced to be considered in a different position? If the displacement is much smaller than the quantum uncertainty, the cat must be considered to exist in the same place, as the quantum state remains nearly identical and the displacement is undetectable in principle. However, this serves only as an absolute bound, because our ability to distinguish various locations is far from this quantum limit. Furthermore, the state of an object (e.g., alive or dead) is meaningful only when considered over a period of time. Yet, in our construction, the quantum state of an object is defined at a specific instant. We must ensure that the quantum state maintains the macroscopic form of the object not just at that instant, but over a duration. The splitting of the world during this period introduces another source of ambiguity, as there is no precise definition of when the splitting occurs. The time of splitting corresponds to the time of collapse in von Neumann’s (1932) approach. His extensive discussion demonstrating that the exact timing of the collapse is inconsequential applies equally well to the timing of splitting in the MWI.

The reason we can offer only an approximate prescription for the correspondence between the quantum state of the Universe and our experience mirrors Bell’s (1990) claim that “ordinary quantum mechanics is just fine FAPP.” Foundational concepts such as “object” and “measurement” are not defined rigorously. Bell and many others have searched (thus far in vain) for a “precise quantum mechanics.” Because it is insufficient for a fundamental physical theory to merely be fine FAPP, quantum mechanics requires rigorous foundations. The MWI provides these rigorous foundations for part (i), the “physics part” of the theory; only part (ii), which corresponds to our subjective experience, is approximate (just fine FAPP). However, “just fine FAPP” simply means that the theory successfully accounts for our experience across any possible experiment, which is precisely the goal of part (ii). For further arguments on why a FAPP definition of a world is sufficient, see Wallace (2002, 2010a, 2012) and Vaidman (2022).

3.5 Preferred Basis

The mathematical structure of part (i) of the theory allows infinitely many ways to decompose the quantum state of the Universe into a superposition of orthogonal states. The basis for the decomposition into world states follows from the definition of a world composed of objects in definite positions and states (“definite” relative to our ability to distinguish them). Given the nature of the observer and her conceptual framework for describing the world, the specific choice of the decomposition (2) follows (up to a precision that is fine FAPP, as required). If we refrain from asking why we are the way we are, or why the world we perceive takes the form it does, and ask only how we can explain the relations between the events we observe, then the problem of the preferred basis does not arise: we, along with the concepts of our world, define the preferred basis.

However, if we inquire why we exist as the specific types of observers we are, further explanation is available. By examining the details of the physical world—such as the structure of the Hamiltonian and the value of the Planck constant—one can understand why known sentient beings take a particular form and why they use specific concepts to describe their worlds. The central argument is that the locality of physical interactions ensures the stability of worlds in which objects are well-localized. The small value of the Planck constant allows macroscopic objects to remain localized for extended periods. Worlds corresponding to localized quantum states of macroscopic objects do not split rapidly, providing sufficient time for sentient beings to perceive the locations of these objects. In contrast, a “world” defined by an alternative decomposition—such as a “world +” characterized by the relative phase of a superposition of a macroscopic object in distinct locations A and B—splits almost instantaneously, creating an equal-amplitude superposition of two worlds: “world +” and “world –”. This occurs far too quickly for any feasible sentient being to perceive a particular world and act accordingly. This splitting is the phenomenon of decoherence, which has attracted enormous attention (see Joos et al. (2003); Zurek (2003, 2022, 2025); Schlosshauer (2007, 2019); Wallace (2012); Saunders (1993, 2021a); Hemmo and Shenker (2022); Franklin (2024); Dawid and Thébault (2025)).

A popular variant of decoherence research is the “decoherent histories” framework of Gell-Mann and Hartle (1990) inspired by the Consistent Histories approach to quantum mechanics (see also Saunders (1995); Riedel et al. (2016); Corry (2025)). While all of these analyses conventionally presuppose a 3D space, Cotler et al. (2019), Carroll and Singh (2019), and Carroll (2022) have developed “Hilbert space fundamentalism.” According to this approach, the entire structure of our observed world, including space and the fields existing within it, can be determined solely by the energy eigenspectrum of the Hamiltonian of our Universe.

3.6 The Measure of Existence

Myriad worlds exist in parallel within the Universe. While all worlds share the same physical size—setting aside potential variations introduced by the quantum aspects of early cosmology—and sentient beings within them feel equally “real,” there remains a distinct sense in which certain worlds are larger than others. Vaidman (1998) formalizes this property as the measure of existence of a world.

This measure of existence serves two primary functions. First, it quantifies a world’s capacity to interfere with other worlds in a gedanken experiment, a point explored further at the end of this section. Second, it provides the foundation for introducing the illusion of probability within the MWI, as the subsequent section details. In this way, the measure of existence directly parallels the probability measure discussed in Everett (1957) and visually represented in Lockwood (1989) (p. 230).

Given the decomposition (2), the measure of existence of world \(i\) is \(\mu_i = \lvert \alpha_i\rvert^2.\) It can also be expressed as the expectation value of \(\mathbf{P}_i\), the projection operator on the space of quantum states corresponding to the actual values of all physical variables describing world \(i\):

\[\tag{3} \mu_i = \langle \Psi_\universe \mid \mathbf{P}_i \mid \Psi_\universe \rangle. \]

Note that although the measure of existence of a world is expressed using the mathematical formalism (part (i) of the MWI), the concept of this measure, much like the concept of a world itself, belongs to part (ii) of the MWI: the bridge to our experience.

I also possess a measure of existence, which is the sum of the measures of existence across all the different worlds in which I exist. I do not, however, directly experience this measure. I feel the same weight and see the same brightness regardless of how tiny my measure of existence might be.

My current measure of existence is relevant only for gedanken situations such as Wigner’s friend (Wigner 1961), recently revived by Frauchiger and Renner (2018), which demonstrates the meaning of the measure of existence of a world as a measure of its ability to interfere with other worlds. If I am a friend of Wigner, a gedanken superpower who can perform interference experiments with macroscopic objects like people, and I perform an experiment with two outcomes A and B, such that the two worlds are created with different measures of existence—say, \(\mu_{A}=\frac{1}{2} \mu_{B}\)—then there is a difference between Lev A and Lev B in how Wigner can affect their future through the interference of worlds. Both Lev A and Lev B consider performing a new experiment with another device which splits worlds into worlds C and D with equal measures. Wigner can manipulate the interference of the worlds in such a way that Lev A (the one with a smaller measure of existence) will not have a future with result C of the second experiment. However, Wigner cannot prevent the future result C for Lev B; see Vaidman (1998, p. 256).

4. Probability in the MWI

Probability in the MWI cannot be introduced in a simple way as in quantum theory with collapse. However, even if there is no probability in the MWI, it is possible to explain our illusion of apparent probabilistic events. Due to the identity of the mathematical counterparts of worlds, we should not expect any difference between our experience in a particular world of the MWI and the experience in a single-world universe with collapse at every quantum measurement.

4.1 Probability from Uncertainty

The concept of ignorance probability, a standard meaning of probability in a deterministic theory, faces difficulties in the MWI because there is no relevant information of which an observer about to perform a quantum experiment is ignorant. The quantum state of the Universe at one time specifies the quantum state at all times. If I am going to perform a quantum experiment with two possible outcomes such that standard quantum mechanics predicts a probability of 1/3 for outcome A and 2/3 for outcome B, then, according to the MWI, both the world with outcome A and the world with outcome B will exist. It is senseless to ask, “What is the probability that I will get A instead of B?” because “I” will correspond to both “Lev”s: the one who observes A and the one who observes B.

To solve this difficulty, Albert and Loewer (1988) proposed the Many Minds interpretation, in which the different worlds exist only in the minds of sentient beings. In addition to the quantum wave function of the Universe, Albert and Loewer postulate that every sentient being has a continuum of minds. Whenever the quantum state of the Universe develops into a superposition containing states of a sentient being that correspond to different perceptions, the minds of this sentient being evolve randomly and independently into mental states corresponding to these different perceptions (with probabilities equal to the quantum probabilities for these states). In particular, whenever an observer makes a measurement, the observer’s minds develop mental states that correspond to the perception of different outcomes—i.e., corresponding to world A or world B in our previous example. Since there is a continuum of minds, there will always be an infinity of minds for any sentient being, and the procedure can continue indefinitely. This resolves the difficulty: each “I” corresponds to a single mind, and it ends up in a state corresponding to a world with a particular outcome. However, this solution comes at the price of introducing additional structure into the theory, including a genuinely random process.

Saunders (2010) claims to solve the problem without introducing additional structure into the theory. Working in the Heisenberg picture, he uses appropriate semantics and mereology according to which distinct worlds have no parts in common, not even at early times when the worlds are qualitatively identical. In the terminology of Lewis (1986, p. 206), we have the divergence of worlds rather than overlap. Wilson (2013, 2020) develops this idea by introducing a framework called “indexicalism”, which involves a set of distinct diverging “parallel” worlds in which each observer is located in only one world and all propositions are construed as self-locating (indexical). In Wilson’s words, “indexicalism” allows us to vindicate treating weights as a candidate objective probability measure; however, it is not clear how this program can succeed (see Tappenden (2021); Harding (2023); Khawaja (2023)). It is hard to identify diverging worlds in our experience, and there is nothing in the mathematical formalism of standard quantum mechanics that can be a counterpart of diverging worlds; see also Kent (2010, p. 345). Note that Saunders (2021b, 2024, 2026) continued to develop the concept of probability, but without diverging worlds. He named his theory λ-MANY, which is based on counting of microstates λ. In the next section, the measure of existence of worlds is related to subjective ignorance probability.

Several other proposals address the issue of probability in the MWI. Weissman (1999) suggested a modification of quantum theory with additional non-linear decoherence (and hence with even more worlds than in the standard MWI) that can asymptotically lead to worlds of equal mean measure for different outcomes. Hanson (2006) introduced decoherence dynamics in which observers in different worlds “mangle” one another such that an approximate Born rule is obtained. Van Wesep (2006) used an algebraic method for deriving the probability rule, whereas Buniy et al. (2006) used the decoherent histories approach of Gell-Mann and Hartle (1990). Waegell and McQueen (2020) considered probability based on the ontology of “local worlds” introduced by Waegell (2018), a concept inspired by the approach of Deutsch and Hayden (2000).

4.2 Illusion of Probability from Post-Measurement Uncertainty

Vaidman (1998) introduced the self-location ignorance probability of an agent in the framework of the MWI in a situation of post-measurement uncertainty; see also Tappenden (2011, 2021). It seems senseless to ask, “What is the probability that Lev in world A will observe A?” This probability is trivially equal to 1. The task is to define the probability in such a way that we could reconstruct the prediction of the standard approach, where the probability for A is 1/3. It is indeed senseless to ask you what the probability is that Lev in world A will observe A, but this might be a meaningful question when addressed to Lev in the world of the outcome A. Under normal circumstances, world A is created (i.e., measuring devices and objects which interact with measuring devices become localized according to the outcome) before Lev is aware of the result A. Then, it is sensible to ask this Lev about his probability of being in world A. There is a definite outcome which this Lev will see, but he is ignorant of this outcome at the time of the question. In order to make this point vivid, Vaidman (1998) proposed an experiment in which the experimenter is given a sleeping pill before the experiment. Then, while asleep, he is moved to room A or to room B depending on the results of the experiment. When the experimenter has woken up (in one of the rooms), but before he has opened his eyes, he is asked, “In which room are you?” Certainly, there is a matter of fact about which room he is in (he can learn about it by opening his eyes), but he is ignorant about this fact at the time of the question.

This construction provides the ignorance interpretation of probability, but the value of the probability has to be postulated:

Probability Postulate An observer should set his subjective probability of the outcome of a quantum experiment in proportion to the total measure of existence of all worlds with that outcome.

This postulate (named the Born-Vaidman rule by Tappenden 2011) is a counterpart of the collapse postulate of standard quantum mechanics according to which, after a measurement, the quantum state collapses to a particular branch with probability proportional to its squared amplitude. (See the section on the measurement problem in the entry on philosophical issues in quantum theory.) However, it differs in two aspects. First, it parallels only the second part of the collapse postulate, the Born Rule, and second, it is related only to part (ii) of the MWI, the connection to our experience, and not to the mathematical part of the theory (i).

The question of the probability of obtaining A makes sense for Lev in world A before he becomes aware of the outcome and for Lev in world B before he becomes aware of the outcome. Both “Lev”s have the same information on the basis of which they should give their answer. According to the probability postulate, they will give the same answer: 1/3 (the relative measure of existence of world A). Since Lev before the measurement is associated with two “Lev”s after the measurement who have identical ignorance probability concepts for the outcome of the experiment, one can define the probability of the outcome of the experiment to be performed as the ignorance probability of the successors of Lev for being in a world with a particular outcome. Whether self-location beliefs can resolve the probability problem in the MWI is a highly controversial question. Chen (2022) and Adlam (2024) are skeptical about the legitimacy of its application, although Chua and Chen (2025) find that it can justify the Born rule even in a mixed-state Everettian multiverse, represented by a density matrix. Bradley (2012) finds it useful, Barrett and Goldbring (2024) consider it the clearest way of understanding probabilities in the MWI, while Vaidman (2025) argues that this is the only solution.

The “sleeping pill” argument does not reduce the probability of an outcome of a quantum experiment to a familiar concept of probability in the classical context. The quantum situation is genuinely different. Since all outcomes of a quantum experiment are realized, there is no probability in the usual sense. Nevertheless, this construction explains the illusion of probability. It leads believers in the MWI to behave according to the following principle:

Behavior Principle We care about all our successive worlds in proportion to their measures of existence.

With this principle, our behavior should be similar to the behavior of a believer in the collapse theory who cares about possible future worlds in proportion to the probability of their occurrence.

The important part of the Probability Postulate is the supervenience of subjective probability on the measure of existence. Given this supervenience, the proportionality follows naturally from the following argument. By assumption, if after a quantum measurement all the worlds have equal measures of existence, the probability of a particular outcome is simply proportional to the number of worlds with this outcome. The measures of existence of worlds are, in general, not equal, but the experimenters in all the worlds can perform additional specially tailored auxiliary measurements of some variables such that all the new worlds will have equal measures of existence. The experimenters should be completely indifferent to the results of these auxiliary measurements: their only purpose is to split the worlds into “equal-weight” worlds. Then, the additivity of the measure of existence yields the Probability Postulate.

There are many other arguments (apart from the empirical evidence) supporting the Probability Postulate. Gleason’s (1957) theorem about the uniqueness of the probability measure uses a natural principle that the probability of an outcome is independent of splitting into parallel worlds. Tappenden (2000, 2017) adopts a different semantics according to which “I” live in all branches and have “distinct experiences” in different “superslices”. He uses “weight of a superslice” instead of “measure of existence” and argues that it is intelligible to associate probabilities according to the Probability Postulate. Exploiting a variety of ideas in decoherence theory, the relational theory of tense, and theories of identity over time, Saunders (1998) argued for the “identification of probability with the Hilbert Space norm” (which equals the measure of existence). Page (2003) promotes an approach named Mindless Sensationalism. The basic concept of this approach is a conscious experience. He assigns weights to different experiences depending on the quantum state of the Universe, as the expectation values of presently-unknown positive operators corresponding to the experiences (similar to the measures of existence of the corresponding worlds). Page writes “… experiences with greater weights exist in some sense more …” (2003, 479). A refinement of these ideas appears in Page (2022). In all of these approaches, the postulate is introduced through an analogy with treatments of time, e.g., the measure of existence of a world is analogous to the duration of a time interval. Note also Greaves (2004), who advocates the “Behavior Principle” on the basis of the decision-theoretic reflection principle related to the next section.

Groisman et al. (2013) argue that the analysis of probability in the MWI can help even when analysing a controversial issue of classical probability theory, the Sleeping Beauty problem. Accepting the Probability Postulate reduces the analysis of probability to a calculation of the measures of existence of various worlds. Note, however, that not everyone agrees about what these calculations yield; see Lewis (2007), Papineau and Durà-Vilà (2009), Bradley (2011), and Wilson (2014).

4.3 Probability Postulate from Symmetry Arguments

In an ambitious work, Deutsch (1999) claimed to derive the Probability Postulate from the quantum formalism and classical decision theory. In Deutsch’s argument, the notion of probability is operationalized by reducing it to the betting preferences of a rational agent. Thus, an agent who is indifferent between receiving $20 on those branches where spin “up” is observed and receiving $10 on all branches is, by definition, deemed to assign a probability of 1/2 to the spin-up branches. Deutsch then attempts, using symmetry arguments, to prove that the only rationally coherent strategy for an agent is to assign these operationalized “probabilities” to equal the quantum-mechanical branch weights. Wallace (2003, 2007, 2010b, 2012) developed an axiomatic treatment of this approach by making explicit the tacit assumptions in Deutsch’s argument. In the most recent version of these proofs, the central assumptions are (i) the symmetry structure of unitary quantum mechanics; (ii) the consistency of an agent’s preferences across time; and (iii) the agent’s indifference to the fine-grained branching structure of the world per se. Early criticisms of the Deutsch-Wallace approach focused on circularity concerns; see Barnum et al. (2000), Baker (2007), and Hemmo and Pitowsky (2007). As the program led to more explicit proofs, criticism turned to the decision-theoretic assumptions being made; see Lewis (2010), Albert (2010), Kent (2010), and Price (2010). The analysis of the Deutsch-Wallace program continues in a flurry of mostly critical papers; see Adlam (2014), Dawid and Thébault (2014, 2015), Dizadji-Bahmani (2015), Read (2018), Brown and Ben Porath (2020), Steeger (2022), and March (2024, 2025).

Zurek (2005) offers a new twist to the Born rule derivation based on the permutation symmetry of states corresponding to worlds with equal measures of existence. He considers entangled systems and relies on “envariance” symmetry: a unitary evolution of one system that can be undone by a corresponding unitary evolution of the system with which it is entangled. Zurek assumes that a local manipulation of the second system does not alter the probabilities of measurement outcomes on the first system. Swapping the states of the first system swaps the probabilities of the outcomes because these outcomes are correlated with the second system, which remains unchanged. Because swapping the states of both systems restores the original global state, the probabilities must remain unchanged. Since they have simultaneously been swapped, they must therefore be equal.

Sebens and Carroll (2018) provided a proof of the Probability Postulate based on symmetry considerations within the framework of the self-location uncertainty of Vaidman (1998). However, Kent (2015) and McQueen and Vaidman (2019) argued that their proof fails because it starts with a meaningless question. The proof considers a situation similar to the sleeping pill experiment presented above: I was asleep during a quantum measurement, but unlike the original proposal, there was no change in my state. I was not moved to different rooms according to the results of the experiment. Still, the question is asked: What is the probability for me to be in a world with a particular outcome? Whether that question can be meaningfully asked depends on whether I have branched. The critics argue that, although there are separate worlds, I have not yet branched, and thus the question is not meaningful (at this stage, I am in both worlds). The Sebens and Carroll proof might get off the ground if the program of diverging worlds—see Saunders (2010) and Wilson (2013, 2020)—succeeds. Note also that Dawid and Friederich (2020) and Gao (2025) criticize Sebens and Carroll (2018) on other grounds.

Vaidman (2012) uses symmetry to derive the Probability Postulate in another way. He starts from a situation that is symmetric in all relevant respects, such that all outcomes must have equal probability. Then, the derivation assumes relativistic causality—specifically, that the probability of a measurement outcome in one location cannot be affected by spatially remote manipulations. Vaidman (2020) stresses that the relativistic causality of the evolution of the wave function of the Universe is insufficient, and adds a postulate of relativistic causality for the subjective experiences of an observer within their world. Barrett (2017) also argues that for a derivation of the Probability Postulate, it is necessary to add assumptions beyond the relativistic covariance of the unitary evolution. Short (2023) introduced three axioms: that probabilities (i) depend only on the present state, (ii) are zero for worlds with zero amplitude, and (iii) cannot “flow” between worlds that are uncoupled by the dynamics. Saunders (2026) argues that a single axiom—stating that the probability of an event cannot be changed by an action in a parallel world—is enough. These axioms can be viewed as such additional assumptions.

5. MWI and (Non)Locality

The most celebrated example of the nonlocality of quantum mechanics is given by Bell’s theorem in the context of the Einstein-Podolsky-Rosen argument. It was stated already in the first edition of this entry that Bell’s argument cannot get off the ground in the MWI framework because Bell’s theorem requires a single outcome of a quantum experiment; see also Bacciagaluppi (2002), published at the same time. However, this has been questioned, and the topic continues to be extensively analyzed; see the recent essay collection by Ney (2026a). In this volume, Saunders (2026) and Waegell and McQueen (2026) claim that this is not true. Saunders (2026) introduces physical probability in the MWI and defines a modified concept of the locality condition. This allows him to provide an alternative analysis of Bell’s inequalities, which he claims is a new argument for the MWI. Waegell and McQueen (2026) take worlds as ontological entities and argue that when Alice and Bob share an entangled state, Alice can change the Alice–Bob correlations, which, in their view, is a change at Bob’s site. The argument is that the local change leads to an important change in the global state: it tells Alice which copy of Bob she will meet when their wavepackets are brought to the same location. However, Brown and Timpson (2016), Ney (2025, 2026b), Blackshaw et al. (2026), and Vaidman (2026) view Bell’s setup in a different way. An entangled pair has genuinely uncertain local properties but precise relative properties. There is nothing nonlocal in the fact that a local action by Alice changes a relative Alice–Bob property. On the level of the Universe incorporating all the worlds together, local descriptions (local reduced density matrices) cannot be changed by remote actions. This is a crucial property which allows a generalization to relativistic field theory. Observers in all Lorentz frames agree about the descriptions of every space-time localized region.

There is no consensus that collapse necessarily involves action at a distance; see Myrvold (2016) for arguments that it does not. According to the collapse postulate, the outcome of a quantum experiment is not determined by the initial conditions of the Universe prior to the experiment: only the probabilities are governed by the initial state. Alice does not change the probability of Bob’s measurement outcome by performing or not performing her measurement. Alice changes this outcome from genuinely uncertain to certain but randomly created and unknown to Bob, so the Bell experiment cannot be used for signaling. Nevertheless, the change of the probability of Bob’s local measurement from half to either 0 or 1 can be viewed as action at a distance; see, e.g., Vaidman (2026). The reality at Bob’s site changes from genuine uncertainty to ignorance about certain facts existing in the Universe. Alice and Alice’s macroscopic measuring device know Bob’s particle state.

In the MWI as it is presented here, the quantum state of the world, like the quantum state of the Universe, describes the whole 3-D space. Recently, there has been an extensive discussion of global versus local branching; see Blackshaw et al. (2026), Chua and Sebens (2026), and Ney (2026b). Local branching (Wallace 2012) relies on decoherence and considers worlds that spread with the velocity of light and do not describe the whole space. Equation (2) describes the states of global worlds. Although in global branching a local measurement splits a global world into global worlds, it does not mean that there are immediate changes in all remote locations. The new worlds might differ only in the states of systems which were entangled with the local system that was measured. McQueen and Vaidman (2019) argue that agents in remote locations in the new worlds do not split, as Sebens and Carroll (2018) claim. These agents just come to belong to multiple worlds.

Even if the MWI removes the most bothersome aspect of nonlocality (action at a distance), the other aspect of quantum nonlocality, the nonseparability of remote objects manifested in entanglement, is apparently still there. A “world” is a nonlocal concept. This explains why we observe nonlocal correlations in a particular world; see Vaidman (1994). Deutsch (2012) provides an alternative vindication of quantum locality using a quantum information framework which avoids nonseparability. This approach started with Deutsch and Hayden (2000) analyzing the flow of quantum information using the Heisenberg picture. After discussions by Rubin (2001) and Deutsch (2002), Hewitt-Horsman and Vedral (2007) analyzed the uniqueness of the physical picture of the information flow. Timpson (2005) and Wallace and Timpson (2007) questioned the locality demonstration in this approach, and the meaning of the locality claim was clarified in Deutsch (2012). Rubin (2011) suggested that this approach might provide a simpler route toward the generalization of the MWI of quantum mechanics to the MWI of field theory. Recent works by Raymond-Robichaud (2020), Kuypers and Deutsch (2021), and Bédard (2021a) clarified the meaning of the Deutsch and Hayden proposal as an alternative local MWI which not only lacks action at a distance, but provides a set of local descriptions which completely describes the whole physical Universe. However, there is a complexity price. Bédard (2021b) argues that “the descriptor of a single qubit has larger dimensionality than the Schrödinger state of the whole network — or of the Universe!” This does not stop Bédard from adopting the Deutsch–Hayden picture. Bédard (2025) argues that Bell’s theorem can be discussed in the framework of the MWI, but that it has a local and very elegant explanation within the Deutsch–Hayden approach.

6. Tests of the MWI

It is frequently claimed (e.g., by DeWitt (1970)) that the MWI is, in principle, indistinguishable from an ideal collapse theory. This is not the case. The collapse leads to effects that do not exist if the MWI is the correct theory. To observe the collapse, we would need highly advanced technology that allows for the “undoing” of a quantum experiment, including a reversal of the detection process by macroscopic devices. See Lockwood (1989, p. 223), Vaidman (1998, p. 257), and other proposals in Deutsch (1986). These proposals remain strictly gedanken experiments, far beyond the reach of current or foreseeable technology, because they require observing interference between different worlds. Since worlds branch when at least one macroscopic object enters macroscopically distinguishable states, testing the MWI demands an interference experiment involving a macroscopic body.

While modern interference experiments involve increasingly massive objects (such as the quantum superposition of an acoustic resonator with \(10^{16}\) atoms demonstrated by Schrinski et al. (2023)), these objects are only on the threshold of being considered “macroscopic.” A decisive experiment should involve the interference of states which differ in a macroscopic number of degrees of freedom: an impossible task for today’s technology. It can be argued, however, that the burden of an experimental proof lies with the opponents of the MWI, because it is they who claim that there is a new physics beyond the well-tested Schrödinger equation. As the analysis of Schlosshauer (2006) shows, we have no such evidence.

The MWI fails if there is a physical process that collapses the wave function of the Universe into a single-world quantum state. Several ingenious proposals for such a mechanism have been advanced (see Pearle (1986) and the entry on collapse theories). These models—alongside Weissman’s (1999) concept of non-linear decoherence—predict additional observable effects, such as minute violations of energy conservation. These predictions have been subjected to various experimental tests (e.g., Collett et al. (1995), Diósi (2015)). To date, such effects have not been observed, successfully ruling out some, though not all, of these models (see Vinante et al. (2020)). Regarding other interpretations, Wallace (2023) and Vaidman (2024) agree that realistic experiments cannot distinguish between the MWI and Bohmian mechanics. However, Wallace (2023) suggests that field theory corrections to quantum mechanical predictions offer indirect evidence for the MWI, arguing that there is no feasible path to extend either Bohmian mechanics or collapse theories into the domain of quantum field theory.

Much of the experimental evidence for quantum mechanics is statistical in nature. Greaves and Myrvold (2010) have argued that existing data from quantum experiments supports the Probability Postulate of the MWI just as strongly as it supports the Born rule in alternative frameworks (though see Kent (2010), Albert (2010), and Price (2010) for criticisms). Taking this further, Barrett and Huttegger (2020) contend that “even an ideal observer under ideal epistemic conditions may never have any empirical evidence whatsoever for believing that the results of one’s quantum-mechanical experiments are randomly determined.” Thus, statistical analysis of quantum experiments should not help us test the MWI, but we might mention speculative cosmological arguments in support of the MWI by Page (1999, 2022) and Aguirre and Tegmark (2011).

7. Objections to the MWI

Some of the objections to the MWI follow from misinterpretations due to the multitude of MWIs. The terminology of the MWI can be confusing. Everett’s “branch” is “world” here. “World” is “universe” in Deutsch (1996), while “universe” is “multiverse”. There are two very different approaches with the same name, “The Many-Minds Interpretation (MMI)”. The MMI of Albert and Loewer (1988) mentioned above should not be confused with the MMI of Lockwood et al. (1996) (which resembles the approach of Zeh (2000)). Further, the MWI in the Heisenberg representation by Deutsch (2002) differs significantly from the MWI presented in the Schrödinger representation (used here). The MWI presented here is very close to Everett’s original proposal, but in the entry on Everett’s relative state formulation of quantum mechanics, as well as in his book, Barrett (1999) uses the name “MWI” for the splitting worlds view publicized by DeWitt (1970). This approach has been justly criticized: it has both some kind of collapse (continuous splitting) and the multitude of mutually unobservable worlds. Now we consider some objections in detail.

7.1 Ockham’s Razor

Much of the opposition to the MWI stems from its introduction of a vast number of unobservable worlds. Critics argue this constitutes an extreme violation of Ockham’s principle: “Entities are not to be multiplied beyond necessity.” However, when evaluating physical theories, one can reasonably argue that physical laws should not be multiplied beyond necessity either (a version of Ockham’s Razor that has been applied in the past). From this perspective, the MWI emerges as the most economical theory. It retains all the laws of standard quantum theory but eliminates the collapse postulate, which is the most problematic of those laws. Furthermore, the MWI is more economical than Bohmian mechanics, which adds the ontology of particle trajectories and the specific laws governing their evolution. Tipler (1986a, p. 208) has presented an effective analogy with the criticism of Copernican theory on the grounds of Ockham’s Razor. Hemmo and Shenker (2022) agree that the postulates of the MWI are economical and therefore advantageous from the point of view of Ockham’s Razor, but they argue that this advantage is irrelevant, since the MWI postulates alone are not enough to explain our experience.

One might also consider a possible philosophical advantage of the plurality of worlds in the MWI, similar to that claimed by realists about possible worlds, such as Lewis (1986). For a discussion of the analogy between the MWI and Lewis’ theory, see Skyrms (1976) and Wilson (2020). However, the analogy is not complete: Lewis’ theory considers all logically possible worlds, with all possible physics, vastly more than all the worlds that are incorporated in the quantum state of the Universe.

7.2 The Problem of Preferred Basis

The formalism of quantum theory allows infinitely many ways to decompose the quantum state of the Universe into a superposition of orthogonal states. This leads to a widespread criticism of the MWI. The question arises: “Why choose the particular decomposition (2) and not any other?” Since other decompositions might lead to a very different picture, the whole construction seems to lack predictive power.

The locality of physical interactions—couplings solely to local properties—defines the preferred basis. As described in Section 3.5, only localized states of macroscopic objects are stable. Large uncertainty in the position of a macroscopic object will lead to entanglement and decoherence in a very short time. Indeed, due to extensive research on decoherence, the problem of preferred basis is no longer considered a serious objection; see Wallace (2010a).

Singling out position as a preferred variable to solve this problem might be considered a weakness. However, it is implausible that one can derive what our world should be solely from a mathematical theory of vectors in Hilbert space. Ingredients must be added to the theory, and adding locality—a property of all known physical interactions—seems very natural; in fact, it plays a crucial role in all interpretations. Hemmo and Shenker (2020) also argued that something has to be added to the Hilbert space structure, but viewed the addition of the locality-of-interaction postulate as the reason why Ockham’s razor does not cut in favor of the MWI. Note that taking position as a preferred variable is not an ontological claim here, in contrast to the options discussed in the next section.

7.3 The Wave Function is not Enough

As mentioned above, the gap between the mathematical formalism of the MWI, namely the wave function of the Universe, and our experience is larger than in other interpretations. This is the reason why many thought that the ontology of the wave function is not enough. Bell (1987, p. 201) felt that either the wave function is not everything or it is not right. He was looking for a theory with local “beables”. Many followed Bell in search of a “primitive ontology” in 3+1 space-time; see Allori et al. (2014).

A particular reason why the wave function of the Universe cannot be the whole ontology lies in the argument, led by Maudlin (2010), that this is the wrong type of object. The wave function of the Universe (considered to have N particles) is defined in a 3N-dimensional configuration space, while we need an entity in 3+1 space-time (like the primitive ontology); see the discussion by Albert (1996), Lewis (2004), Monton (2006), and Ney (2021, 2023). The addition of “primitive ontology” to the wave function of the Universe helps us to understand our experience, but complicates the mathematical part of the theory. In the MWI framework, it is not necessary. The expectation values of the density of particles in space-time, which are the concept derived from the wave functions corresponding to different worlds, can play the role of “primitive ontology”. Since interactions between particles are local in space, this is what is needed for finding causal connections ending in our experience. The density of particles is gauge independent and also properly transforms between different Lorentz observers such that they all agree upon their experiences. In particular, the explanation of our experience is unaffected by the “narratability failure” problem of Albert (2015): the wave function description might be different for different Lorentz frames, but the description in terms of densities of particles is the same. Note also an alternative approach based on 3+1 space-time by Wallace and Timpson (2010), who, being dissatisfied with the wave function ontology, introduced the formulation of Spacetime State Realism. Recently, more works appeared on this subject: Ney and Albert (2013), Myrvold (2015), Gao (2017), Lombardi et al. (2019), Maudlin (2019), Chen (2019), Wallace (2020), Wilson (2022), Allori (2026), and Dulani and Ney (2026). These works discuss problems in obtaining our world as emergent from the Universal wave function; note also Miller (2025) for showing difficulties in combining MWI with chemistry. These considerations might explain a skeptical tone of Everettian Quantum Mechanics. However, as argued in Sec. 3, the success of the “emergence” program is not strictly necessary: it suffices to locate the counterpart of our experienced world within the Universal wave function.

7.4 Derivation of the Probability Postulate

A common criticism of the MWI—raised by Belinfante (1975) and repeated by Putnam (2005)—relies on a naive derivation where the probability of an outcome is proportional to the number of worlds with that outcome. Such a derivation leads to the wrong predictions, but accepting the idea of probability being proportional to the measure of existence of a world resolves this problem. Although this involves adding a postulate, we do not complicate the mathematical part (i) of the theory since we do not change the ontology, namely, the wave function. It is a postulate belonging to part (ii), the connection to our experience, and it is a very natural postulate: differences in the mathematical descriptions of worlds are manifest in our experience; see Saunders (1998).

A distinct source of criticism arises from the ambitious claim—attributed to Everett and supported by DeWitt (1970)—that the Probability Postulate can be derived solely from the MWI formalism. While objections to such derivations may be valid (see Kent (1990)), they are frequently conflated with objections to the MWI itself. Similarly, recent attempts to derive the postulate using decision theory (Deutsch (1999, 2012); Wallace (2007)) or particular symmetry arguments (Zurek (2005); Sebens and Carroll (2018)) have faced strong opposition (see Section 4.3). These critiques, too, are often misconstrued as evidence against the interpretation. However, as Papineau (2010) argues, even if MWI holds no advantage over other interpretations regarding the derivation of the Born rule, it is at no disadvantage either.

The issue, termed the “incoherence” probability problem by Wallace (2003), is arguably the most serious difficulty. How can probability exist if all possible outcomes occur? To address this, Saunders and Wallace (2008a) introduced semantics aimed at giving sense to talk of pre-branching uncertainty. Greaves (2004) argued that the decision-theoretic approach initiated by Deutsch (1999) does not require uncertainty. As discussed in Section 4.2, after branching, self-location uncertainty suffices to explain the illusion of probability for an observer, even though the global Universe remains deterministic. Albert (2010, 2015) objected that Vaidman’s self-locating probability arises “too late” in the process. McQueen and Vaidman (2019) countered by framing probability through the value of a rational bet using the strategy of Deutsch (1999) and Wallace (2003) (see Section 4.3). The payoffs of such a bet affect the experimenter’s successors in the various worlds; since the pre-measurement experimenter cares about all successors—who share identical rational strategies—the betting behavior is well-defined prior to the experiment. Recently, Lazarovici (2023) and Barrett (2025) argued that the concept of typicality better captures Everett’s original approach. In this view, Born probabilities are neither subjective degrees of belief nor chances of exclusive outcomes, but rather correspond to the relative frequencies of records along typical branches of the Universe.

7.5 Social Behavior of a Believer in the MWI

There are claims that a believer in the MWI will behave in an irrational way. One claim is based on the naive argument described in the previous section: a believer who assigns equal probabilities to all different worlds will make equal bets for the outcomes of quantum experiments that have unequal probabilities.

Another claim, discussed by Lewis (2000), is related to the strategy of a believer in the MWI who is offered to play a quantum Russian roulette game. The argument is that I, who would not accept an offer to play a classical Russian roulette game, should agree to play the roulette any number of times if the firing mechanism is controlled by a quantum measurement outcome. Indeed, at the end, there will be one world in which Lev is a multi-millionaire and in all other worlds there will be no Lev Vaidman alive. Thus, in the future, the surviving Lev will be a rich and presumably happy man.

However, adopting the Probability Postulate leads all believers in the MWI to behave according to the Behavior Principle. Under this principle, our behavior is similar to that of a believer in collapse theory who cares about possible future worlds according to the probability of their occurrence. I should not agree to play quantum Russian roulette because the measure of existence of worlds with Lev dead will be much larger than the measure of existence of the worlds with a rich and alive Lev. This approach also resolves the puzzle which Wilson (2017) raises concerning the Quantum Doomsday Argument.

While the Behavior Principle ensures that an MWI believer acts conventionally in most scenarios, specific situations exist where belief in the MWI might alter behavior. Assume I am forced to play Russian roulette but given a choice between a classical or a quantum version. If my subjective preference is to ensure the existence of at least one Lev in the future, I should choose the quantum version. However, if I am terribly afraid of dying, I should choose classical roulette, which offers a chance that death does not occur at all.

Albrecht and Phillips (2014) claim that even a regular coin toss splits the world, suggesting that a dedicated quantum device is not needed to generate splitting. While splitting events are undeniably frequent—every Geiger counter or single-photon detector splits the world—the frequency of splitting outside a physics laboratory remains a complex physics question. Not every situation leads to a multitude of worlds with a sizable measure of existence; otherwise, our ability to predict the near future would be compromised.

8. Why the MWI?

For proponents of the MWI, the primary reason for its adoption is that it avoids the collapse of the quantum wave. Alternative no-collapse theories are not considered superior for various reasons—such as the nonlocality inherent in Bohmian mechanics (see Brown and Wallace (2005))—and they all share the disadvantage of positing additional structure. The collapse postulate introduces a physical law that differs from all other known physics in two key aspects: it is genuinely random, and it involves some kind of action at a distance. Furthermore, there is no experimental evidence favoring collapse over the MWI. Adopting the MWI allows Nature to avoid “playing dice”; it provides a deterministic theory for the physical Universe while explaining why the world appears indeterministic to human observers. The MWI is understood to avoid action at a distance, as the nonlocal correlations we observe in Bell-type experiments with entangled particles can instead be explained by the nonlocality (nonseparability) of worlds.

The MWI resolves most, if not all, paradoxes of quantum mechanics (e.g., Schrödinger’s cat); for a discussion on the resolution of various paradoxes, see Vaidman (1994) and McQueen and Vaidman (2020). In this context, a physical paradox can be understood as a phenomenon that strongly contradicts our classical intuition. Because the fundamental laws of physics govern the Universe as a whole—encompassing all worlds—restricting our perspective to a single world can generate the appearance of a paradox. An illustrative example is the interaction-free measurement proposed by Elitzur and Vaidman (1993), which demonstrates how one can obtain information about a region through which no particle ever passed. From the perspective of the entire Universe, however, the paradox dissolves: in other worlds, particles did indeed pass through that region.

Researchers in quantum information constitute another community that frequently favors the MWI. In quantum computing, a defining feature is the parallel processing performed within a single computer, a concept that closely mirrors the foundational picture of the MWI. However, the usefulness of the MWI in explaining the speedup of quantum computation has been questioned (see Steane (2003); Duwell (2007); Cuffaro (2012, 2022)). It is not that quantum computation cannot be understood without the MWI framework; rather, as noted by Deutsch and Jozsa (1992), it is often intuitively easier to conceptualize quantum algorithms as parallel computations occurring across parallel worlds. Although there is no way to extract all the information generated across these parallel computations, a quantum algorithm operates by having the outcomes of all calculations interfere to yield the desired result. While cluster-state quantum computers also rely on parallel computations, the mechanism by which the final result is obtained is less transparent. The criticism originates from identifying computational worlds with decoherent worlds. In reality, a quantum computing process actively avoids decoherence through careful engineering, and the preferred basis is established as the computational basis by fiat.

Recent studies suggest that several founding figures of quantum mechanics held views aligning closely with the MWI; for instance, Allori et al. (2011) argue this regarding Schrödinger, as does Becker (2004) concerning von Neumann. At the inception of the MWI, Wheeler (1957) wrote: “No escape seems possible from this relative state formulation if one wants to have a complete mathematical model for the quantum mechanics…” While the MWI initially struggled against the dominant Copenhagen interpretation (see Byrne (2010); Barrett and Byrne (2012)), it has steadily gained legitimacy in recent decades (see Deutsch (1996), Bevers (2011), Barrett (2011), Tegmark (2014), Susskind (2016), Zurek (2018), and Brown (2020)). Contextualizing this shift, Berenstain (2020) argues that the MWI represents the latest in a succession of scientific revolutions that have compelled humans to abandon the prejudice of occupying a privileged position in the Universe. Much like the heliocentric model of the Solar System, Darwinian evolution, and the Special Theory of Relativity, the MWI follows this decentralizing pattern. It offers metaphysical neutrality between the perspectives of observers on different branches of the universal wave function, contrasting with single-world theories that grant a privileged reality to just one observer’s perspective.

Despite its many advantages, the MWI is far from achieving consensus within the physics community. Allori (2023) suggests that this lack of agreement stems from the fact that “currently there is no consensus about which should be a theory’s desiderata”. A recent survey by Gibney (2025) highlights the ongoing conflict among quantum interpretations, positioning the MWI as a serious contender. It is still in the developing stage, as can be seen from the very diverse opinions expressed in the recent conferences devoted to the MWI Oxford (2021), Tel Aviv (2022).

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• –––, 2005, ‘Probabilities from Entanglement, Born’s rule \(p_k =|\psi_k |^2\) from Envariance’, Physical Review A, 71: 052105.
• –––, 2018, ‘Quantum Theory of the Classical: Quantum Jumps, Born’s Rule and Objective Classical Reality via Quantum Darwinism’, Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society A, 376: 20180107.
• –––, 2022, ‘Emergence of the Classical World from Within Our Quantum Universe’, in Kiefer, C. (eds) From Quantum to Classical: Essays in Honour of H.-Dieter Zeh, Cham: Springer, pp. 23–44.
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Acknowledgments

I thank Yossi Sirote for his work on the new edition of this entry. I am grateful to everybody who has borne with me through endless discussions about the MWI. I acknowledge partial support by grant 1713/24 of the Israel Science Foundation and Alexander von Humboldt Foundation.