Complexity of the Question

It is said that philosophy begins in wonder. Thus it was for the pre-Socratic Greeks, who wondered what constituted the basic stuff of the world (κóσμος) around them, how this basic stuff changed into the diverse forms they experienced, and how it came to be. Questions of origination in its metaphysical dimensions are the subject of our concern.

First, why is there anything at all? This question becomes clearer when put in contrastive form: Why is there something rather than nothing? We can ask this question even in the absence of contingent beings, though in this context it is likely to prove unanswerable. For example, if God or the universe is logically or absolutely necessary, these would not only exist but must exist even if nothing else existed. Probably no reason can be given for why logically or absolutely necessary things exist, if they do at all. (Michael Almeida disagrees; see his argument in the supplement Argument from a Strong Principle of Sufficient Reason.)

Some doubt whether we can ask this question because there being nothing is not an option. John Heil asks, “What exactly is nothing at all? What would nothing be?” (2013: 174). He analogizes nothing with the notion of empty space, in terms of which, he thinks, we can conceptualize nothing. He reasons that we cannot achieve a notion of empty space simply by removing the universe’s contents one at a time, for space (the void) would still exist. However, we need not analogize nothing in terms of empty space, and even if we do, we surely can conceive of removing space. If we think of space as a particular type of relation between objects, the removal of all objects (everything) would leave nothing, including relations. The key point is that “leaving nothing” is not to be understood in the sense that nothing is or has existence. We can easily be misled by the language of there being nothing at all, leading to the notion that nothing has being or existence. Heil suggests that nothing might be a precursor to the Big Bang. However, this too is a misconception—though one widely held by those who think that the universe arose out of nothing, e.g., a vacuum fluctuation. A vacuum fluctuation is itself not nothing “but is a sea of fluctuating energy endowed with a rich structure and subject to physical laws” (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 183, 191). The contrastive question is comprehensible: “Why is there something rather than there never having been anything whatsoever?”

Gerardus Rutten (2012, 13–15), develops an a priori reductio ad absurdum argument for the impossibility of there being nothing. Suppose nothing exists. If nothing exists, then no actual states of affairs exist, and if no actual states of affairs exist, no merely possible states of affairs exist, since (on an Aristotelean model) there is nothing to actualize them or bring them about. Hence, if nothing exists, there are no possible states of affairs, since to be possible, something must be either actual or merely possible. (This is consistent with theists’ contention that out of nothing nothing can come.) However, one can conceive of a possible world with at least one actual and hence possible state of affairs S, for example, a world with one atom. But, Rutten notes, on the S5 axiom system of modal logic (see the entry on modal logic), all possible worlds are connected. Hence, if S is metaphysically possible in one world, S is metaphysically possible in all possible worlds. That is, S is necessarily possible. However, this contradicts the original conclusion that if total nothingness is metaphysically possible, there are no possible states of affairs in that possible world. Hence, this provides a reductio against the original thesis that there can be nothingness.

One might counter this reductio not only by questioning the principle that what is factually possible in one world is so in every world, but also by contending that the argument trades on a confusion between factual necessity, as evidenced by appeal to an Aristotelian principle regarding the relationship between actuality and possibility, with logical necessity, which in invoking the S5 modal system addresses logical possibility across possible worlds (for this distinction, see Burgess 1999, 81).

Second, why are there these particular contingent beings? The starting point here is the existence of particular things, and the question posed asks for an explanation for there being these particular things. If we are looking for a causal explanation and accept a full explanation (in terms of contemporary or immediately prior causal conditions and the relevant natural laws that together necessitate the effect), the answer emerges from an analysis of the relevant immediate causal conditions present in each case. Hume argues that an explanation in terms of temporally conjoined factors is all that is necessary for a satisfactory explanation. In contrast, O’Connor treats this formulation of the question as the basis for his construction of a cosmological argument for the existence of an absolutely necessary being (2008: 65).

Heil suggests that the answer depends on how one understands the Big Bang (2013: 178). If it was spontaneous, the question has no answer. If not spontaneous, there might be an answer. Theists broaden the explanatory search to include final causes or intentions appropriate to a personal cause. It leads us to ask the question, “Supposing that God exists, why did God bring about contingent beings?” This assumes that God exists and now inquires about the reasons for creation. On the one hand, we might argue that this question is unanswerable in that only God would know his reasons for bringing the universe into existence (O’Connor 2008). On the other hand, God acts out of his nature. Swinburne (2004: 47, 114–23) emphasizes God’s goodness, from which we can infer possible reasons for what God brings about (although at this point the problem of evil has bite). God also acts from his intentions (Swinburne 1993: 139–45; 2007: 83–84), so that God could reveal his purposes for his act of creating (Richard Swinburne, The Evolution of the Soul: 309).

Third, why do things continue to exist? This is the question that Thomas Aquinas posed. Aquinas was interested not in a beginning cause but in a sustaining or grounding cause, for he believed that the universe could be eternal—although he believed on the basis of revelation that it was not eternal. He constructed his cosmological arguments around the question of what sustains or grounds things in the universe in their existence.

Fourth, if the universe has a beginning, what is the cause of that beginning? This is the question that is addressed by the kalām cosmological argument, given its central premise that everything that begins to exist has a cause. Whether the antecedent in the conditional is true is the subject of much philosophical dispute (see below, Section 6)).

Fifth and fundamentally, why are there contingent beings? This may be asked about particular finite beings and, if the universe is contingent, the universe. Several responses have been given. One is that particular things exist because of their causes, and their causes because of their causes, and so on. Had those causes not existed, the effect in question would not exist. If one speaks about the universe, then either it exists because it is caused (e.g., brought about by the intentional act of a supernatural being) or it is inexplicable (the universe just exists; its existence is a brute fact; it has always existed, though perhaps through many phases). This is the question that many traditional cosmological arguments connected to natural theology address.

One thing that is obvious from this discussion is that questions about existence are more nuanced than usually addressed (Heil 2013: 177). It is important to be more precise about what one is asking when one asks this broader metaphysical question about why there is something rather than nothing.