Descartes’ Epistemology

First published Wed Dec 3, 1997; substantive revision Mon Nov 27, 2023

René Descartes (1596–1650) is widely regarded as a key figure in the founding of modern philosophy. His noteworthy contributions extend to mathematics and physics. This entry focuses on his philosophical contributions to the theory of knowledge. Specifically, the focus is on the epistemological project of his famous work, Meditations on First Philosophy. Descartes circulated the Meditations to other philosophers for objections and comments, then responding with detailed replies that provide a rich source of further information about the original work. Indeed, six sets of objections and replies were published along with the first edition of the Meditations (1641), and a seventh set was added with the second edition (1642).

1. Conception of Knowledge

1.1 Analysis of Perfect Knowledge

I shall refer to the brand of knowledge Descartes seeks in the Meditations, as ‘perfect knowledge’ – a brand he sometimes discusses in connection with the Latin term scientia. Famously, he defines perfect knowledge in terms of doubt. While distinguishing perfect knowledge from lesser grades of conviction, he writes:

I distinguish the two as follows: there is conviction [persuasio] when there remains some reason which might lead us to doubt, but knowledge [scientia] is conviction based on a reason so strong that it can never be shaken by any stronger reason. (24 May 1640 letter to Regius, AT 3:65, CSMK 147)

In the Second Replies, he adds:

… I shall now expound for a second time the basis on which it seems to me that all human certainty can be founded.

First of all, as soon as we think that we correctly perceive something, we are spontaneously convinced that it is true. Now if this conviction is so firm that it is impossible for us ever to have any reason for doubting what we are convinced of, then there are no further questions for us to ask: we have everything that we could reasonably want. … For the supposition which we are making here is of a conviction so firm that it is quite incapable of being destroyed; and such a conviction is clearly the same as the most perfect certainty. (AT 7:144f, CSM 2:103)

These passages (and others) suggest an account wherein doubt is the contrast of certainty. As my certainty increases, my doubt decreases; conversely, as my doubt increases, my certainty decreases. The requirement that knowledge is to be based in complete, or perfect certainty, thus amounts to requiring a complete inability to doubt one’s convictions – an utter indubitability. This conception of the relationship between certainty and doubt helps underwrite Descartes’ methodical emphasis on doubt, the so-called ‘method of doubt’ (discussed in Section 2).

That perfect knowledge requires that it be “impossible for us ever to have any reason for doubting what we are convinced of” marks an extraordinarily high standard of justification. Does Descartes view this as the only standard deserving of knowledge-talk? Arguably, no; yet this is a difficult question, because he didn’t write in English. He seems to be an epistemic contextualist, at least in the sense of invoking some notion of cognition, or knowledge, in divergent contexts presupposing different epistemic standards. We’ll see, for example, that he holds that even the deductive demonstrations of expert geometers may fall short of the standards needed for perfect knowledge; yet, the kind of terminology he uses to characterize their epistemic achievements is routinely rendered in terms of knowledge-talk, in standard English translations of his work.

The certainty/indubitability of interest to Descartes is psychological in character, though not merely psychological – not simply an inexplicable feeling. It has also a distinctively epistemic character involving a kind of rational insight. During moments of certainty, it is as if my perception is guided by “a great light in the intellect” (Med. 4, AT 7:59, CSM 2:41). This rational illumination empowers me to “see utterly clearly with my mind’s eye”; my feelings of certainty are grounded – indeed, “I see a manifest contradiction” in denying the proposition of which I’m convinced (Med. 3, AT 7:36, CSM 2:25).

Descartes characterizes these epistemically impressive cognitions in terms of their being perceived clearly and distinctly. The Meditations never defines these terms; indeed, it sometimes uses them in confusing ways (e.g., sometimes using clarity-talk as a shorthand for the conjunction of clarity and distinctness). However, in the Principles Descartes offers the following definitions:

I call a perception “clear” when it is present and accessible to the attentive mind … I call a perception “distinct” if, as well as being clear, it is so sharply separated from all other perceptions that it contains within itself only what is clear. (Prin. 1:45, AT 8a:21f, CSM 1:207f)

Other texts indicate that clarity contrasts with obscurity, and distinctness with confusedness. Though having clear and distinct apprehension is epistemically impressive, we’ll see clear texts indicating that this marks a merely necessary condition of perfect knowledge, not a sufficient condition.

Should we regard Descartes’ account of perfect knowledge as a version of the justified true belief analysis of knowledge tracing back to Plato? The above texts are among Descartes’ clearest statements concerning perfect knowledge. Yet they raise questions about the extent to which his account is continuous with other analyses of knowledge. Prima facie, his characterizations imply a justified belief analysis – or, using language closer to his own (and where justification is construed in terms of unshakability), an unshakable conviction analysis. There’s no stated requirement that the would-be knower’s conviction is to be true, as opposed to being unshakably certain. Is truth, therefore, not a requirement of perfect knowledge? We’ll return to the issue in Section 6.4.

1.2 Internalism and Justification

One way to divide up theories of justification is in terms of the internalism-externalism distinction. Very roughly: a theory of epistemic justification is internalist insofar as it requires that the justifying factors are accessible to the knower’s conscious awareness; it is externalist insofar as it does not impose this requirement.

Descartes holds an internalist account requiring that all justifying factors take the form of ideas. (For a partly externalist interpretation of Descartes, see Della Rocca 2005.) Various texts imply that ideas are, strictly speaking, the only objects of immediate perception or awareness. (More on the directness or immediacy of sense perception in Section 9.1.) Independent of assumptions about the directness of perception, Descartes’ method of doubt underwrites an assumption with similar force: for almost the entirety of the Meditations, his meditator-spokesperson – hereafter, the ‘meditator’ – adopts the methodological assumption that all his thoughts and experiences are occurring in a dream. This assumption is tantamount to requiring that justification comes in the form of ideas, rather than via direct perception of an extramental world.

An important consequence of this kind of interpretation – i.e., a traditional representationalist understanding of ideas – is that rigorous philosophical inquiry must proceed via an inside-to-out strategy. This strategy is assiduously followed in the Meditations, and it endures as a hallmark of many early modern epistemologies. Ultimately, all judgments are grounded in an inspection of the mind’s own ideas. Philosophical inquiry is, properly understood, an investigation of ideas. The methodical strategy of the Meditations has the effect of forcing readers to adopt this mode of inquiry.

In recent years, some commentators have questioned this traditional way of understanding the mediating role of ideas. Noteworthy is John Carriero’s outstanding commentary on the Meditations (2009), an account providing a serious challenge to traditional representationalist interpretations (including the kind of interpretation often assumed in the present account).

1.3 Methodist Approach

How are would-be knowers to proceed in identifying candidates for perfect knowledge? Distinguish particularist and methodist answers to the question. The particularist is apt to trust our prima facie intuitions regarding particular knowledge claims. These intuitions may then be used to help identify more general epistemic principles. The methodist, by contrast, is apt to distrust our prima facie intuitions. The preference is instead to begin with general principles about proper method. These methodical principles may then be used to arrive at settled, reflective judgments concerning particular knowledge claims.

Famously, Descartes is in the methodist camp. Those who haphazardly “direct their minds down untrodden paths” are sometimes “lucky enough in their wanderings to hit upon some truth,” but “it is far better,” writes Descartes, “never to contemplate investigating the truth about any matter than to do so without a method” (Rules 4, AT 10:371, CSM 1:15f). Were we to rely on our prima facie intuitions, we might accept that the earth is unmoved, or that ordinary objects (as tables and chairs) are just as they appear. Yet, newly emerging mechanist doctrines of the 17th century imply otherwise. Descartes thinks such cases underscore the unreliability of our prima facie intuitions and the need for a method by which to make epistemic progress.

Descartes’ view is not that all our pre-reflective intuitions are mistaken. He concedes that “no sane person has ever seriously doubted” such particular claims as “that there really is a world, and that human beings have bodies” (Synopsis, AT 7:16, CSM 2:11). But such pre-reflective judgments may be ill-grounded, even when true.

The dialectic of the First Meditation features a confrontation between particularism and methodism, with methodism emerging the victor. For example, the meditator (while voicing empiricist sensibilities) puts forward, as candidates for the foundations of knowledge, such prima facie obvious claims as “that I am here, sitting by the fire, wearing a winter dressing-gown, holding this piece of paper in my hands, and so on” – particular matters “about which doubt is quite impossible,” or so it would seem (AT 7:18, CSM 2:12f). In response (and at each level of the dialectic), Descartes invokes his own methodical principles to show that the prima facie obviousness of such particular claims is insufficient to meet the burden of proof.

Another methodological feature of the Meditations is its first-person, meditative character. Gary Hatfield explains.

Descartes adopted the strategy of writing his Meditations as meditations. In other words, he modeled his book in metaphysics and the theory of knowledge (or “epistemology”) on a form of religious writing, that of “meditations” or “spiritual exercises” … In spiritual exercises, which were common in Jesuit schools such as the one Descartes attended (La Flèche), readers learn to abandon the world of the senses and sensuality and to focus on God. … Because the Meditations is constructed in the hope that each reader will take on the identity of the “I” of the narrative, the presumed reader of the text is called “the meditator.” (2006, 125)

1.4 Innate Ideas

Descartes’ commitment to innate ideas places him in a rationalist tradition tracing back to Plato. Knowledge of the nature of reality derives from ideas of the intellect, not the external senses. An important part of metaphysical inquiry therefore involves learning to think with the intellect. Plato’s allegory of the cave portrays this rationalist theme in terms of epistemically distinct worlds: what the senses reveal is likened to shadowy imagery on the wall of a poorly lit cave; what the intellect reveals is likened to a world of fully real beings illuminated by bright sunshine. The metaphor aptly depicts our epistemic predicament given Descartes’ own doctrines. An important function of his methods is to help would-be perfect knowers redirect their attention from the confused imagery of the senses to the luminous world of clear and distinct ideas of the intellect.

Further comparisons arise with Plato’s doctrine of recollection. In the Fifth Meditation, in connection with the discovery of innate truths within, the meditator remarks: “on first discovering them it seems that I am not so much learning something new as remembering what I knew before” (Med. 5, AT 7:64, CSM 2:44). Elsewhere Descartes adds, of innate truths:

[W]e come to know them by the power of our own native intelligence, without any sensory experience. All geometrical truths are of this sort – not just the most obvious ones, but all the others, however abstruse they may appear. Hence, according to Plato, Socrates asks a slave boy about the elements of geometry and thereby makes the boy able to dig out certain truths from his own mind which he had not previously recognized were there, thus attempting to establish the doctrine of reminiscence. Our knowledge of God is of this sort. (May 1643 letter To Voetius, AT 8b:166f, CSMK 222f)

The famous “wax” thought experiment of the Second Meditation is supposed to illustrate (among other things) a procedure to “dig out” what is innate. The thought experiment purports to help the meditator achieve a “purely mental scrutiny,” thereby apprehending more easily the innate idea of body (Med. 2, AT 7:30f, CSM 2:20f). According to Descartes, our minds come stocked with a variety of intellectual concepts – ideas whose content is independent of experience. This storehouse includes ideas in mathematics, logic, and metaphysics. Interestingly, Descartes holds that even our sensory ideas involve innate content. On his understanding of the new mechanical physics, bodies have no real properties resembling our sensory ideas of colors, sounds, tastes, and the like, thus implying that the content of such ideas draws from the mind itself. But if even these sensory ideas count as innate, how then are we to characterize the doctrine of innateness? Importantly, the formation of these sensory ideas – unlike purely intellectual concepts – depends on sensory stimulation. On one plausible understanding, Descartes’ official doctrine has it that ideas are innate insofar as their content derives from the nature of the mind alone, as opposed to deriving from sense experience (cf. Newman 2006). This characterization allows that both intellectual and sensory concepts draw on native resources, though not to the same extent.

Though the subject of rationalism or nativism in Descartes’ epistemology deserves careful attention, the present article generally focuses on Descartes’ efforts to achieve perfect knowledge. Relatively little attention is given to his doctrine of innateness, or, more generally, his ontology of thought. (For further discussion of his commitment to innateness, see Adams 1975, Jolley 1990, Newman 2006, and Nelson 2007.)

2. The Methods: Foundationalism and Doubt

Of his own methodology, Descartes writes:

Throughout my writings I have made it clear that my method imitates that of the architect. When an architect wants to build a house which is stable on ground where there is a sandy topsoil over underlying rock, or clay, or some other firm base, he begins by digging out a set of trenches from which he removes the sand, and anything resting on or mixed in with the sand, so that he can lay his foundations on firm soil. In the same way, I began by taking everything that was doubtful and throwing it out, like sand … (Replies 7, AT 7:536f, CSM 2:366)

The theory whereby items of knowledge are best organized on an analogy to architecture traces back to ancient Greek thought – to Aristotle, and to work in geometry. That Descartes’ method effectively pays homage to Aristotle is, of course, a welcome result for his Aristotelian audience. But Descartes views Aristotle’s foundationalist principles as incomplete, at least when applied to metaphysical inquiry. His method of doubt is intended to complement foundationalism. The two methods are supposed to work in cooperation, as conveyed in the above quotation. Let’s consider each method.

2.1 Foundationalism

The central insight of foundationalism is to organize knowledge in the manner of a well-structured, architectural edifice. Such an edifice owes its structural integrity to two kinds of features: a firm foundation and a superstructure of support beams firmly anchored to the foundation. A system of justified beliefs might be organized by two analogous features: a foundation of unshakable first principles, and a superstructure of further propositions anchored to the foundation via unshakable inference.

Exemplary of a foundationalist system is Euclid’s geometry. Euclid begins with a foundation of first principles – definitions, postulates, and axioms or common notions – on which he then bases a superstructure of further propositions. Descartes’ own designs for metaphysical knowledge are inspired by Euclid’s system:

Those long chains composed of very simple and easy reasoning, which geometers customarily use to arrive at their most difficult demonstrations, had given me occasion to suppose that all the things which can fall under human knowledge are interconnected in the same way. (Discourse 2, AT 6:19, CSM 1:120).

It would be misleading to characterize the arguments of the Meditations as unfolding straightforwardly according to geometric method (cf. Curley 2006, 31). But Descartes maintains that they can be reconstructed as such, and he expressly does so at the end of the Second Replies – providing a “geometrical” exposition of some of his central lines of argument, organized as definitions, postulates, axioms or common notions, and propositions (AT 7:160–70, CSM 2:113–120).

As noted above, the Meditations contains a destructive component that Descartes likens to the architect’s preparations for laying a foundation. Though the component finds no analogue in the methods of geometers, Descartes appears to hold that it is needed in metaphysical inquiry. The discovery of Euclid’s first principles (some of them, at any rate) is comparatively unproblematic: such principles as that things which are equal to the same thing are also equal to one another accord not only with reason, but with the senses. In contrast, metaphysical inquiry might have first principles that conflict with the senses:

The difference is that the primary notions which are presupposed for the demonstration of geometrical truths are readily accepted by anyone, since they accord with the use of our senses. Hence there is no difficulty there, except in the proper deduction of the consequences, which can be done even by the less attentive, provided they remember what has gone before. …

In metaphysics by contrast there is nothing which causes so much effort as making our perception of the primary notions clear and distinct. Admittedly, they are by their nature as evident as, or even more evident than, the primary notions which the geometers study; but they conflict with many preconceived opinions derived from the senses which we have got into the habit of holding from our earliest years, and so only those who really concentrate and meditate and withdraw their minds from corporeal things, so far as possible, will achieve perfect knowledge of them.

(Replies 2, AT 7:156f, CSM 2:111)

Among Descartes’ persistent themes is that such preconceived opinions can obscure our mental vision of innate principles: where there are disputes about first principles, it is not “because one man’s faculty of knowledge extends more widely than another’s, but because the common notions are in conflict with the preconceived opinions of some people who, as a result, cannot easily grasp them”; whereas, “we cannot fail to know them [innate common notions] when the occasion for thinking about them arises, provided that we are not blinded by preconceived opinions” (Prin. 1:49f, AT 8a:24, CSM 1:209). These “preconceived opinions” must be “set aside,” says Descartes, “in order to lay the first foundations of philosophy” (May 1643 letter to Voetius, AT 8b:37, CSMK 221). Otherwise, we’re apt to regard, as first principles, the mistaken (though prima facie obvious) sensory claims that particularists find attractive. Such mistakes in the laying of the foundations weaken the entire edifice. Descartes adds:

All the mistakes made in the sciences happen, in my view, simply because at the beginning we make judgements too hastily, and accept as our first principles matters which are obscure and of which we do not have a clear and distinct notion. (Search, AT 10:526, CSM 2:419)

Though foundationalism brilliantly allows for the expansion of knowledge from first principles, Descartes thinks that a complementary method is needed to help us discover genuine first principles. As Hatfield writes, “the problem is not to carry out proofs (which might well be assented to, given the definitions and axioms), but to discover the axioms themselves (which are hopelessly obscured by the prejudices of the senses)” (1986, 71). Descartes therefore devises the method of doubt for this purpose – a method to help “set aside” preconceived opinions.

(For examples of non-foundationist interpretations, see Bennett 1990, Frankfurt 1970, Sosa 1997a, and Della Rocca 2011.)

2.2 Method of Doubt

Descartes opens the First Meditation asserting the need “to demolish everything completely and start again right from the foundations” (AT 7:17, CSM 2:12). The passage adds:

Reason now leads me to think that I should hold back my assent from opinions which are not completely certain and indubitable just as carefully as I do from those which are patently false. So, for the purpose of rejecting all my opinions, it will be enough if I find in each of them at least some reason for doubt. (AT 7:18, CSM 2:12)

In the architectural analogy, we can think of bulldozers as the ground-clearing tools of demolition. For knowledge building, Descartes construes sceptical doubts as the ground-clearing tools of epistemic demolition. Bulldozers undermine literal ground; doubt undermines epistemic ground. Using sceptical doubts, the meditator shows how to find “some reason for doubt” in all his preexisting claims to knowledge.

The ultimate aim of the method is constructive. Unlike “the sceptics, who doubt only for the sake of doubting,” Descartes aims “to reach certainty – to cast aside the loose earth and sand so as to come upon rock or clay” (Discourse 3, AT 6:29, CSM 1:125). Bulldozers are typically used for destructive ends, as are sceptical doubts. Descartes’ methodical innovation is to employ demolition for constructive ends. Where a bulldozer’s force overpowers the ground, its effects are destructive. Where the ground’s firmness resists the bulldozer’s force, the bulldozer might be used constructively – using it to reveal the ground as firm. Descartes thus uses sceptical doubts to test the firmness of candidates put forward for the foundations of knowledge.

According to at least one prominent critic, this employment of sceptical doubt is unnecessary and excessive. Writes Gassendi:

There is just one point I am not clear about, namely why you did not make a simple and brief statement to the effect that you were regarding your previous knowledge as uncertain so that you could later single out what you found to be true. Why instead did you consider everything as false, which seems more like adopting a new prejudice than relinquishing an old one? This strategy made it necessary for you to convince yourself by imagining a deceiving God or some evil demon who tricks us, whereas it would surely have been sufficient to cite the darkness of the human mind or the weakness of our nature. (Objs. 5, AT 7:257f, CSM 2:180; italics added)

Here, Gassendi singles out two features of methodical doubt – its universal and hyperbolic character. In reply, Descartes remarks:

You say that you approve of my project for freeing my mind from preconceived opinions; and indeed no one can pretend that such a project should not be approved of. But you would have preferred me to have carried it out by making a “simple and brief statement” – that is, only in a perfunctory fashion. Is it really so easy to free ourselves from all the errors which we have soaked up since our infancy? Can we really be too careful in carrying out a project which everyone agrees should be performed? (Replies 5, AT 7:348, CSM 2:241f)

Evidently, Descartes holds that the universal and hyperbolic character of methodical doubt is helpful to its success. Further appeal to the architectural analogy helps elucidate why.

Consider first the universal character of doubt – the need “to demolish everything completely and start again right from the foundations.” The point is not merely to apply doubt to all candidates for perfect knowledge, but to apply doubt collectively. Descartes offers the following analogy:

Suppose [a person] had a basket full of apples and, being worried that some of the apples were rotten, wanted to take out the rotten ones to prevent the rot spreading. How would he proceed? Would he not begin by tipping the whole lot out of the basket? And would not the next step be to cast his eye over each apple in turn, and pick up and put back in the basket only those he saw to be sound, leaving the others? In just the same way, those who have never philosophized correctly have various opinions in their minds which they have begun to store up since childhood, and which they therefore have reason to believe may in many cases be false. They then attempt to separate the false beliefs from the others, so as to prevent their contaminating the rest and making the whole lot uncertain. Now the best way they can accomplish this is to reject all their beliefs together in one go, as if they were all uncertain and false. They can then go over each belief in turn and re-adopt only those which they recognize to be true and indubitable. (Replies 7, AT 7:481, CSM 2:324)

That even one falsehood would be mistakenly treated as a genuine first principle – say, the belief that the senses are reliable, or that ancient authorities should be trusted – threatens to spread falsehood to other beliefs in the system. A collective doubt helps avoid such mistakes. It ensures that the method only approves candidate first principles that are unshakable in their own right: it rules out that the appearance of unshakability is owed to logical relations with other principles, themselves not subjected to doubt.

How is the hyperbolic character of methodical doubt supposed to contribute to the method’s success? The architectural analogy is again helpful. Suppose that an architect is vigilant in employing a universal/collective doubt. Suppose, further, that she attempts to use epistemic bulldozers for constructive purposes. A problem nonetheless arises. How big a bulldozer is she to use? A light-duty bulldozer might be unable to distinguish a medium-sized boulder from immovable bedrock. In both cases, the ground would appear immovable. Descartes takes the solution to lie in using not light-duty, but heavy-duty tools of demolition – the bigger the bulldozer, the better. The lesson is clear for the epistemic builder: the more hyperbolic the doubt, the better.

A potential problem remains. Does not the problem of the “light-duty bulldozer” repeat itself? No matter how firm one’s ground, might it not be dislodged in the face of a yet bigger bulldozer? This raises the worry that there might not be unshakable ground, as opposed to ground which is yet unshaken. Descartes’ goal of utterly indubitable epistemic ground may simply be elusive.

At this juncture, perhaps the architectural analogy breaks down in a manner that serves Descartes well. For though there is no most-powerful literal bulldozer, perhaps epistemic bulldozing is not subject to this limitation. Descartes seems to think that there is a most-powerful doubt – a doubt than which none more hyperbolic can be conceived. The Evil Genius Doubt (and equivalent doubts) is supposed to fit the bill. If the method reveals epistemic ground that stands fast in the face of a doubt this hyperbolic, then, as Descartes seems to hold, this counts as epistemic bedrock if anything does.

Hence the importance of the universal and hyperbolic character of the method of doubt. Gassendi’s suggestion that we forego methodical doubt in favor of a “simple and brief statement to the effect that [we’re] regarding [our] previous knowledge as uncertain” misses an important, intended point of the method.

Descartes’ method of doubt has been subject to numerous objections – some fair, others less so. Rendered in the terms Descartes himself employs, the method is arguably less flawed than its reputation. Let us consider some of the common objections. Two such objections are suggested in a passage from the pragmatist Peirce:

We cannot begin with complete doubt. We must begin with all the prejudices which we actually have when we enter upon the study of philosophy. These prejudices are not to be dispelled by a maxim [viz., the maxim that the philosopher “must begin with universal doubt”], for they are things which it does not occur to us can be questioned. Hence this initial skepticism will be a mere self-deception, and not real doubt … A person may, it is true, in the course of his studies, find reason to doubt what he began by believing; but in that case he doubts because he has a positive reason for it, and not on account of the Cartesian maxim. Let us not pretend to doubt in philosophy what we do not doubt in our hearts. (1955, 228f)

Note, however, that the procedure of the Meditations is not that universal doubt is supposed to flow simply from adherence to a maxim; to the contrary, the doubt is supposed to flow from careful attention to positive reasons for doubt – recall the express resolution to find “at least some reason for doubt” in one’s prior opinions. Descartes introduces sceptical arguments precisely in acknowledgement that we need such reasons:

I did say that there was some difficulty in expelling from our belief everything we have previously accepted. One reason for this is that before we can decide to doubt, we need some reason for doubting; and that is why in my First Meditation I put forward the principal reasons for doubt. (Replies 5, appendix, AT 9a:204, CSM 2:270)

A second objection arises from Peirce’s contention that we should “not pretend to doubt in philosophy what we do not doubt in our hearts”. Descartes presumably agrees that hyperbolic doubt is not (what Peirce calls) a “doubt in our hearts” – recall his concession that “no sane person has ever seriously doubted” such claims as “that there really is a world, and that human beings have bodies” (AT 7:16, CSM 2:11). Further, Descartes makes clear that we should not extend hyperbolic doubt to practical matters:

I made a very careful distinction between the conduct of life and the contemplation of the truth. As far as the conduct of life is concerned, I am very far from thinking that we should assent only to what is clearly perceived. … from time to time we will have to choose one of many alternatives about which we have no knowledge … (Replies 2, AT 7:149, CSM 2:106)

Elsewhere, Descartes illustrates the danger in applying hyperbolic doubt to practical contexts, with an example of someone who “decided to abstain from all food to the point of starvation, because he was not certain that it was not poisoned” – a scenario wherein the person “would be rightly regarded as insane” (AT 3:422, CSMK 189). Such dangers, however, do not arise in connection with theoretical matters, including those pursued in the Meditations. An essential component of Descartes’ constructive epistemology is the distinction between matters to which we have always given assent, in spite of their being doubtful, and matters to which we cannot but assent while perceiving them clearly and distinctly. Hyperbolic doubt is supposed to show that our previous opinions are likely of a piece with the former; yet, perfect knowledge is built from the latter. The emphasis on doubt is intended to help counter-balance our “habit of confidently assenting to” what we regard as “highly probable opinions,” on the grounds that such matters seem “much more reasonable to believe than to deny” (Med. 1, AT 7:15, CSM 2:22). The meditator thus adopts the attitude of methodical doubt whereby all candidates for belief are treated as if false: “it will be a good plan to turn my will in completely the opposite direction and deceive myself, by pretending for a time that these former opinions are utterly false and imaginary” (ibid.) – a plan that is carried out precisely by subjecting all matters to hyperbolic doubt.

A related objection takes the method to require not merely doubt, but disbelief or dissent. One of Gassendi’s objections reads in this manner. He seems to take Descartes to be urging us, quite literally, to “consider everything as false,” a strategy which, as he says to Descartes, “made it necessary for you to convince yourself” of the sceptical hypotheses(Objs. 5, AT 7:257f, CSM 2:180). Based on Descartes’ most careful statements, however, his method does not require a dissent from the statements it undermines. Rather, the method urges us to “hold back [our] assent from opinions which are not completely certain and indubitable just as carefully as [we] do from those which are patently false” (Med. 1, AT 7:18, CSM 2:12, cf. AT 7:461).

Finally, a common objection has it that the universality of doubt undermines the method of doubt itself, since, for example, the sceptical hypotheses themselves are dubious. Descartes thinks this mistakes the intended scope of the method: namely, to extend doubt universally to candidates for knowledge, but not also to the very tools for founding knowledge. As he concedes: “there may be reasons which are strong enough to compel us to doubt, even though these reasons are themselves doubtful, and hence are not to be retained later on” (Replies 7, AT 7:473f, CSM 2:319).

(For further discussion of Descartes’s method of doubt, see Frankfurt 1970, Garber 1986, Larmore 2014, Newman 2006, Williams 1983, and Wilson 1978.)

3. First Meditation Doubting Arguments

3.1 Dreaming Doubts

Historically, there are at least two distinct dream-related doubts. The one doubt undermines the judgment that I am presently awake – call this the ‘Now Dreaming Doubt’. The other doubt undermines the judgment that I am ever awake (i.e., in the way normally supposed) – call this the ‘Always Dreaming Doubt’. A textual case can be made on behalf of both formulations being raised in the Meditations.

Both doubts appeal to some version of the thesis that the experiences we take as dreams are (at their best) qualitatively similar to those we take as waking – call this the ‘Similarity Thesis’. The Similarity Thesis may be formulated in a variety of strengths. A strong Similarity Thesis might contend that some dreams seem experientially similar to waking, even on hindsight, subsequent to waking; a weaker rendering of the thesis might contend merely that dreams seem similar to waking while having them, but not upon waking. Arguably, the sceptical doubt is equally potent on either rendering. Even so, on the most natural reading the First Meditation passage seems to suggest the stronger view, with its reference to “exactly similar thoughts”:

How often, asleep at night, am I convinced of just such familiar events – that I am here in my dressing-gown, sitting by the fire – when in fact I am lying undressed in bed! Yet at the moment my eyes are certainly wide awake when I look at this piece of paper; I shake my head and it is not asleep; as I stretch out and feel my hand I do so deliberately, and I know what I am doing. All this would not happen with such distinctness to someone asleep. Indeed! As if I did not remember other occasions when I have been tricked by exactly similar thoughts while asleep! (AT 7:19, CSM 2:13)

As for the range of experiences that we can suppose dreams to be capable of imitating, Descartes looks to hold that every kind of sensory experience is plausibly reproducible in dreams, and thereby subject to doubt. He writes: “every sensory experience I have ever thought I was having while awake I can also think of myself as sometimes having while asleep” (Med. 6, AT 7:77, CSM 2:53).

The Similarity Thesis is sufficient to generate straightaway the Now Dreaming Doubt. Since I can think of a dream as being qualitatively similar to my present experience, then, for all I know, I am now dreaming. I might be awake. But if, for all I know, I am now dreaming, then I lack perfect knowledge of any matters whose truth presupposes that I am now awake. The Now Dreaming Doubt does its epistemic damage so long as it undermines my reasons for believing I’m awake. And at this stage of the Meditations, Descartes thinks that it does: “there are never any sure signs by means of which being awake can be distinguished from being asleep” (Med. 1, AT 7:19, CSM 2:13).

The Now Dreaming Doubt generates widespread sceptical consequences. For if I do not perfectly know that I am now awake, then neither do I know that I’m now “holding this piece of paper in my hands,” to cite an example the First Meditation meditator had supposed to be “quite impossible” to doubt. Reflection on the sceptical doubt changes his mind, and he comes around to the view that, for all he knows, the sensible objects of his present experience are mere figments of a vivid dream.

Much ado has been made about whether dreaming arguments are self-refuting. According to an influential objection, similarity theses presuppose that we can reliably distinguish dreams and waking – we need first to distinguish them, in order to compare them; yet the conclusion of dreaming arguments entails that we cannot reliably distinguish them. Therefore, if the conclusion of such an argument is true, then the premise invoking the Similarity Thesis cannot be.

Some formulations of dreaming arguments are indeed self-refuting in this way. Of present interest is whether all are – specifically, whether Descartes makes the mistake. It would appear that he does not, based on a Sixth Meditation passage summarizing the earlier doubts. There, his formulation presupposes simply the truism that we do, in fact, make a distinction between waking and dreaming (never mind whether reliably). He states the relevant premise in terms of what we think of as waking, versus what we think of as dreaming: “every sensory experience I have ever thought I was having while awake I can also think of myself as sometimes having while asleep” (AT 7:77, CSM 2:53, italics added). This formulation avoids the charge of self-refutation, for it is compatible with the conclusion that we cannot reliably distinguish dreams and waking.

Does Descartes also put forward a second dreaming argument, the Always Dreaming Doubt? There is strong textual evidence to support this (see Newman 1994), though it is by no means the standard interpretation. The conclusion of the Always Dreaming Doubt is generated from the very same Similarity Thesis, together with a further sceptical assumption, namely: that for all I know, the processes producing what I take as waking are no more veridical than those producing what I take as dreams. As the meditator puts it:

[E]very sensory experience I have ever thought I was having while awake I can also think of myself as sometimes having while asleep; and since I do not believe that what I seem to perceive in sleep comes from things located outside me, I did not see why I should be any more inclined to believe this of what I think I perceive while awake. (Med. 6, AT 7:77, CSM 2:53)

The aim of the Always Dreaming Doubt is to undermine not whether I’m now awake, but whether so-called “sensation” is produced by external objects even on the assumption that I am now awake. For in the cases of both waking and dreaming, my cognitive access extends only to the productive result, but not the productive process. On what basis, then, do I conclude that the productive processes are different – with external objects playing more of a role in waking than in dreaming? For all I know, both sorts of experience are produced by some subconscious faculty of my mind. As Descartes has his meditator say:

[T]here may be some other faculty [of my mind] not yet fully known to me, which produces these ideas without any assistance from external things; this is, after all, just how I have always thought ideas are produced in me when I am dreaming. (Med. 3, AT 7:39, CSM 2:27)

The sceptical consequences of the Always Dreaming Doubt are even more devastating than those of the Now Dreaming Doubt. If I do not perfectly know that “normal waking” experience is produced by external objects, then, for all I know, all of my experiences might be dreams of a sort. For all I know, there might not be an external world. My best evidence of an external world derives from my preconceived opinion that external world objects produce my waking experiences. Yet the Always Dreaming Doubt calls this into question:

All these considerations are enough to establish that it is not reliable judgement but merely some blind impulse that has made me believe up till now that there exist things distinct from myself which transmit to me ideas or images of themselves through the sense organs or in some other way. (Med. 3, AT 7:40, CSM 2:27)

The two dreaming doubts are parasitic on the same Similarity Thesis, though their sceptical consequences differ. The Now Dreaming Doubt raises the universal possibility of delusion: for any one of my sensory experiences, it is possible (for all I know) that the experience is delusive. The Always Dreaming Doubt raises the possibility of universal delusion: it is possible (for all I know) that all my sensory experiences are delusions (say, from a God’s-eye perspective).

3.2 Evil Genius Doubt

Though dreaming doubts do significant demolition work, they are light-duty bulldozers relative to Descartes’ most power sceptical doubt. What further judgments are left to be undermined? Immediately after the discussion of dreaming, the meditator tentatively concludes that the results of empirical disciplines “are doubtful” – e.g., “physics, astronomy, medicine,” and the like. Whereas:

[A]rithmetic, geometry and other subjects of this kind, which deal only with the simplest and most general things, regardless of whether they really exist in nature or not, contain something certain and indubitable. For whether I am awake or asleep, two and three added together are five, and a square has no more than four sides. It seems impossible that such transparent truths should incur any suspicion of being false. (Med. 1, AT 7:20, CSM 2:14)

Early in the Third Meditation, it emerges that even truths this “simple and straightforward” are subject to hyperbolic doubt (AT 7:35f, CSM 2:25). And immediately following the above First Meditation passage, Descartes introduces his most hyperbolic doubt – the hypothesis of an all-powerful deceiver.

There is variation in the interpretation of the doubt, even concerning the number of deceivers Descartes means to be citing. However, I suggest that there is a very natural reading that provides for a unified understanding of a single deceiver hypothesis.

The passage initially introducing a deceiver represents the meditator as having long believed in a creator who is both all-powerful and all-good. It seems to follow (so the meditator reasons) that a creator with these attributes would not allow its creatures to be deceived about the existence of the external world, nor about such transparent truths as that 2+3=5. But likewise, neither should a creator with these attributes allow its creatures ever to be deceived. Yet we are sometimes deceived. Since even occasional deception seems to pose a reductio on the very existence of an all-powerful, all-good creator, the implication is that the creator (if there be one) must be lacking in either power or goodness. Suppose the creator is all-powerful but not all-good – i.e., an “evil genius” of sorts. In that case, it seems we might be deceived about even the most evident of matters.

Notice that this foregoing understanding allows us to read the following two passages as referring to the very same sceptical scenario – namely, a worry about a deceiver who’s all-powerful, but not all-good:

And yet firmly rooted in my mind is the long-standing opinion that there is an omnipotent God who made me the kind of creature that I am. How do I know that he has not brought it about that there is no earth, no sky, no extended thing, no shape, no size, no place, while at the same time ensuring that all these things appear to me to exist just as they do now? What is more, since I sometimes believe that others go astray in cases where they think they have the most perfect knowledge, may I not similarly go wrong every time I add two and three or count the sides of a square, or in some even simpler matter, if that is imaginable? But perhaps God would not have allowed me to be deceived in this way, since he is said to be supremely good. But if it were inconsistent with his goodness to have created me such that I am deceived all the time, it would seem equally foreign to his goodness to allow me to be deceived even occasionally; yet this last assertion cannot be made. (AT 7:21, CSM 2:14)

I will suppose therefore that not God, who is supremely good and the source of truth, but rather some malicious demon [mauvais génie] of the utmost power and cunning has employed all his energies in order to deceive me. (AT 7:21, CSM 2:15)

Some commentators take these passages to introduce two separate deceivers – a deceiving God, on the one hand, and an evil genius (mauvais génie), on the other hand (cf. Gouhier 1937, 163). Yet this seems to introduce needless complication without sufficient textual justification. The deceptions of both deceivers are said to derive from having supreme power, while (unlike the true God) lacking in goodness. And note that Descartes expresses ambivalence as to whether even to refer to a deceiver as ‘God’: while invoking hyperbolic doubt, the Second Meditation references the deceiver as “a God, or whatever I may call him” (AT 7:24, CSM 2:16). In any case, a single deceiver hypothesis will hereafter be assumed, referring to it by its popular designation, the ‘Evil Genius Doubt’.

It is tempting to assume that the Evil Genius Doubt draws its sceptical force from the “utmost power” attributed to the deceiver. Clear texts suggest a different reading. Descartes contends that an equally powerful doubt derives from the supposition that we are not the creatures of an all-powerful creator. Recall that the above reductio reasoning implies simply that the creator cannot be both all-powerful and all-good. Suppose, then, that we give-up the assumption that the creator is all-powerful. The passage continues – while denying that the doubt is thereby weakened:

Perhaps there may be some who would prefer to deny the existence of so powerful a God rather than believe that everything else is uncertain. … yet since deception and error seem to be imperfections, the less powerful they make my original cause, the more likely it is that I am so imperfect as to be deceived all the time. (AT 7:21, CSM 2:14)

Descartes makes the same point in a parallel passage of the Principles:

[W]e have been told that there is an omnipotent God who created us. Now we do not know whether he may have wished to make us beings of the sort who are always deceived even in those matters which seem to us supremely evident … We may of course suppose that our existence derives not from a supremely powerful God but either from ourselves or from some other source; but in that case, the less powerful we make the author of our coming into being, the more likely it will be that we are so imperfect as to be deceived all the time. (Prin. 1:5, AT 8a:6, CSM 1:194)

Descartes’ official position is that the Evil Genius Doubt is merely one among multiple hypotheses that can motivate the more general hyperbolic doubt. (See Cunning 2014, 68ff, and Hatfield 2006, 126, for variations on this theme.) Fundamentally, the more general doubt is about our cognitive nature, that is, about the possibility that our minds are flawed. The First Meditation texts are somewhat ambiguous on this count. But later passages are very clear (a theme we’ll develop more fully in Section 4.3).

What is essential to the doubt is not the specific story about the origin of our cognitive wiring; it’s instead the realization – regardless the story – that for all we know, our cognitive wiring is flawed. Even so, I regularly speak in terms of the evil genius (following Descartes’ lead), as a kind of mnemonic for the more general doubt about our cognitive nature.

Having introduced the Evil Genius Doubt, the First Meditation program of demolition is not only hyperbolic but universal. As the meditator remarks, I “am finally compelled to admit that there is not one of my former beliefs about which a doubt may not properly be raised” (Med. 1, AT 7:21, CSM 2:14f). As will emerge, the early paragraphs of the Third Meditation clarify a further nuance of the Evil Genius Doubt – a nuance consistently observed thereafter. Descartes clarifies, there, that the Evil Genius Doubt operates in an indirect manner (a topic to which we return in Section 4.3).

(For examples of alternative interpretations of the Evil Genius Doubt, see Gewirth 1941 and Wilson 1978.)

4. The Cogito and Doubt

4.1 Cogito Ergo Sum

Famously, Descartes puts forward a very simple candidate as (what CSM translate as being) the “first item of knowledge [cognition]” (Med. 3, AT 7:35, CSM 2:24). The candidate is suggested by methodical doubt – by the very effort at thinking all my thoughts might be mistaken. Early in the Second Meditation, the meditator observes:

I have convinced myself that there is absolutely nothing in the world, no sky, no earth, no minds, no bodies. Does it now follow that I too do not exist? No: if I convinced myself of something then I certainly existed. But there is a deceiver of supreme power and cunning who is deliberately and constantly deceiving me. In that case I too undoubtedly exist, if he is deceiving me; and let him deceive me as much as he can, he will never bring it about that I am nothing so long as I think that I am something. So after considering everything very thoroughly, I must finally conclude that this proposition, I am, I exist, is necessarily true whenever it is put forward by me or conceived in my mind. (AT 7:25, CSM 2:16f)

As the canonical formulation has it, I think therefore I am (Latin: cogito ergo sum; French: je pense, donc je suis) – a formulation that does not expressly appear in the Meditations. Descartes regards the ‘cogito’ (as it is often referred to) as the “first and most certain of all to occur to anyone who philosophizes in an orderly way” (Prin. 1:7, AT8a:7, CSM 1:195).

Is the great certainty of the cogito supposed to attach to the “I think,” the “I am,” or the “therefore” (i.e., their logical relation)? Presumably, it must attach to all of these, if the cogito is to play the foundational role Descartes assigns to it. But this answer can seem to depend on whether the cogito is understood as an inference or an intuition – an issue we address below.

Testing the cogito by means of methodical doubt is supposed to reveal its unshakable certainty. Hyperbolic doubt helps me appreciate that the existence of my body is subject to doubt, whereas the existence of my thinking is not. The very attempt at thinking away my thinking is indeed self-stultifying.

The cogito raises numerous philosophical questions and has generated an enormous literature. The most significant ongoing debate concerns whether Descartes intends the cogito to be an intuition (i.e., roughly, self-evident), or instead an inference.

In an influential 1962 paper, Jaakko Hintikka’s argues that it should be understood non-inferentially, as a performative utterance. On his analysis, I exist doesn’t follow logically from I think, nor does Descartes suppose otherwise. Rather, the transition from I think to I exist is non-logical – indeed, the statement that “I do not exist” is not logically incoherent. The key point, according to Hintikka, is that the very act of thinking that statement – the cognitive performance – is existentially incoherent: I cannot both think the statement and believe it to be true. Hintikka takes the emphasis on “cogito” as intended “to express the performatory character of Descartes’s insight; it refers to the ‘performance’ (to the act of thinking) through which the sentence ‘I exist’ may be said to verify itself” (1962, 17).

The following Second Replies text can seem supportive of a non-inferential reading:

When someone says “I am thinking, therefore I am, or I exist,” he does not deduce existence from thought by means of a syllogism, but recognizes it as something self-evident by a simple intuition of the mind. (Replies 2, AT 7:140, CSM 2:100)

However, as Margaret Wilson correctly observes, “the claim that the cogito is an inference … is not equivalent to the claim that it is a syllogism” (1978, 56). The passage only expressly rejects the effort to understand the cogito in terms of syllogism, but not necessarily in terms of inference.

Further, it should be noted that inferential interpretations need not reject that the cogito counts also as an intuition. There’s no inconsistency in claiming a self-evident grasp of a proposition that has inferential structure. It is indeed widely held among philosophers that modus ponens is self-evident, yet it contains an inference. In short, that a statement contains an inference does not entail that one’s acceptance of it is grounded in inference – a fact applicable to the cogito. Edwin Curley helpfully notes that Descartes “consistently blurs the distinction between inferences and propositions by referring to the whole formula ‘I think, therefore I am’ as a truth, a first principle, a proposition, and a conclusion” (1978, 79). Anthony Kenny adds that, for Descartes, “what is from one point of view intuited is from another point of view deduced” (1968, 55), citing Rules 3 as support.

A related point concerns the absence of an express ‘ergo’ (‘therefore’) in the Second Meditation account – as if thereby indicating the absence of inference in that passage. However, the Second Meditation passage is arguably the one place (of his various published treatments) where Descartes explicitly details a line of inferential reflection leading up to the conclusion that I am, I exist. His other treatments merely say the ‘therefore’; the Second Meditation unpacks it.

Whatever the cogito’s inferential status, it is worth noting a twofold observation of Barry Stroud: “a thinker obviously could never be wrong in thinking ‘I think’,” moreover, “no one who thinks could think falsely that he exists” (2008, 518).

Further issues about the cogito are worth clarifying – let’s cover a few points in summary fashion. First, a first-person formulation is essential to the certainty of the cogito. Third-person claims, such as “Icarus thinks,” or “Descartes thinks,” are not unshakably certain – not for me, at any rate; only the occurrence of my thought has a chance of resisting hyperbolic doubt. There are a number of passages in which Descartes refers to a third-person version of the cogito. But none of these occurs in the context of establishing the actual existence of a particular thinker (in contrast with affirming the conditional, general result that whatever thinks exists).

Second, a present tense formulation is essential to the certainty of the cogito. It’s no good to reason that “I existed last Tuesday, since I recall that I was thinking on that day.” For all I know, I’m now merely dreaming about that occasion. Nor does it work to reason that “I’ll continue to exist, since I’m now thinking.” As the meditator remarks, “it could be that were I totally to cease from thinking, I should totally cease to exist” (Med. 2, AT 7:27, CSM 2:18). The privileged certainty of the cogito is grounded in the “manifest contradiction” (AT 7:36, CSM 2:25) of trying to think away my present thinking.

Third, the certainty of the cogito depends on being formulated in terms of cogitatio – i.e., my thinking, or awareness/consciousness more generally. Any mode of thinking is sufficient, including doubting, affirming, denying, willing, understanding, imagining, and so on (cf. Med. 2, AT 7:28). My bodily activities, however, are insufficient. For instance, it’s no good to reason that “I exist, since I am walking,” because methodical doubt calls into question the existence of my legs. Maybe I’m just dreaming that I have legs. A simple revision, such as “I exist, since it seems I’m walking,” restores the anti-sceptical potency (cf. Replies 5, AT 7:352; Prin. 1:9).

Fourth, a caveat is in order. That Descartes rejects formulations presupposing the existence of a body commits him to no more than an epistemic distinction between the ideas of mind and body, but not (yet) an ontological distinction (as in mind-body dualism). Indeed, in the passage following the cogito, Descartes has his meditator say:

And yet may it not perhaps be the case that these very things which I am supposing to be nothing [e.g., “that structure of limbs which is called a human body”], because they are unknown to me, are in reality identical with the “I” of which I am aware? I do not know, and for the moment I shall not argue the point, since I can make judgements only about things which are known to me. (Med. 2, AT 7:27, CSM 2:18)

In short, the intended epistemic success of the cogito does not presuppose any particular mind-body ontology.

Finally, Descartes’ reference to an “I”, in the “I think,” is not intended to presuppose the existence of a substantial self. In the very next sentence following the initial statement of the cogito, the meditator says: “But I do not yet have a sufficient understanding of what this ‘I’ is, that now necessarily exists” (AT 7:25, CSM 2:17). As Stephen Menn writes:

Although the Meditator now knows that he is, he does not seem to know what he is: his old conception of his nature has been called into doubt, and he does not seem to have anything new to replace it. (1998, 249)

The cogito purports to yield certainty that I exist insofar as I am a thinking thing, whatever that turns out to be. The ensuing discussion is intended to help arrive at an understanding of the ontological nature of the thinking subject.

More generally, we should distinguish issues of epistemic and ontological dependence. In the final analysis, Descartes thinks he shows that the occurrence of thought depends (ontologically) on the existence of a substantial self – to wit, on the existence of an infinite substance, namely God (cf. Med. 3, AT 7:48ff). But he denies that an acceptance of these ontological matters is epistemically prior to the cogito: its certainty is not supposed to depend (epistemically) on the abstruse metaphysics that Descartes thinks he eventually establishes. (See Vinci 1998 for an alternative reading.)

If the cogito does not presuppose a substantial self, what then is the epistemic basis for injecting the ‘I’ into the “I think”? Some critics have complained that, in referring to the “I”, Descartes begs the question by presupposing what he means to establish in the “I exist.” Among the critics, Bertrand Russell objects that “the word ‘I’ is really illegitimate.” Echoing the 18th century thinker, Georg Lichtenberg, Russell writes that Descartes should have, instead, stated “his ultimate premiss in the form ‘there are thoughts’.” Russell adds that “the word ‘I’ is grammatically convenient, but does not describe a datum” (1945, 567). Accordingly, “there is pain” and “I am in pain” have different contents, and Descartes is entitled only to the former.

One effort at reply has it that introspection reveals more than what Russell allows – it reveals the subjective character of experience. On this view, there is more to the experiential story of being in pain than is expressed by saying that there is pain: the experience includes the feeling of pain plus a point-of-view – an experiential addition that’s difficult to characterize except by adding that “I” am in pain, that the pain is mine. Importantly, my awareness of this subjective feature of experience does not depend on an awareness of the metaphysical nature of a thinking subject. If we take Descartes to be using ‘I’ to signify this subjective character, then he is not smuggling in something that’s not already there: the “I”-ness of consciousness turns out to be (contra Russell) a primary datum of experience. And though, as Hume persuasively argues, introspection reveals no sense impressions suited to the role of a thinking subject, Descartes, unlike Hume, has no need to derive all our ideas from sense impressions. Descartes’ idea of the self does ultimately draw on innate conceptual resources.

Setting aside the philosophical concerns associated with the cogito, let’s turn to a further interpretive concern: namely, the issue of whether, at its initial introduction (in the Second Meditation), Descartes intends that the cogito counts as perfect knowledge.

4.2 Does the Cogito count as (Atheist-Available) Perfect Knowledge?

The extraordinary certainty and doubt-resistance of the cogito marks an Archimedean turning point in the meditator’s inquiry. However, there are interpretive disputes about whether Descartes intends the cogito to count – at its initial introduction, prior to the arguments for God – as fully indubitable, and therefore as perfect knowledge. It is quite common to interpret the cogito as being the first item of perfect knowledge. In Section 6.1 we’ll explore how such interpretations (i.e., Bounded Doubt Interpretations) render Descartes’ broader argument. But here, I want to develop the textual case for holding that even the cogito is undermined by Evil Genius Doubt.

There is no disputing that Descartes characterizes the cogito as the “first item of knowledge [cognitione]” (Med. 3, AT 7:35, CSM 2:24), and as the first “piece of knowledge [cognitio]” (Prin. 1:7, AT 8a:7, CSM 1:195). Noteworthy, however, is the Latin terminology Descartes uses in these characterizations (‘cognitio’ and its cognates). As noted at the outset, Descartes is a contextualist in the sense of invoking the notion of knowledge in divergent contexts that presuppose very different epistemic standards. Of particular interest is that he expressly clarifies that contexts aptly characterized in terms of cognitio-talk do not necessarily count as perfect knowledge:

The fact that an atheist can be “clearly aware [clare cognoscere] that the three angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles” is something I do not dispute. But I maintain that this awareness [cognitionem] of his is not true knowledge [scientiam], since no act of awareness [cognitio] that can be rendered doubtful seems fit to be called knowledge [scientia]. Now since we are supposing that this individual is an atheist, he cannot be certain that he is not being deceived on matters which seem to him to be very evident (as I fully explained). (Replies 2, AT 7:141, CSM 2:101)

This alone does not prove that the cogito is not intended to count as perfect knowledge (at its initial occurrence, in the Second Meditation). However, it does undercut the argument whereby calling it the “first item of knowledge” shows that Descartes intends it as perfect knowledge.

More generally, a wide range of clear texts support (what I’ll call) the No Atheistic Perfect Knowledge Thesis – a thesis with implications for the debate about the cogito. Consider the following texts, each arising in a context of clarifying the requirements of perfect knowledge (italics are added):

For if I do not know this [i.e., “whether there is a God, and, if there is, whether he can be a deceiver”], it seems that I can never be quite certain about anything else. (Med. 3, AT 7:36, CSM 2:25)

I see that the certainty of all other things depends on this [i.e., “that the supreme being exists”], so that without it nothing can ever be perfectly known [perfecte sciri]. (Med. 5, AT 7:69, CSM 2:48)

[I]f I were unaware of God … I should thus never have true and certain knowledge [scientiam] about anything, but only shifting and changeable opinions. (Med. 5, AT 7:69, CSM 2:48)

Thus I see plainly that the certainty and truth of all knowledge [scientiae] depends uniquely on my awareness of the true God, to such an extent that I was incapable of perfect knowledge [perfecte scire] about anything else until I became aware of him. (Med. 5, AT 7:71, CSM 2:49)

These texts make a powerful case that nothing else can be perfectly known prior to establishing that we’re created by an all-perfect God, rather than an evil genius. Indeed, Descartes’ express wording seems intended to rule-out any exceptions. The first text is particularly noteworthy, because it comes at the end of a paragraph which includes reference to the cogito. As Curley writes:

Notice that Descartes does not say: until I know whether God exists and can be a deceiver I cannot be certain of anything except the existence of the self and its thoughts. He says he cannot be certain of anything. (2006, 40)

Descartes looks to hold that hyperbolic doubt is utterly unbounded – i.e., that it undermines all manner of propositions, including thereby the proposition that “I exist.”

We can indeed read the opening paragraphs of the Third Meditation as intended to clarify not that the cogito is perfectly known, but instead the following twofold point: First, that what underwrites the cogito’s epistemic impressiveness is clarity and distinctness. Second, that even cognitions this impressive can be undermined by Evil Genius Doubt, and thus lack the full indubitability of perfect knowledge.

Regarding the first point, the Third Meditation opens with meditator attempting to build on the apparent success of the cogito. What are the internal marks of this impressive perception – what is it like to have perception that good? The answer:

I am certain that I am a thinking thing. Do I not therefore also know what is required for my being certain about anything? In this first item of knowledge [cognitione] there is simply a clear and distinct perception of what I am asserting. (AT 7:35, CSM 2:24)

The next two paragraphs help clarify (among other things) what Descartes takes to be epistemically impressive about clear and distinct perception, in contrast with external sense perception. Of external sensation, the third paragraph offers this:

Yet I previously accepted as wholly certain and evident many things which I afterwards realized were doubtful. What were these? The earth, sky, stars, and everything else that I apprehended with the senses. But what was it about them that I perceived clearly? Just that the ideas, or thoughts, of such things appeared before my mind. Yet even now I am not denying that these ideas occur within me. … Here was my mistake; or at any rate, if my judgement was true, it was not thanks to the strength of my perception. (AT 7:35, CSM 2:24f)

Though we regularly form judgments based on external sensation, they are easily undermined by sceptical doubt, as shown by the Now Dreaming Doubt. By contrast, our clear and distinct perceptions enjoy a perceptual “strength” enabling us to ward off even the Evil Genius Doubt (at least, so it might seem). The fourth paragraph offers this:

But what about when I was considering something very simple and straightforward in arithmetic or geometry, for example that two and three added together make five, and so on? Did I not see at least these things clearly enough to affirm their truth? … when I turn to the things themselves which I think I perceive very clearly, I am so convinced by them that I spontaneously declare: let whoever can do so deceive me, he will never bring it about that I am nothing, so long as I continue to think I am something … or bring it about that two and three added together are more or less than five, or anything of this kind in which I see a manifest contradiction. (AT 7:36, CSM 2:25)

Prima facie, this excerpt suggests that multiple propositions are – at this pre-theistic stage of the broader argument – fully indubitable, thereby counting as perfect knowledge. But there is more to the paragraph; which brings us to the second point noted above, namely, that even cognitions this impressive can be undermined by Evil Genius Doubt – an outcome clarified in the final lines of this same paragraph:

For if I do not know this [i.e., “whether there is a God, and, if there is, whether he can be a deceiver”], it seems that I can never be quite certain about anything else.

In order to appreciate the subtleties of this pivotal fourth paragraph of the Third Meditation, we need to clarify the indirect manner in which Evil Genius Doubt operates on clear and distinct perception.

4.3 How Indirectly to Doubt Clear and Distinct Perception

How could a doubt undermine the cogito? Part of its impressiveness is that I cannot think about my existence without affirming it, yet I cannot doubt my existence without thinking about it. In short, I simply cannot doubt the proposition “I exist” – or so it appears.

Seeming to reinforce further the suspicion that the cogito cannot be doubted is a more general thesis Descartes holds concerning the doubt-resistance of any matters that are clearly and distinctly perceived:

[T]he nature of my mind is such that I cannot but assent to these things, at least so long as I clearly perceive them. (Med. 5, AT 7:65, CSM 2:45)

[M]y nature is such that so long as I perceive something very clearly and distinctly I cannot but believe it to be true. (Med. 5, AT 7:69, CSM 2:48)

How, then, is it possible to doubt such matters? According to one interpretation, the answer is that we cannot doubt them directly, however, we can doubt them in an indirect manner. That is, rather than directing the doubt at particular such propositions, as that I exist, or that 2+3=5, the doubt is instead directed at the cognitive faculties by which we apprehend such propositions. By way of analogy, consider that if a calculator were defective, it would cast doubt on any calculations it generated. Likewise, if my own mind were in some sense defective, this would cast doubt on any matters I apprehended – no matter how evident those matters might seem. By directing the doubt at the veracity of my own cognitive faculties, I do thereby indirectly doubt the particular propositions apprehended by means of those faculties.

A wealth of texts support that this is how the Evil Genius Doubt is intended to operate. Consider these (italics are added):

[Perhaps some God could have given me a nature such that I was deceived even in matters which seemed most evident. (Med. 3, AT 7:36, CSM 2:25)

I can convince myself that I have a natural disposition to go wrong from time to time in matters which I think I perceive as evidently as can be. (Med. 5, AT 7:70, CSM 2:48)

I saw nothing to rule out the possibility that my natural constitution made me prone to error even in matters which seemed to me most true. (Med. 6, AT 7:77, CSM 2:53)

[T]he most serious doubt [arises] from our ignorance about whether our nature might not be such as to make us go wrong even in matters which seemed to us utterly evident. (Prin. 1:30; AT 8a:16, CSM 1:203)

As each passage conveys, the doubt is directed not at the particular object level propositions undermined, but at the possibility of our having a defective cognitive nature. (In this vein, Carriero helpfully refers to the doubt under the heading, ‘imperfect-nature doubt’ [2009, 27], rather than Evil Genius Doubt; Newman and Nelson refer to it as ‘meta-cognitive doubt’ [1999, 374].) As each passage also conveys, the doubt effectively undermines even the “most evident” of matters. Because the doubt is indirect, it’s blind to the particular propositions it undercuts. The relevant question does arguably shift from, “How could a doubt undermine the cogito?”, to “How could this doubt fail to undermine even the cogito?” Indeed, the first of the above passages expressly includes the cogito with the list of example propositions being indirectly called into doubt – this, in the pivotal fourth paragraph of the Third Meditation:

But what about when I was considering something very simple and straightforward in arithmetic or geometry, for example that two and three added together make five, and so on? Did I not see at least these things clearly enough to affirm their truth? Indeed, the only reason for my later judgement that they were open to doubt was that it occurred to me that perhaps some God could have given me a nature such that I was deceived even in matters which seemed most evident. And whenever my preconceived belief in the supreme power of God comes to mind, I cannot but admit that it would be easy for him, if he so desired, to bring it about that I go wrong even in those matters which I think I see utterly clearly with my mind’s eye. Yet when I turn to the things themselves which I think I perceive very clearly, I am so convinced by them that I spontaneously declare: let whoever can do so deceive me, he will never bring it about that I am nothing, so long as I continue to think I am something; or make it true at some future time that I have never existed, since it is now true that I exist; or bring it about that two and three added together are more or less than five, or anything of this kind in which I see a manifest contradiction. (AT 7:35f, CSM 2:25; italics added)

The suggestion is of an epistemic schizophrenia, of sorts, depending on whether one’s attention is directed at the object level propositions, or instead at the possibility of our having defective cognitive faculties:

Moments of epistemic optimism: While I am directly attending to a proposition, perceiving it clearly and distinctly, I enjoy an irresistible cognitive luminance and my assent is compelled.

Moments of epistemic pessimism: When no longer directly attending – no longer perceiving the proposition clearly and distinctly – I can entertain the sceptical hypothesis that such feelings of cognitive luminance are epistemically worthless, indeed arising from a defective cognitive nature.

Granted, this indirect doubt is exceedingly hyperbolic. Even so, it entails that we lack the full indubitability requisite to perfect knowledge. Descartes thus closes the pivotal fourth paragraph, clarifying that because of the Evil Genius Doubt, nothing (yet) meets the epistemic standard of perfect knowledge:

And since I have no cause to think that there is a deceiving God, and I do not yet even know for sure whether there is a God at all, any reason for doubt which depends simply on this supposition is a very slight and, so to speak, metaphysical one. But in order to remove even this slight reason for doubt, as soon as the opportunity arises I must examine whether there is a God, and, if there is, whether he can be a deceiver. For if I do not know this, it seems that I can never be quite certain about anything else. (AT 7:36, CSM 2:25)

A later Third Meditation passage – but one occurring prior to the arguments for God – can be taken to suggest a very different interpretation. On this alternative account, some of the matters we clearly and distinctly perceive are fully indubitable, thereby counting as perfect knowledge even prior to knowledge of God. The passage has Descartes drawing a distinction between what is revealed by the natural light, and what is taught by nature:

When I say “Nature taught me to think this,” all I mean is that a spontaneous impulse leads me to believe it, not that its truth has been revealed to me by some natural light. There is a big difference here. Whatever is revealed to me by the natural light – for example that from the fact that I am doubting it follows that I exist, and so on – cannot in any way be open to doubt. This is because there cannot be another faculty both as trustworthy as the natural light and also capable of showing me that such things are not true. But as for my natural impulses, I have often judged in the past that they were pushing me in the wrong direction when it was a question of choosing the good, and I do not see why I should place any greater confidence in them in other matters. (AT 7:38f, CSM 2:26f)

The passage makes clear that the cogito is revealed by the natural light; and on one plausible reading, it conveys that the cogito is utterly immune to doubt – i.e., it “cannot in any way be open to doubt.” On this understanding, the scope of Evil Genius Doubt is bounded, in the sense that not all propositions are vulnerable to the doubt. This is to say that some propositions, including the cogito, may be fully indubitable, thus satisfying the requirements of perfect knowledge – even for atheists.

Defenders of an unbounded doubt interpretation would offer a different analysis of the passage. First, we saw that Descartes earlier claimed that what grounds the extraordinary certainty of the cogito is that “there is simply a clear and distinct perception.” Yet, that earlier claim is surprising, if the point of the above passage is that the natural light is epistemically superior to mere garden variety clarity and distinctness. A remark Descartes makes to Hobbes is relevant: “As everyone knows, a ‘light in the intellect’ means transparent clarity of cognition” (Replies 3, AT 7:192, CSM 2:135). This suggests that “natural light” references are simply another way of talking about clear and distinct perception. On this point, Carriero notes: “I do not see an important distinction for Descartes between something’s being revealed to me by the light of nature and my perceiving clearly that thing’s being the case” (2008, 305). Note further that a bounded doubt interpretation of this passage is at odds with the numerous other passages we’ve examined indicating that even the cogito is vulnerable to the Evil Genius Doubt.

How, then, do unbounded doubt interpreters deal with this passage? In context, the point of the natural light passage is not to draw a distinction between two grades of clear and distinct perception; it’s instead to clarify the distinction between the kind of probabilistic reasoning the meditator had invoked in prior remarks, and the irresistible evidentness accompanying our very best cognitions, such as the cogito. We can indeed take the point of the passage to apply to moments of careful attention: even while directly attending to the probabilistic matters (taught by nature), we recognize that there are grounds for doubt; whereas, when directly attending to our epistemically best cognitions (revealed by the natural light), we simply cannot doubt them. This reading renders the passage continuous with our reading of the other passages. Again, in the pivotal fourth paragraph of the Third Meditation: “when I turn to the things themselves which I think I perceive very clearly, I am so convinced by them that I spontaneously declare: let whoever can do so deceive me, he will never bring it about that I am nothing, so long as I continue to think I am something”; i.e., while directly attending to them, the matters revealed by the natural light “cannot in any way be open to doubt.” And yet, upon diverting attention, they fall prey to the Evil Genius Doubt.

(For further discussion of the cogito, see Beyssade 1993, Broughton 2002, Carriero 2009, Cunning 2007, Curley 1978, Frankfurt 1966, Hintikka 1962, Kenny 1968, Markie 1992, Peacocke 2012, Sarkar 2003, Stroud 2008, Vendler 1984, Vinci 1998, Williams 1978, and Wilson 1978.)

5. C&D Rule and the Road to Perfect Knowledge

5.1 Clarity and Distinctness as a Provisional Truth Rule

Recall that Descartes characterizes the cogito as an Archimedean point, of sorts, in his constructive efforts at finding something “certain and unshakeable.” It is clear how the cogito serves this role on bounded doubt interpretations, since they render it as being fully immune to the Evil Genius Doubt – indeed, as providing the initial item of perfect knowledge. But what about unbounded doubt interpretations: in rendering the cogito as being subject to Evil Genius Doubt, how do they explain its Archimedean role in the broader project? One answer is that insofar as the cogito is the first cognition noticed to resist any efforts at a direct doubt, it can be said to play an Archimedean role. For it exemplifies the kind of cognitions the meditator thereafter employs, in all subsequent constructive efforts to overcome the sceptical problem.

Descartes indeed uses the cogito to clarify the epistemically privileged status of clear and distinct perception, even formulating clarity and distinctness as underwriting a general rule for discovering truth. The passage occurs in the second paragraph of the Third Meditation:

In this first item of knowledge there is simply a clear and distinct perception of what I am asserting; this would not be enough to make me certain of the truth of the matter if it could ever turn out that something which I perceived with such clarity and distinctness was false. So I now seem [videor] to be able to lay it down as a general rule that whatever I perceive very clearly and distinctly is true. (AT 7:35, CSM 2:24)

I shall refer to this general rule the ‘C&D Rule’. Though interpretations differ, the context of the passage indicates the rule is treated as provisional – i.e., further work will be needed before the rule can be regarded as finally established. On two counts, the announcement of the rule is carefully tinged with caution, in anticipation of the revelation to come (two paragraphs later) that even clearly and distinctly perceived matters are vulnerable to the Evil Genius Doubt. First, the passage notes that being clearly and distinctly perceived “would not be enough to make me certain of the truth of the matter,” if the truth of such matters could be undermined. Second, the announcement includes an important qualification, in saying that it does “now seem” (videor) that this is a justified rule. Because it soon emerges that the Evil Genius Doubt undermines the veracity of the C&D Rule, Descartes assumes the burden of trying to establish the rule – a proof he takes to occur not in this early Third Meditation passage, but only later, after having argued for an all-perfect God: Descartes writes that it is “in the Fourth Meditation [that] it is proved that everything that we clearly and distinctly perceive is true” (Synopsis, AT 7:15, CSM 2:11). (Section 5.3 discusses Descartes’ Fourth Meditation argument for the C&D Rule.)

5.2 Strategy for Constructive Proofs Moving Forward

If even clear and distinct perception is subject to doubt, how is the meditator to make progress? How can he construct arguments in the effort to solve the sceptical problem? This brings into focus the issue of whether Descartes’ procedure is viciously circular. For it seems that in the very process of arguing for a truth rule, he is already employing that very rule. For now, we’ll set to the side the issue of circularity (returning to it in Section 6).

In his strategy for making constructive arguments, Descartes builds on the fact that clearly and distinctly perceived matters appear to us to be utterly conclusive, i.e., while our perception is clear and distinct. So, by employing none other than premises and reasoning that are clearly and distinctly perceived, we can – in some sense – make rational progress, notwithstanding that those very same proofs fall vulnerable to indirect doubt, once our attention is no longer clear and distinct. The following Fifth Meditation passage illustrates the point:

Admittedly my nature is such that so long as I perceive something very clearly and distinctly I cannot but believe it to be true. But my nature is also such that I cannot fix my mental vision continually on the same thing, so as to keep perceiving it clearly; and often the memory of a previously made judgement may come back, when I am no longer attending to the arguments which led me to make it. And so other arguments can now occur to me which might easily undermine my opinion, if I were unaware of [the true] God; and I should thus never have true and certain knowledge about anything, but only shifting and changeable opinions. For example, when I consider the nature of a triangle, it appears most evident to me, steeped as I am in the principles of geometry, that its three angles are equal to two right angles; and so long as I attend to the proof, I cannot but believe this to be true. But as soon as I turn my mind’s eye away from the proof, then in spite of still remembering that I perceived it very clearly, I can easily fall into doubt about its truth, if I am unaware of God. For I can convince myself that I have a natural disposition to go wrong from time to time in matters which I think I perceive as evidently as can be. (Med. 5, AT 7:69f, CSM 2:48; cf. AT 3:64f; AT 8a:9f).

Of course, Descartes will need some sort of final solution to the problem of ongoing indirect doubt. In the meantime, he has his meditator attempting to move forward, by constructing clearly and distinctly perceived anti-sceptical arguments.

The broader argumentative strategy is revealed at the end of the pivotal fourth paragraph of the Third Meditation: “in order to remove even this slight reason for doubt, as soon as the opportunity arises I must examine whether there is a God, and, if there is, whether he can be a deceiver.” So, in the effort to establish the C&D Rule, the meditator makes arguments to the conclusion that his creator is not an evil genius, but an all-perfect creator who would not allow him to be deceived about what he clearly and distinctly perceives.

The broader argument encompasses two main steps. The first main step involves Third Meditation arguments for the existence of an all-perfect God. From these arguments the meditator concludes:

I recognize that it would be impossible for me to exist with the kind of nature I have – that is, having within me the idea of God – were it not the case that God really existed. By ‘God’ I mean the very being the idea of whom is within me, that is, the possessor of all the perfections which I cannot grasp, but can somehow reach in my thought, who is subject to no defects whatsoever. It is clear enough from this that he cannot be a deceiver, since it is manifest by the natural light that all fraud and deception depend on some defect. (Med. 3, AT 7:51f, CSM 2:35)

There is much of interest in Descartes’ Third Meditation arguments for an all-perfect creator God. (Note that the Fifth Meditation advances a further argument for God.) In the interests of space, and of focusing on epistemological concerns, however, these arguments will not be considered here. (For an overview of Descartes’ proofs, see Nolan 2014 and Nolan & Nelson 2006.)

The second main step involves an argument from the premise (now established) that an all-perfect God exists, to the general veracity of the C&D Rule – whereby, whatever is clearly and distinctly perceived is guaranteed to be true. It is this second main step of the broader argument to which we now turn. (As will emerge, a yet further, third step is required on some interpretations.)

5.3 Fourth Meditation Proof of the C&D Rule

It might seem that a separate argument for the C&D Rule is unneeded – that having demonstrated a non-deceiving God, the veracity of the rule is a straightforward consequence. But this is too fast. Why should only the C&D Rule be a straightforward consequence, but not also a more general infallibility of all our judgments? Essentially this point is made in the First Meditation, at the introduction of the Evil Genius Doubt. As we saw, the meditator there observes that what seems to follow from the standard view – whereby God “is said to be supremely good,” rather than a deceiver – is that God would not allow us ever to be mistaken in our judgments:

But if it were inconsistent with his goodness to have created me such that I am deceived all the time, it would seem equally foreign to his goodness to allow me to be deceived even occasionally; yet this last assertion cannot be made. (Med. 1, AT 7:21, CSM 2:14)

In short, the most straightforward consequence of an all-perfect creator would seem to be the universal rule: If I form a judgment, then it is true. Yet quite clearly, this rule doesn’t hold. What emerges is an instance of the problem of evil, here applied to judgment error. As the passage reasons:

  1. Judgment error occurs.
  2. That judgment error occurs is incompatible with the hypothesis that I am the creation of an all-perfect God.
  3. Therefore, I am not the creation of an all-perfect God.

These First Meditation remarks set the stage for the discussion that comes in the Fourth Meditation. Descartes needs a theodicy for error – theodicy being an effort to explain how an all-perfect God is compatible with evil. The theodicy needs to show that the existence of such a God is compatible with some forms of judgment error, but not others; somehow, God allows error in our sensory judgments, while guaranteeing the inerrancy of judgments based on clear and distinct perception. In contrast with the First Meditation setting, the context of the Fourth Meditation comes on the heels of a demonstration of the existence of an all-perfect God. The argument of the Fourth Meditation thus begins by reviewing the problem where the First Meditation left it, but in the light of the meditator’s newfound conclusion – “to begin with, I recognize that it is impossible that God should ever deceive me.” The passage continues:

Next, I know by experience that there is in me a faculty of judgement which, like everything else which is in me, I certainly received from God. And since God does not wish to deceive me, he surely did not give me the kind of faculty which would ever enable me to go wrong while using it correctly.

There would be no further doubt on this issue were it not that what I have just said appears to imply that I am incapable of ever going wrong. For if everything that is in me comes from God, and he did not endow me with a faculty for making mistakes, it appears that I can never go wrong. (Med. 4, AT 7:53f, CSM 2:37f)

Seeking to resolve the problem, the meditator investigates the causes of error. In the course of the discussion, Descartes puts forward his theory whereby judgment arises from the cooperation of the intellect and the will: the role of the intellect is to consider a perceptual content – i.e., something seeming to be the case, thereby functioning as a possible judgment; the role of the will is to give assent (or dissent), or withhold assent, to the perceptual content under consideration.

The investigation concludes that the blameworthy cause of error lies in our improper use of our free will. Neither the intellect nor the will is inherently defective (though each is, of course, finite), nor is there inherent defect in the design of how they cooperate – i.e., their design does not render error inevitable. The design does make for the possibility of error, in that “the scope of the will is wider than that of the intellect”: my will is able to assent to further matters than just those that I clearly and distinctly understand; “but instead of restricting it within the same limits, I extend its use to matters which I do not understand” (AT 7:58, CSM 2:40). In short, actual mistakes of judgment arise from user error:

[If] I simply refrain from making a judgement in cases where I do not perceive the truth with sufficient clarity and distinctness, then it is clear that I am behaving correctly and avoiding error. But if in such cases I either affirm or deny, then I am not using my free will correctly. (Med. 4, AT 7:59, CSM 2:41)

The theodicy that emerges is a version of the free will defense. Accordingly, we should thank God for giving us free will, but the cost of having free will is the possibility of misusing it. Since error is the result of misusing our free will, we should not blame God.

Not only is the theodicy used to explain the kinds of error God can allow, it serves to clarify the kinds of error God cannot allow. From the latter arises a proof of the C&D Rule. God can allow errors that are our fault, but not errors that would be God’s fault. On occasions when my perception is clear and distinct, my assent is involuntary and thus not a result of a misuse of my free will. In such cases, assent is a necessary consequence of my cognitive nature – a point made in many passages, as we’ve seen: “our mind is of such a nature that it cannot help assenting to what it clearly understands” (AT 3:64, CSMK 147). Since, on occasions of clarity and distinctness, my assent is the unavoidable consequence of my God-given cognitive nature, God would properly get the blame if those judgments resulted in error. Therefore, they are not in error; indeed they could not be. That an evil genius might have created me casts doubt on my clear and distinct judgments. That, instead, an all-perfect God created me guarantees that these judgments are true. A clever strategy of argument thus unfolds – effectively inverting the usual reasoning in the problem of evil:

  1. I am the creation of an all-perfect God.
  2. That I am the creation of an all-perfect God is incompatible with the sceptical hypothesis that I am in error about what I clearly and distinctly perceive.
  3. Therefore, I am not in error about what I clearly and distinctly perceive.

The first premise is argued in the Third Meditation. The second premise arises from the discussion of the Fourth Meditation. The result is a divine guarantee of the C&D Rule. Whatever I perceive clearly and distinctly is guaranteed true, because I am the creature of an all-perfect God.

It might seem that, by the end of the Fourth Meditation, Descartes’ broader case to overcome radical doubt is complete. At that stage, the meditator is in position to reproduce a demonstration – each step of which he clearly and distinctly perceives – which supports the grand conclusion that he’s the creation of an all-perfect God who would not allow him to be mistaken about whatever he perceives clearly and distinctly. However, there are significant issues that must be addressed. Among the philosophical concerns is that the demonstration itself looks suspiciously circular – the so-called Cartesian Circle. A further issue arises in connection with the interpretation we have been developing: for when the meditator is no longer clearly and distinctly perceiving the steps of the demonstration, the grand conclusion can then be undermined by means of the Evil Genius Doubt; i.e., it would seem that perfect knowledge is not yet within the meditator’s grasp. Perhaps related is that at the close of the Fourth Meditation one finds no announcement of victory over the Evil Genius Doubt; instead, the announcement comes at the end of the Fifth Meditation. But why? It is to such issues that we now turn.

6. Perfect Knowledge, Circularity, and Truth

6.1 The Cartesian Circle

Students of philosophy can expect to be taught a longstanding interpretation according to which Descartes’ broader argument is viciously circular. He first argues from clearly and distinctly perceived premises to the conclusion that an all-perfect God exists; he then argues from the premise that an all-perfect God exists to the conclusion that whatever is clearly and distinctly perceived is true. The worry is that he presupposes the C&D Rule in the effort to prove the C&D Rule. Despite its prima facie plausibility, Descartes scholarship generally resists the vicious circularity interpretation, based on numerous textual considerations. But even putting those texts to the side, it should be surprising that the project would be viciously circular. As Thomas Lennon notes:

[I]t would be nothing less than astonishing if the central argument of the central text of the central figure of the central period in the history of philosophy were obviously circular. How could the father of modern philosophy, the source of the epistemological turn, have produced such an obviously loopy argument? (2008, 158)

Consider first what every plausible interpretation must concede: that the two main steps of the broader argument unfold in a manner suggestive of a circle – let us indeed refer to them as ‘arcs’. The Third Meditation arguments for God define one arc:

Arc 1: The conclusion that an all-perfect God exists is derived from premises that are clearly and distinctly perceived.

The Fourth Meditation argument defines a second arc:

Arc 2: The general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived (i.e., the C&D Rule) is derived from the conclusion that an all-perfect God exists.

That the broader argument unfolds in accord with these two steps is uncontroversial. The question of interest concerns whether, strictly speaking, these arcs form an epistemic circle. The statement of Arc 1 admits of some ambiguity. How one resolves this ambiguity determines whether the arcs strictly form a circle. Let’s begin by clarifying what Arc 1 would have to mean to generate vicious circularity. We’ll then consider the main alternative interpretations of that arc by which commentators seek to avoid circularity.

Vicious Circularity interpretation:

Arc 1: The conclusion that an all-perfect God exists is derived from premises that are clearly and distinctly perceived – i.e., premises that are accepted only because of having first accepted the general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived.

Arc 2: The general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived is derived from the conclusion that an all-perfect God exists.

Thus rendered, Descartes’ broader argument is viciously circular. The italicized segment of Arc 1 marks an addition to the original statement of it, thereby clarifying the circularity reading. Interpreted in this way, Descartes begins his Third Meditation proofs of God by presupposing the general veracity of clear and distinct perception. That is, he starts by assuming the C&D Rule and then uses the rule in the course of demonstrating it. Evidently, this way of reading Descartes’ argument has pedagogical appeal, for it is widely taught (outside of Descartes scholarship) despite the absence of serious textual merit. If there is one point of general agreement in the scholarly literature, it is that the texts do not sustain this interpretation.

How then should Arc 1 be understood? There are multiple interpretations that avoid vicious circularity, along with numerous schemes for cataloguing them. For present purposes, we’ll catalogue the various accounts according to two main kinds of non-circular strategies that commentators attribute to Descartes. (The secondary literature offers multiple variations on each of these main kinds of interpretations, though the variations won’t here be explored. For further alternative schemes for cataloguing interpretations, see Hatfield 2006 and Newman & Nelson 1999. For an anthology devoted largely to the Cartesian Circle, see Doney 1987.)

Bounded Doubt interpretations:

Arc 1: The conclusion that an all-perfect God exists is derived from premises that are clearly and distinctly perceived – indeed, premises belonging to a special class of truths that are fully immune to doubt prior to establishing the general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived.

Arc 2: The general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived is derived from the conclusion that an all-perfect God exists.

Again, the italicized segment marks an addition to the original statement of Arc 1. Call this a ‘Bounded Doubt’ interpretation, because this kind of interpretation construes hyperbolic doubt as bounded. More precisely, the Evil Genius Doubt is (on this reading) bounded in the sense that its sceptical potency does not extend to all judgments: a special class of truths is outside the bounds of doubt. Exemplary of this special class are the cogito and, importantly, the premises of the Third Meditation proofs of God. Propositions in this special class can be perfectly known, even by atheists.

On this interpretation, there is no vicious circularity in the broader argument, because the truths serving as premises in the arguments for the C&D Rule are perfectly knowable independently of that rule. That is, throughout the arguments of Arcs 1 and 2, the premises employed count as perfectly knowledge prior to the knowledge of the C&D Rule they help establish.

Proponents of this interpretation are apt to cite the Third Meditation passage distinguishing what’s revealed by the natural light, and what’s taught by nature (see Section 4.3). In order to extend perfect knowledge beyond the privileged class of truths (revealed by the natural light), it is necessary to establish the general veracity of the C&D Rule. Thus, the need (on this interpretation) for Arc 2 in the broader project.

The other main kind of interpretation avoids circularity in a different manner. Let’s consider that alternative.

Unbounded Doubt interpretations:

Arc 1: The conclusion that an all-perfect God exists is derived from premises that are clearly and distinctly perceived – i.e., premises that are accepted despite being vulnerable to Evil Genius Doubt, because our cognitive nature compels us to assent to clearly and distinctly perceived propositions.

Arc 2: The general veracity of propositions that are clearly and distinctly perceived is derived from the conclusion that an all-perfect God exists.

Again, the italicized segment marks an addition to the original statement of Arc 1. Let’s call this an ‘Unbounded Doubt’ interpretation, because this kind of interpretation construes hyperbolic doubt as unbounded. More precisely, the Evil Genius Doubt is (on this reading) unbounded in the sense that it undermines all manner of judgments – even the cogito, even the premises of the Third Meditation proofs of God – when the mind is no longer attending to them clearly and distinctly. Insofar as the meditator assents to the steps of these proofs, he does so not because of having an understanding of clear and distinct perceptions as being guaranteed true, but because the mind cannot but assent to them while attending clearly and distinctly.

Importantly, if doubt is thus unbounded there is no circularity. For, on this reading of Arc 1, the arguments therein do not presuppose the general veracity of the C&D Rule. The premises contributing to the conclusion of an all-perfect God remain vulnerable to hyperbolic doubt. Throughout this stage of the inquiry, none of the meditator’s judgments based in clear and distinct perception constitutes perfect knowledge. It is the unboundedness of hyperbolic doubt that underwrites the No Atheistic Perfect Knowledge Thesis.

A central feature of this interpretation is worth repeating. It is natural for critics to ask why the arguments of Arc 1 are accepted by the meditator if, indeed, Evil Genius Doubt remains in play. The answer lies in the indirect manner in which the doubt undermines clear and distinct perception (Section 4.3). While clearly and distinctly attending to a proposition, the mind cannot but assent: “my nature is such that so long as I perceive something very clearly and distinctly I cannot but believe it to be true.” Therefore, while the meditator attends to the steps of the Third Meditation arguments for God, he cannot but accept them. However, the meditator does not (yet) have perfect knowledge of those premises, nor of their conclusions. How, then, do those matters finally rise to the status of perfect knowledge? We return to this issue, below. At present, the focus is on the issue of circularity.

Though bounded and unbounded doubt interpretations can both avoid vicious circularity, each confronts further difficulties – both textual and philosophical. Avoiding the charge of vicious circularity marks the beginning of the interpreter’s work, not the end. Bounded doubt interpreters must explain why, in the first place, the Evil Genius Doubt’s potency does not extend to propositions in the special class. Unbounded doubt interpreters must explain why, in the final analysis, the Evil Genius Doubt eventually loses it undermining potency. Let’s consider each of these further problems.

Granting a bounded doubt interpretation, why – in the first place – does the Evil Genius Doubt’s potency not extend to propositions in the special class? How is it that the doubt does undermine the proposition “that two and three added together make five,” but not the proposition “that there must be at least as much [reality] in the efficient and total cause as in the effect of that cause”? The first proposition is included in the list of examples that are undermined by the Evil Genius Doubt (see the fourth paragraph of the Third Meditation). The second proposition is a premise in a Third Meditation argument for God – a proposition immune to doubt, according to bounded doubt interpretations. What is supposed to be the relevant difference between these propositions? Given the indirect manner in which Evil Genius Doubt operates, there seems no clear explanation of why the doubt succeeds in undermining the first proposition but is somehow resisted by the second. Further awkward for this interpretation is that the cogito is included in the list of examples that that same fourth paragraph passage implies is vulnerable to doubt.

Granting an unbounded doubt interpretation, why – in the final analysis – does the Evil Genius Doubt eventually lose its undermining potency? Putting the point ironically: Why doesn’t the Evil Genius Doubt undermine the very arguments intended to refute the Evil Genius Doubt, as soon as the mind is no longer attending to those premises? Consider Descartes’ own explanation of how hyperbolic doubt undermines the conclusions of arguments once their premises are no longer in the mind’s view:

There are other truths which are perceived very clearly by our intellect so long as we attend to the arguments on which our knowledge of them depends; and we are therefore incapable of doubting them during this time. But we may forget the arguments in question and later remember simply the conclusions which were deduced from them. The question will now arise as to whether we possess the same firm and immutable conviction concerning these conclusions, when we simply recollect that they were previously deduced from quite evident principles (our ability to call them ‘conclusions’ presupposes such a recollection). (Replies 2, AT 7:146, CSM 2:104)

So, when we’re no longer clearly and distinctly perceiving the steps of an argument, we do not “possess the same firm and immutable conviction” of its conclusion. But precisely such moments are when hyperbolic doubt does its undermining work. This means that upon diverting attention from the premises of Arcs 1 and 2, it would then be possible to run the Evil Genius Doubt on their conclusions. It would thus seem that unbounded doubt interpretations leave us in a Sisyphus-like predicament. According to the myth, each time Sisyphus pushes his boulder near to the top of the hill, the boulder slips away, rolling to the very bottom, and the whole process must start all over. By carefully constructing the arguments of Arcs 1 and 2, the meditator gains anti-sceptical momentum, pushing his project near to the goal of perfect knowledge. But each time, once his attention is diverted from the steps of the arguments, he finds himself back at the bottom of the hill, wondering about the credibility of those proofs that had seemed so evident: that is (as Descartes states the comparable problem, above), the question now arises “as to whether we possess the same firm and immutable conviction concerning these conclusions, when we simply recollect that they were previously deduced from quite evident principles.” As Michael Ayers writes:

Descartes’s enterprise might well look worthless. For even if it were granted that his argument is both valid and simple enough to be grasped intuitively, as soon as it is no longer so grasped it would seem to fall open to the very same doubt as it refutes. What is the value of such a momentary triumph over scepticism? (1998, 1013)

Let’s turn to an account that purports to solve this problem arising with unbounded doubt interpretations.

(For examples of bounded doubt interpretations, see Broughton 2002, Doney 1955, Della Rocca 2005, Kenny 1968, Morris 1973, Rickless 2005, and Wilson 1978. For examples of unbounded doubt interpretations, see Carriero 2009, Curley 1978 and 1993, DeRose 1992, Loeb 1992, Newman 2012, Newman & Nelson 1999, Sosa 1997a and 1997b, and Van Cleve 1979.)

6.2 Self-Evident God Interpretation

Again, the hard question for unbounded doubt interpretations: Why, in the final analysis, does the Evil Genius Doubt eventually lose it undermining potency? One recent unbounded doubt interpretation (Newman & Nelson 1999) offers a solution, including an explanation of why Descartes waits until the end of the Fifth Meditation to claim final victory over the sceptical problem. Here is a sketch of the account.

Descartes claims that his final solution to the sceptical problem makes it “impossible for us ever to have any reason for doubting what we are convinced of.” Yet how is this impossibility supposed to be achieved? We have seen that the sticking point in the account is indirect doubt. Descartes rejects that we could overcome the problem via uninterrupted clear and distinct perception: “my nature is also such that I cannot fix my mental vision continually on the same thing, so as to keep perceiving it clearly; and often the memory of a previously made judgement may come back, when I am no longer attending to the arguments which led me to make it.” At such moments of inattention, an indirect doubt remains possible so long as we can make sense of the evil genius scenario, or any other scenario wherein we have a defective cognitive nature. It thus seems that a final solution to the problem would need (somehow) to make it no longer possible to make sense of the relevant sceptical scenarios. Indeed, the proposed interpretation has it the sceptical scenarios become self-evidently incoherent. We come to have an utterly basic apprehension that we’re the creation of an all-perfect creator who would not allow us to be deceived about what we clearly and distinctly perceive.

The needed apprehension of God would have to be self-evident. For suppose my apprehension is grounded in a demonstration. In that case, it’s possible to think of the conclusion of that demonstration without also thinking of the premises; and on such occasions, my confidence in the demonstration is vulnerable to an indirect doubt. Thus, the needed apprehension of God is a self-evident, clear and distinct conception that renders – as literally unthinkable – the very sceptical scenarios that underwrite indirect doubt.

A useful analogy lies in the doubt-resisting character of the cogito. If I attempt a direct doubt of own my existence, the effort is self-stultifying; I immediately apprehend that I must exist, in order to attempt the doubt. What Descartes needs is a similarly strong and immediate doubt-resisting outcome in connection with the very attempt at running an indirect doubt. That is, on occasions of trying to undermine clearly and distinctly perceived matters – e.g., by doubting God’s existence, or benevolence, or the like – the very effort at doubt would be immediately thwarted.

Multiple texts suggest that this is the account Descartes intends, and that the Fifth Meditation is the locus of the meditator’s discovery of an enhanced, self-evident apprehension of God. The Fifth Meditation introduces various themes about innate truths, including the positive epistemic effects of repeated meditation: truths initially noticed only by means of inference might eventually come to be apprehended self-evidently. In the build-up to the passage claiming that the Evil Genius Doubt is finally and fully overcome, Descartes writes:

Some of the things I clearly and distinctly perceive are obvious to everyone, while others are discovered only by those who look more closely and investigate more carefully; but once they have been discovered, the latter are judged to be just as certain as the former. In the case of a right-angled triangle, for example, the fact that the square on the hypotenuse is equal to the square on the other two sides is not so readily apparent as the fact that the hypotenuse subtends the largest angle; but once one has seen it, one believes it just as strongly. But as regards God, if I were not overwhelmed by preconceived opinions, and if the images of things perceived by the senses did not besiege my thought on every side, I would certainly acknowledge him sooner and more easily than anything else. For what is more self-evident [ex se est apertius] than the fact that the supreme being exists, or that God, to whose essence alone existence belongs, exists?

Although it needed close attention for me to perceive this, I am now just as certain of it as I am of everything else which appears most certain. And what is more, I see that the certainty of all other things depends on this, so that without it nothing can ever be perfectly known. (AT 7:69, CSM 2:47f)

Descartes reiterates the theme in the Second Replies:

I ask my readers to spend a great deal of time and effort on contemplating the nature of the supremely perfect being. Above all they should reflect on the fact that the ideas of all other natures contain possible existence, whereas the idea of God contains not only possible but wholly necessary existence. This alone, without a formal argument, will make them realize that God exists; and this will eventually be just as self-evident [per se notum] to them as the fact that the number two is even or that three is odd, and so on. For there are certain truths which some people find self-evident, while others come to understand them only by means of a formal argument. (AT 7:163f, CSM 2:115)

These passages convey that one’s apprehension of God eventually upgrades from being inferential, to being transparently self-evident. Granting that the meditator has achieved an apprehension of God of this kind, it plausibly explains why Descartes would think he’s achieved a final solution to the sceptical problem. Given his newfound epistemic standing, the meditator would be unable to make coherent sense of the Evil Genius Doubt. His clear and distinct perceptions would be fully indubitable, thereby counting as perfect knowledge.

The interpretation helps explain two passages wherein Descartes purports to be detailing the final solution to the sceptical problem. In both passages, he can seem simply to be asserting that sceptical doubts are impossible, as if having forgotten the indirect manner in which his own hyperbolic doubt operates. But if we take Descartes to be assuming that the apprehension of God has become utterly self-evident, both passages make more sense. The one passage arises in the Second Replies, in the context of rebutting an objection to the effect that, in the final analysis, it remains possible to doubt clear and distinct perception. Descartes replies that the objector is “still stuck fast” in doubts “put forward in the First Meditation,” but “very carefully removed in the succeeding Meditations,” adding:

[O]nce we have become aware that God exists it is necessary for us to imagine that he is a deceiver if we wish to cast doubt on what we clearly and distinctly perceive. And since it is impossible to imagine that he is a deceiver, whatever we clearly and distinctly perceive must be completely accepted as true and certain. (AT 7:144, CSM 2:103; italics added)

The other passage arises in the Fifth Meditation, in the concluding summary explanation of how the sceptical problem is finally overcome. Importantly, on the present interpretation, is the context in which the summary explanation occurs: namely, on the heels of revealing the newly discovered thesis, that nothing “is more self-evident than the fact that the supreme being exists.” In that context, Descartes explains that a final solution to the sceptical problem has been achieved.

Now, however, I have perceived that God exists, and at the same time I have understood that everything else depends on him, and that he is no deceiver; and I have drawn the conclusion that everything which I clearly and distinctly perceive is of necessity true. Accordingly, even if I am no longer attending to the arguments which led me to judge that this is true, as long as I remember that I clearly and distinctly perceived it, there are no counter-arguments which can be adduced to make me doubt it, but on the contrary I have true and certain knowledge of it. And I have knowledge not just of this matter, but of all matters which I remember ever having demonstrated, in geometry and so on. For what objections can now be raised? That the way I am made makes me prone to frequent error? But I now know that I am incapable of error in those cases where my understanding is transparently clear. Or can it be objected that I have in the past regarded as true and certain many things which I afterwards recognized to be false? But none of these were things which I clearly and distinctly perceived: I was ignorant of this rule for establishing the truth, and believed these things for other reasons which I later discovered to be less reliable. So what is left to say? (AT 7:70, CSM 2:48f)

Absent a self-evident apprehension of God, the two passages appear inexplicable, with Descartes seeming to misunderstand the sceptical implications of his own Evil Genius Doubt. But on the self-evident God interpretation, both passages read as a summary of the anti-sceptical effects of it being impossible to conceive of God as a deceiver. As Descartes writes to Voetius, the very thought of God as a deceiver “implies a conceptual contradiction – that is, it cannot be conceived” (May 1643 letter, AT 8b:60, CSMK 222). The interpretation also makes sense of why the final victory over scepticism is announced not at the end of the Fourth Meditation, but at the end the Fifth – i.e., after the enhanced, self-evident apprehension of God is supposed to have been achieved.

(For further discussion see Newman & Nelson 1999, Nolan 2005, and Nolan &and Nelson 2006.)

6.3 Another Cartesian Circle?

Michael Della Rocca has recently argued that a further circle arises from considerations in the Fourth Meditation – a problem he suspects is “more difficult to get out of than the traditional problem of circularity” (2011, 98). To help clarify this further circle, Della Rocca focuses on a twofold question:

Why, for Descartes, should we not assent to ideas that are not clear and distinct and why is there no such obligation not to assent to clear and distinct ideas? The reason Descartes offers seems to be that we should not assent to ideas that are not clear and distinct because they, unlike clear and distinct ideas, are not guaranteed to be true. (2011, 96)

As Della Rocca understands the broader Fourth Meditation argument, the claim that we should assent only to what we clearly and distinctly perceive is an essential step in the ongoing argument to establish the divine guarantee of clear and distinct perception. Since this step presupposes the eventual conclusion, that conclusion is based on circular reasoning:

One of the premises needed for arguing that clear and distinct ideas are true is, as we have seen, that we should assent only to clear and distinct ideas. This claim, in turn, requires argument, and the argument for it seems to be based on the claim that clear and distinct ideas are guaranteed to be true. So, one of the premises of the argument for the claim that clear and distinct ideas are true is that clear and distinct ideas are guaranteed to be true. Here, the conclusion – indeed, a strengthened version of the conclusion – is itself a premise in the argument. (2011, 98)

Perhaps we can avoid this alleged circle. The linchpin of Della Rocca’s charge of circularity is his contention that “Descartes’s reason for saying that we should assent only to clear and distinct ideas is that such ideas are guaranteed to be true and ideas that are not clear and distinct are not guaranteed to be true” (2011, 97). Though Descartes can be read in this way, the texts support the following alternative understanding of the broader argumentative narrative. In the First Meditation, the meditator initially resolves that he should withhold assent to anything which is “not completely certain and indubitable” (AT 7:18, CSM 2:12). Early in the Third Meditation, having reflected on the epistemic impressiveness of the cogito, the meditator discovers that all, but only, clear and distinct perceptions are utterly assent-compelling. As a practical consequence, his initial resolve effectively implies that he should assent only to clear and distinct perceptions – not because of presupposing the conclusion of the eventual proof of the C&D Rule, but because these are the only perceptions to which he can’t but assent. This provides a practical answer to Della Rocca’s question, concerning why we should “not assent to ideas that are not clear and distinct and why is there no such obligation not to assent to clear and distinct ideas.” It is in the Fourth Meditation that the meditator purports to demonstrate the divine guarantee of the C&D Rule. However, no step of that demonstration presupposes that clear and distinct perceptions have already been established as true; i.e., the conclusion of the demonstration is not, as Della Rocca contends, “based on the claim that clear and distinct ideas are guaranteed to be true.” Rather (as we saw in Section 5.3), the conclusion purports to be based on an analysis of the respective contributions of the intellect and the will, to judgment formation. Summarizing the key steps:

So what then is the source of my mistakes? It must be simply this: the scope of the will is wider than that of the intellect; but instead of restricting it within the same limits, I extend its use to matters which I do not understand. (AT 7:58, CSM 2:40)

Granted, the meditator needs each of the demonstrative steps to be clearly and distinctly perceived. However, he needs this not because of presupposing the conclusion to be proved, but in order to be in compliance with his own initial resolve, stated in the First Meditation – to withhold assent to anything which is “not completely certain and indubitable.”

Central to the above account avoiding Della Rocca’s circle is (among other claims) the thesis that clear and distinct perceptions are assent-compelling – i.e., as Descartes writes, that “the nature of my mind is such that I cannot but assent to these things, at least so long as I clearly perceive them.” It it thus worth noting that Della Rocca wavers on whether Descartes holds this thesis: he interprets a remark in Descartes’ correspondence (9 Feb 1645, AT 4:173, CSMK 245) to suggest “that we can withhold assent from even a current clear and distinct perception” (2006, 155).

6.4 Is Truth a Condition of Perfect Knowledge?

We noted in Section 1.1 that Descartes’ clearest statements appear to indicate a justified belief analysis of perfect knowledge. Consider again the relevant Second Replies passage:

Hence you see that once we have become aware that God exists it is necessary for us to imagine that he is a deceiver if we wish to cast doubt on what we clearly and distinctly perceive. And since it is impossible to imagine that he is a deceiver, whatever we clearly and distinctly perceive must be completely accepted as true and certain.

But since I see that you are still stuck fast in the doubts which I put forward in the First Meditation, and which I thought I had very carefully removed in the succeeding Meditations, I shall now expound for a second time the basis on which it seems to me that all human certainty can be founded.

First of all, as soon as we think that we correctly perceive something, we are spontaneously convinced that it is true. Now if this conviction is so firm that it is impossible for us ever to have any reason for doubting what we are convinced of, then there are no further questions for us to ask: we have everything that we could reasonably want. What is it to us that someone may make out that the perception whose truth we are so firmly convinced of may appear false to God or an angel, so that it is, absolutely speaking, false? Why should this alleged “absolute falsity” bother us, since we neither believe in it nor have even the smallest suspicion of it? For the supposition which we are making here is of a conviction so firm that it is quite incapable of being destroyed; and such a conviction is clearly the same as the most perfect certainty. (AT 7:144f, CSM 2:103)

The last part of the passage emphasizes two conditions: a belief condition, expressed in terms of conviction, and a justification condition, expressed in terms of indubitability or unshakability – “conviction based on a reason so strong that it can never be shaken by any stronger reason.” Conspicuously missing is any further condition stipulating that the conviction must be true. The passage does clarify, of anything that would count as perfect knowledge, that it is “completely accepted as true”; that we are “convinced that it is true,” indeed, that we are “firmly convinced.” But these remarks speak to the belief condition, not to an expressed truth condition. Indeed, the passage is plausibly read even more strongly: i.e., not merely as omitting mention of a truth condition, but as allowing for some broad possibility that what we regard as indubitable truths are, “absolutely speaking, false.”

Why, then, is Descartes dismissive of the stated objection, indicating that it shouldn’t “bother” us? On one plausible reading of the passage, Descartes is assuming that the possibility in question is simply a further iteration of Evil Genius Doubt – “I see that you are still stuck fast in the doubts which I put forward in the First Meditation.” Whether a deceiving God is really possible, it’s something Descartes has argued to be unimaginable for perfect knowers, i.e., for successful graduates of the Meditations – “it is impossible to imagine that he [God] is a deceiver.” On a plausible reading, therefore, Descartes is dismissive of the objection not on metaphysical grounds of absolute impossibility, but on epistemic grounds of indubitability: the “alleged ‘absolute falsity’,” noted in the objection, should in no way “bother us” because our conviction is “so firm that it is quite incapable of being destroyed.”

Why does Descartes not add a truth condition, thereby ensuring that beliefs counting as perfect knowledge are true? In an influential 1970 book, Harry Frankfurt offers a provocative answer. He argues that Descartes’ goal, truth-wise, is to establish the consistency of our beliefs, but not their correspondence with an external reality. Writes Frankfurt:

The point of Descartes’s validation of reason is that if reason is properly employed – that is, if we give assent only to what we clearly and distinctly perceive – we are not led to doubt that reason is reliable. … The crux of Descartes’s validation of reason is not so much the discovery that a benign deity exists, but that reason leads to the conclusion that such a deity exists. (1970, 176)

Frankfurt thinks that Descartes’ novel plan involves arguing that our best rational efforts show that our best rational efforts are logically consistent: it is “an attempt to show that there are no good reasons for believing that reason is unreliable – that the mistrust of reason is not supported by reason and that it is accordingly irrational” (1970, 175). Frankfurt adds that “the conception of truth involved in [Descartes’] question about the truth of what is clearly and distinctly perceived is, in other words, a conception of coherence rather than of correspondence” (1970, 170).

Frankfurt’s coherentist interpretation is at odds with a number of textual and doctrinal considerations. Descartes writes to Mersenne that “the word ‘truth’, in the strict sense, denotes the conformity of thought with its object” (16 Oct 1639, AT 2:597, CSMK 139). The suggestion here is of some version of a correspondence theory. Also, on the most straightforward reading of the epistemic moves in the Meditations, Descartes is presupposing that at least some truths involve extramental metaphysical relations. Consider that Evil Genius Doubt is, fundamentally, a worry not about whether our various clear and distinct judgments cohere, but about whether they accurately represent an extramental reality – i.e., a doubt about “whether things do in reality correspond to our perception of them” (Replies 4, AT 7:226, CSM 2:159). Interestingly, Frankfurt himself came to renounce the interpretation:

I now think, however, that it was a mistake on my part to suggest that Descartes entertained a coherence conception of truth. The fact is that there is no textual evidence to support that suggestion; on the contrary, whenever Descartes gives an explicit account of truth he explains it unequivocally as correspondence with reality. (1978, 36f)

How then should we interpret the Second Replies passage, and how should we understand the absence of a truth condition? I suggest that the lack of a truth condition need not reflect an indifference about truth, as opposed to a view about how a concern for truth is properly expressed in an account of knowledge. We can understand Descartes as wanting a fully internalist account whereby all conditions of knowledge are accessible to the would-be knower. Putting the point another way, if the question of whether the conditions of knowledge had been met were answerable only by “God or an angel,” it would impose an unacceptably externalist element on the theory. On a justified belief rendering, his account of perfect knowledge is fully internalist; yet, with the addition of a truth condition, it is not – at least, not given a correspondence theory of truth, in the context of metaphysical realism. Importantly, then, in attributing to Descartes a justified belief account, we need not thereby attribute to him an indifference concerning truth. Rather, we can attribute to him the view that the way properly to express one’s concern for truth is by enforcing high justificatory standards. Again, from that same passage:

Now if this conviction is so firm that it is impossible for us ever to have any reason for doubting what we are convinced of, then there are no further questions for us to ask: we have everything that we could reasonably want.

One possible objection to a justified belief account is expressed by Lennon, who worries that on such accounts the desired cognitive state (indubitability) “could as well be achieved by a pill”; adding that “Descartes would not be satisfied with such a pill because his aim is not just to arrive at certainty, but truth, which he cannot help but think he has achieved” (2008, 167). (Cf. Hatfield 2006, 135, who expresses a related objection.)

Granted, if the pill simply prevented me from apprehending any reasons for doubting my beliefs, we’d be loath to regard such beliefs as knowledge. Descartes himself makes a related point in connection with an atheist geometer who happens never to doubt his beliefs, simply because the Evil Genius Doubt never occurs to him:

[A]lthough this doubt may not occur to him, it can still crop up if someone else raises the point or if he looks into the matter himself. So he will never be free of this doubt until he acknowledges that God exists. (Replies 2, AT 7:141, CSM 2:101)

Presumably, Descartes’ point holds whether the doubt simply never occurs to him, or is instead prevented from occurring by a pill. Note further that the spirit of the objection presupposes that the achieved indubitability is merely psychological, in that the person simply runs up against an inexplicable inability to doubt. Yet we have seen clear texts which have Descartes characterizing the desired states of clarity and distinctness not merely psychologically, but, further, in epistemic terms implying a sort of cognitive luminance, or rational insight. He uses light metaphors including the association of clarity and distinctness with the natural light. The meditator’s ability to ward off the evil demon – during occurrent clarity and distinctness – is described in terms of perceiving “utterly clearly with [the] mind’s eye”; and of being “convinced” of all matters the denial of which leads one to “see a manifest contradiction” (Med. 3, AT 7:36, CSM 2:25). In Descartes’ view, our inability to doubt the matters we clearly and distinctly perceive is not simply a causal result, but also a rational result of what such perception enables us to understand. Were there a pill that would induce both the causal and the rational outcomes that Descartes associates with perfect knowledge, then, arguably, he would endorse taking the pill. For we would then “have everything that we could reasonably want.”

Another possible objection is that Descartes’ high justificatory standards generate a de facto truth condition: because having Cartesian certainty entails that one’s beliefs are true, truth is a necessary condition of knowledge. But this objection misses a key point. As suggested in the Second Replies passage, Cartesian certainty – understood in terms of indubitability – does not, strictly speaking, rule out the broad possibility that we are in error. The notions of indubitability and truth are different: that “p is indubitable” entails not that “p is true,” but that “there can be no reasons for doubting p.” Descartes’ final solution to the Evil Genius Doubt entails not that an evil genius cannot be, but that it cannot be coherently conceived. And that it cannot be coherently conceived, thinks Descartes, gives us “everything that we could reasonably want” – not because such coherence is the goal, but because of what it establishes, truth-wise.

(For further discussion of the role of truth in perfect knowledge, see Frankfurt 1970 and 1978, Hatfield 2006, Lennon 2008, Loeb 1992, and Newman & Nelson 1999.)

7. Proving an External Material World

The opening line of the Sixth Meditation makes clear its principal objective: “It remains for me to examine whether material things exist” (AT 7:71, CSM 2:50). At this juncture, the meditator perfectly knows of his own existence and of God’s. It follows that there’s an external world with at least one object, namely, God. However, the existence of an external material world remains in doubt. Establishing the existence of material bodies is not a straightforward matter of perceiving them, because, in Descartes’ view, “bodies are not strictly perceived by the senses” (see Section 9.1).

In his eventual argument, Descartes’ strategy for proving an external material world has two main parts: first, he argues for the externality of the causes of sensation; second, he argues for the materiality of these external causes. (Calling the ideas in question “sensations” can seem circular, if one conceives of sensations as having a physiological component. But note that for Descartes, “what is called ‘having a sensory perception’,” strictly encompasses only a mental aspect Med. 2, AT 7:29, CSM 2:19). From these two steps, it follows that there exists an external material world. Let’s consider each phase of the argument.

7.1 Case for the Externality of the Causes of Sensation

Descartes builds on a familiar line of argument in the history of philosophy, itself appealing to the involuntariness of sensations. The familiar argument is first articulated in the Third Meditation. Speaking of his apparently adventitious ideas (sensations), the meditator remarks:

But the chief question at this point concerns the ideas which I take to be derived from things existing outside me … I know by experience that these ideas do not depend on my will, and hence that they do not depend simply on me. Frequently I notice them even when I do not want to: now, for example, I feel the heat whether I want to or not, and this is why I think that this sensation or idea of heat comes to me from something other than myself, namely the heat of the fire by which I am sitting. (AT 7:38, CSM 2:26)

Though some such involuntariness argument has convinced many philosophers, the inference does not hold up to methodical doubt, as the meditator explains:

Then again, although these [apparently adventitious] ideas do not depend on my will, it does not follow that they must come from things located outside me. Just as the impulses which I was speaking of a moment ago seem opposed to my will even though they are within me, so there may be some other faculty [of my mind] not yet fully known to me, which produces these ideas without any assistance from external things; this is, after all, just how I have always thought ideas are produced in me when I am dreaming. (Med. 3, AT 7:39, CSM 2:27)

We first examined this passage in regard to the Always Dreaming Doubt. That sceptical hypothesis raises the problem of the existence of external things. For all I know, my “waking” experiences are produced not by external things, but by processes similar to those producing my dreams. This sceptical possibility explains why the familiar involuntariness argument fails: the inference presupposes exactly what is at issue – namely, whether involuntarily received sensory ideas are produced by external things, rather than by a subconscious faculty of my mind.

Many philosophers have assumed that we lack the epistemic resources to solve this sceptical problem. For example, Hume writes:

By what argument can it be proved, that the perceptions of the mind must be caused by external objects … and could not arise either from the energy of the mind itself … or from some other cause still more unknown to us? It is acknowledged, that, in fact, many of these perceptions arise not from anything external, as in dreams, madness, and other diseases. … It is a question of fact, whether the perceptions of the senses be produced by external objects … But here experience is, and must be entirely silent. (Enquiry Sec. 12)

Interestingly, Descartes would agree that experiential resources cannot solve the problem. By the Sixth Meditation, however, Descartes purports to have the innate resources he needs to solve it – notably, innate ideas of mind and body. Among the metaphysical theses he develops is that mind and body have wholly distinct essences: the essence of thinking substance is pure thought; the essence of body is pure extension. In a remarkable maneuver, Descartes invokes this distinction to refute the sceptical worry that sensations are produced by a subconscious faculty of the mind: “nothing can be in me, that is to say, in my mind, of which I am not aware,” and this “follows from the fact that the soul is distinct from the body and that its essence is to think” (13 Dec 1640 letter to Mersenne, AT 3:273, CSMK 165f). This result allows Descartes to supplement the involuntariness argument, thereby strengthening the inference. For from the additional premise that nothing can be in my mind of which I am unaware, it follows that if sensations were being produced by some activity in my mind, I’d be aware of that activity on the occasion of its operation. Since I’m not thus aware, it follows that the sensation I’m having is produced by a cause external to my mind. As Descartes writes, this cause

… cannot be in me, since clearly it presupposes no intellectual act [of awareness] on my part, and the ideas in question are produced without my cooperation and often even against my will. So the only alternative is that it is in another substance distinct from me … (Med. 6, AT 7:79, CSM 2:55)

It follows that my sensations are caused by external world objects – i.e., objects external to my mind. It remains to be shown that these external causes are material objects.

7.2 Case for the Materiality of the Causes of Sensation

On Descartes’ analysis, there are three possible options for the kind of external thing causing sensations:

  1. God
  2. Material/corporeal substance
  3. Some other created substance

That is, the cause is either infinite substance (God), or finite substance; and if finite, then either corporeal, or something else. Descartes thinks he eliminates options (a) and (c) by appeal to God being no deceiver:

But since God is not a deceiver, it is quite clear that he does not transmit the ideas to me either directly from himself, or indirectly, via some creature [other than corporeal substance] … For God has given me no faculty at all for recognizing any such source for these ideas; on the contrary, he has given me a great propensity to believe that they are produced by corporeal things. It follows that corporeal things exist. (Med. 6, AT 7:79f, CSM 2:55; italics added)

This is a problematic passage. The “great propensity” here cited is not the irresistible compulsion of clear and distinct perception. (If it were, the conclusion that sensation is caused by material objects would follow straightaway from this clear and distinct perception, via the C&D Rule.) But unless each step of the argument is clearly and distinctly perceived, Descartes should not be making the argument. Adding to the difficulties of the passage, he expressly cites the conclusion as following from the fact that “God is not a deceiver,” implying that he thinks this inference is supported by a divine guarantee.

On one kind of interpretation, Descartes relaxes his epistemic standards in the Sixth Meditation (cf. Schmitt 1986, 493f). He no longer insists on perfect knowledge, now settling for probabilistic arguments. Though no decisive texts support the interpretation, it does find some support. For instance, in the Synopsis to the Meditations, Descartes writes of his Sixth Meditation arguments:

The great benefit of these arguments is not, in my view, that they prove what they establish … The point is that in considering these arguments we come to realize that they are not as solid or as transparent as the arguments which lead us to knowledge of our own minds and of God … (AT 7:15f, CSM 2:11)

The remark can be read as a concession that the Sixth Meditation arguments are weaker than the earlier arguments about minds and God – that these later arguments do not “prove what they establish.” Of course, one need not read the remark this way. And other texts are unfavorable to this interpretation. For example, in the opening paragraphs of the Sixth Meditation, Descartes considers a probabilistic argument for the existence of external bodies. Though he accepts the proposed account as offering the best explanation, he nonetheless dismisses it for the express reason that it grounds “only a probability” – it does not provide the “basis for a necessary inference that some body exists” (AT 7:73, CSM 2:51). This is a puzzling dismissal, assuming Descartes has relaxed his standards to probable inference.

The relaxed standards interpretation falls short for another reason. It leaves unexplained why Descartes cites a divine guarantee for the conclusion that sensations are caused by material objects.

On another kind of interpretation, the troubling passage appealing to a “great propensity” does not mark a relaxing of epistemic standards. Instead, Descartes is extending the implications of his discussion of theodicy in the Fourth Meditation to encompass further cases of natural belief – such beliefs deriving from our God-given cognitive nature. It was noted above (Section 5.2) that Descartes thinks the divine guarantee of the C&D Rule follows, in part, from the fact that God wouldn’t allow us to be mistaken when our assent is a natural consequence of our God-given cognitive nature. Suppose Descartes holds that there are further cases in which an all-perfect God would not allow us to be in error, in part because the beliefs in question arise naturally from our God-given cognitive nature. And suppose the further cases involve a natural propensity to believe which cannot be corrected by our cognitive faculties. Given these assumptions, the resulting rule for truth would look something like the following:

I am not in error in cases in which (i) I have a natural propensity to believe, and (ii) God provided me no faculty by which to correct a false such belief.

This rule is more expansive than the C&D Rule, in that it licenses more kinds of judgments. Clauses (i) and (ii) are tailored to the problematic passage wherein, as we’ve seen, Descartes invokes two conditions: “God has given me no faculty at all for recognizing any such source for these ideas; on the contrary, he has given me a great propensity to believe that they are produced by corporeal things.” If this is on the right interpretive track, then Descartes needs some way to justify this rule. Assuming a proof similar in structure to the proof of the C&D Rule, the justification might run as follows:

  1. There is an all-perfect God.
  2. An all-perfect God cannot allow me to be in error in cases in which (i) I have a natural propensity to believe, and (ii) God provided me no faculty by which to correct a false such belief.
  3. Therefore, I am not in error in cases in which (i) I have a natural propensity to believe, and (ii) God provided me no faculty by which to correct a false such belief.

If Descartes affirms premise 2, it explains why he thinks he’s entitled to this more expansive rule, and without relaxing his epistemic standards. Indeed, a number of texts indicate that he holds some version of premise 2. The relevant Sixth Meditation passage states that from “the very fact that God is not a deceiver” there is a “consequent impossibility of there being any falsity in my opinions which cannot be corrected by some other faculty supplied by God” (AT 7:80, CSM 2:55f). Another passage adds that we would be “doing God an injustice” if we implied “that God had endowed us with such an imperfect nature that even the proper use of our powers of reasoning allowed us to go wrong” (Prin. 3:43, AT 8a:99, CSM 1:255). And in the Second Replies, Descartes addresses case of judgments that “could not be corrected by any clearer judgements or by means of any other natural faculty,” adding that “in such cases I simply assert that it is impossible for us to be deceived” (Replies 2, AT 7:143f, CSM 2:102f). These passages make a strong case that something like premise 2 is in play, indeed implying that God’s benevolent nature entails a more expansive rule of truth than the C&D Rule. (As will emerge, Descartes looks again to call on this more expansive rule in his effort to prove that he is not dreaming.)

Earlier, we noted another apparent problem in the Sixth Meditation passage wherein Descartes concludes that the external cause of sensation is something corporeal. One of his premises cites a great propensity to believe, yet the propensity is not itself the irresistible compulsion of clear and distinct perception. Does not the methodic procedure of the Meditations restrict Descartes to using clear and distinct premises? By way of reply, distinguish (a) that my sensation has an external cause, and (b) that I have a great propensity to believe my sensation has an external cause. In context, the meditator lacks clear and distinct perception of (a). However, the relevant premise of the argument (as opposed to its conclusion) is not (a), but (b). And there is no principled reason that the meditator cannot clearly and distinctly perceive this premise.

A final observation. It goes regularly unnoticed that the conclusion of Descartes’ argument for the existence of an external material world leaves significant scepticism in place. Granting the success of the argument, my sensations are caused by an external material world. But for all the argument shows – for all the broader argument of the Meditations shows, up to this point – my mind might be joined to a brain in a vat, rather than a full human body. This isn’t an oversight on Descartes’ part. It’s all he thinks the argument can prove. For even at this late stage of the project, the meditator has not yet established himself to be awake – a line of inquiry to which we now turn.

(For further discussion of Descartes’ effort to prove the existence of an external material world, see Carriero 2009 [146ff], Friedman 1997, Garber 1992, and Newman 1994.)

8. Perfect Knowledge of Being Awake

By design, the constructive arguments of the Meditations unfold even though the meditator remains in doubt about being awake. This of course reinforces the ongoing theme that perfect knowledge does not properly encompass judgments of external sense. (The judgment that an external material world exists is not strictly a judgment of external sense – as if knowing its existence simply by sensing it. Rather, as we’ve seen, the judgment arises from an complex inference about the possible causes of sensations.) In the closing paragraph of the Sixth Meditation, Descartes revisits the issue of dreaming. He claims to show how, in principle – even if not easily in practice – it is possible to achieve perfect knowledge that one is presently awake.

A casual reading of that final paragraph might suggest that Descartes offers a naturalistic solution to the problem (i.e., a non-theistic solution), in the form of a continuity test: since continuity with past experiences holds only of waking but not dreaming, checking for the requisite continuity provides a test for ascertaining that one is awake. The following remarks can be read in this way:

I now notice that there is a vast difference between the two [“being asleep and being awake”], in that dreams are never linked by memory with all the other actions of life as waking experiences are. … But when I distinctly see where things come from and where and when they come to me, and when I can connect my perceptions of them with the whole of the rest of my life without a break, then I am quite certain that when I encounter these things I am not asleep but awake. (AT 7:89f, CSM 2:61f)

This naturalistic “solution” prompts two obvious criticisms, both raised by Hobbes in the Third Objections. First, the solution runs contrary to Descartes’ No Atheistic Perfect Knowledge Thesis: since the continuity test (on the naturalistic reading of it) does not invoke God, it thus appears, as Hobbes notes, “that someone can know he is awake without knowledge of the true God” (AT 7:196, CSM 2:137). Second, it seems that one could dream the requisite continuity: one could “dream that his dream fits in with his ideas of a long series of past events,” thus undermining the credibility of the continuity test (AT 7:195, CSM 2:137).

Mirroring our discussion in Section 7.2, one kind of interpretation has Descartes relaxing his epistemic standards. He’s aware that the naturalistic solution does not stand up to methodic doubt, but he’s not attempting to overcome the Now Dreaming Doubt with perfect knowledge. A problem for this interpretation is that it doesn’t square with the following reply Descartes makes to Hobbes’ first objection: “an atheist can infer that he is awake on the basis of memory of his past life” (via the continuity test); but “he cannot know that this criterion is sufficient to give him the certainty that he is not mistaken, if he does not know that he was created by a non-deceiving God” (Replies 3, AT 7:196, CSM 2:137). Evidently, Descartes’ solution is not supposed to be available to the atheist. Taken at face value, this reply rules out a relaxed standards interpretation; it indeed rules out any interpretation involving a naturalistic solution to the problem of dreaming.

On closer inspection, the Sixth Meditation passage puts forward not a naturalistic solution, but a theistic one. The meditator finally concludes that he’s awake because, as the passage explicitly reads, “God is not a deceiver” (AT 7:90, CSM 2:62).

How does his argument go? Recall, in the proof of the external material world (Section 7.2), that Descartes mysteriously invokes the following (divinely guaranteed) truth rule:

I am not in error in cases in which (i) I have a natural propensity to believe, and (ii) God provided me no faculty by which to correct a false such belief.

The dreaming passage looks to have Descartes again invoking this rule. The passage opens with the meditator observing the following:

I can almost always make use of more than one sense to investigate the same thing; and in addition, I can use both my memory, which connects present experiences with preceding ones, and my intellect, which has by now examined all the causes of error. Accordingly, I should not have any further fears about the falsity of what my senses tell me every day; on the contrary, the exaggerated doubts of the last few days should be dismissed as laughable. This applies especially to … my inability to distinguish between being asleep and being awake. (AT 7:89, CSM 2:61)

Referring to the worry that he’s presently dreaming as exaggerated suggests that condition (i) is met – i.e., suggesting that the present circumstance includes a “natural propensity” to believe he’s awake. As such, he needs only to establish condition (ii), and he’ll have a divine guarantee of being awake. Here, notice that an important theme of the above passage concerns the meditator’s faculties for correcting sensory error – a theme suggestive of condition (ii). In context, Descartes’ appeal to the continuity test is perhaps best understood in conjunction with condition (ii). As the meditator says (speaking of his apparently waking experience):

[W]hen I distinctly see where things come from and where and when they come to me, and when I can connect my perceptions of them with the whole of the rest of my life without a break, then I am quite certain that when I encounter these things I am not asleep but awake. And I ought not to have even the slightest doubt of their reality if, after calling upon all the senses as well as my memory and my intellect in order to check them, I receive no conflicting reports from any of these sources. For from the fact that God is not a deceiver it follows that in cases like these I am completely free from error. (AT 7:90, CSM 2:62; italics added)

Central to the inference is the meditator’s effort to check the correctness of his belief, by means of his various faculties. The cases like these to which Descartes refers look to be those where conditions (i) and (ii) are both satisfied. Recall what Descartes writes in conjunction with the proof of the external material world: from “the very fact that God is not a deceiver” there is a “consequent impossibility of there being any falsity in my opinions which cannot be corrected by some other faculty supplied by God” (AT 7:80, CSM 2:55f). Perhaps, therefore, we can understand Descartes’ theistic solution to the Now Dreaming Doubt as building on the same rule he employs in his proof for the external material world.

What about Hobbes’s other objection – in effect, that one could dream both (i) and (ii)? Descartes’ response: “A dreamer cannot really connect his dreams with the ideas of past events, though he may dream that he does. For everyone admits that a man may be deceived in his sleep” (AT 7:196, CSM 2:137). Perhaps Descartes thinks the situation with dreaming parallels that of waking life: those who are sufficiently tired, or otherwise perceptually inattentive, “cannot really” perceive truths clearly and distinctly, though it may seem to them that they do. Whether in waking or dreaming, the Fourth Meditation theodicy has God allowing us to make judgment errors, provided that they are correctable. Descartes is committed to holding that when our perception is confused, we can in principle come to discover the confusion – even if not easily. When we lack clear and distinct perception, we are at fault (not God) for any resulting judgments, in part because we can discover that our perception is confused. Descartes needs it that the same principle holds even while dreaming. (And again, nearly the entirety of the Meditations unfolds under the supposition that, for all we know, we may presently be dreaming.) For the case at hand – i.e., the possibility of mistakenly judging that I’m awake, while in a dream – Descartes needs it that we could, in principle, discover that we’re mistaken. Apropos of condition (ii), therefore, is whether God has provided us a faculty by which to discover that we’re dreaming, on occasions when we wrongly believe ourselves to be awake. Evidently, Descartes thinks so, as he tells Gassendi:

When, for example, we are asleep and are aware that we are dreaming, we need imagination in order to dream, but to be aware that we are dreaming we need only the intellect. (Replies 5, AT 7:358f, CSM 2:248)

Importantly, Descartes does not say we can easily correct the mistake of dreaming that we’re awake. To the contrary, the Sixth Meditation treatment of the Now Dreaming Doubt closes with a concession that his solution is perhaps more theoretical than practical:

But since the pressure of things to be done does not always allow us to stop and make such a meticulous check, it must be admitted that in this human life we are often liable to make mistakes about particular things, and we must acknowledge the weakness of our nature. (AT 7:90, CSM 2:62)

Thus the importance of Descartes’ First Meditation remark that “no danger or error will result” from the program of methodical doubt, “because the task now in hand does not involve action” (AT 7:22, CSM 2:15). Methodical doubt should not be applied to practical matters. Prudence dictates that when making practical decisions I should assume I’m awake, even if I don’t perfectly know that I’m awake. Judgment errors made while mistakenly assuming I’m awake do not have actual practical consequences, unlike those made while mistakenly assuming I’m dreaming.

(For further discussion, see Newman 1999, Williams 1978, and Wilson 1978.)

9. Self-Knowledge

9.1 That Mind is Better-Known than Body

Descartes holds that our judgments about our own minds are epistemically better-off than our judgments about bodies. In our natural, pre-reflective condition, however, we’re apt to confuse the sensory images of bodies with the external things themselves, a confusion leading us to think our judgments about bodies are epistemically impressive. The confusion is clearly expressed (Descartes would say) in G. E. Moore’s famous claim to knowledge – “Here is a hand” – along with his more general defense of common sense:

I begin, then, with my list of truisms, every one of which (in my own opinion) I know, with certainty, to be true. … There exists at present a living human body, which is my body. This body was born at a certain time in the past, and has existed continuously ever since … But the earth had existed also for many years before my body was born … (1962, 32f)

In contrast, Descartes writes:

[I]f I judge that the earth exists from the fact that I touch it or see it, this very fact undoubtedly gives even greater support for the judgement that my mind exists. For it may perhaps be the case that I judge that I am touching the earth even though the earth does not exist at all; but it cannot be that, when I make this judgement, my mind which is making the judgement does not exist. (Prin. 1:11, AT 8a:8f, CSM 1:196)

Methodical doubt is intended to help us appreciate the folly of the commonsensical position – helping us recognize that perception of our own minds is “not simply prior to and more certain … but also more evident” than perception of our own bodies (Prin. 1:11, AT 8a:8, CSM 1:196). “Disagreement on this point,” writes Descartes, comes from “those who have not done their philosophizing in an orderly way”; from those who, while properly acknowledging the “certainty of their own existence,” mistakenly “take ‘themselves’ to mean only their bodies” – failing to “realize that they should have taken ‘themselves’ in this context to mean their minds alone” (Prin. 1:12, AT 8a:9, CSM 1:196).

In epistemological contexts, Descartes purports to establish the mind-better-known-than-body doctrine with methodical doubt. For example, while reflecting on his epistemic position in regard both to himself, and to the wax, the Second Meditation meditator says:

Surely my awareness of my own self is not merely much truer and more certain than my awareness of the wax, but also much more distinct and evident. For if I judge that the wax exists from the fact that I see it, clearly this same fact entails much more evidently that I myself also exist. It is possible that what I see is not really the wax; it is possible that I do not even have eyes with which to see anything. But when I see, or think I see (I am not here distinguishing the two), it is simply not possible that I who am now thinking am not something. (AT 7:33, CSM 2:22)

Further reasons might be helping to motivate Descartes’ view. On the kind of representational theory of perception that is widely attributed to him, our sense organs and nerves serve as literal mediating links in the causal chains generating sense perception: they stand between (both spatially and causally) external things themselves, and the brain events occasioning our perceptual awareness (cf. Prin. 4:196). In veridical sensation, the objects of immediate sensory awareness are not external bodies themselves, nor are we immediately aware of the states of our sense organs or nerves. Rather, the objects of immediate awareness are – whether in veridical sensation, or in dreams – the mind’s own ideas. Descartes indeed holds that the fact of physiological mediation helps explain delusional ideas, because roughly the same kinds of physiological processes that produce waking ideas are employed in producing delusional ideas:

[I]t is the soul which sees, and not the eye; and it does not see directly, but only by means of the brain. That is why madmen and those who are asleep often see, or think they see, various objects which are nevertheless not before their eyes: namely, certain vapours disturb their brain and arrange those of its parts normally engaged in vision exactly as they would be if these objects were present. (Optics, AT 6:141, CSM 1:172; cf. AT 7:85ff and AT 11:248f)

Various passages of the Meditations lay important groundwork for this theory of perception. For instance, one of the messages of the wax passage is that sensory awareness does not reach to external things themselves:

We say that we see the wax itself, if it is there before us, not that we judge it to be there from its colour or shape; and this might lead me to conclude without more ado that knowledge of the wax comes from what the eye sees, and not from the scrutiny of the mind alone. But then if I look out of the window and see men crossing the square, as I just happen to have done, I normally say that I see the men themselves, just as I say that I see the wax. Yet do I see any more than hats and coats which could conceal automatons? I judge that they are men. (Med. 2, AT 7:32, CSM 2:21)

Descartes thinks we’re apt to be “tricked by ordinary ways of talking” (ibid.). In ordinary contexts we don’t say that it seems there are men outside the window; we say that we see them. Nor, in such contexts, are our beliefs about those men apt to result from conscious, inferentially complex judgments, say, like this one: “Well, I appear to be awake, and the window pane looks clean, and there’s plenty of light outside, and so on, and I thus conclude that I am seeing men outside the window.” Even so, our ordinary ways of speaking and thinking often mislead. Descartes’ view is that the mind’s immediate perception does not, strictly speaking, extend beyond itself, to external bodies. This is an important basis of the mind-better-known-than-body doctrine. In the concluding paragraph of the Second Meditation, Descartes writes:

I see that without any effort I have now finally got back to where I wanted. I now know that even bodies are not strictly [proprie] perceived by the senses or the faculty of imagination but by the intellect alone, and that this perception derives not from their being touched or seen but from their being understood; and in view of this I know plainly that I can achieve an easier and more evident perception of my own mind than of anything else. (AT 7:34, CSM 2:22f)

The understanding of ideas as the only immediate objects of awareness arises in a number of texts. In the Sixth Meditation, while discussing sense perception and our ideas of external things, Descartes writes that the mind’s sensation extends strictly and immediately only to the ideas: “the ideas were, strictly speaking, the only immediate objects of my sensory awareness [solas proprie et immediate sentiebam]” (AT 7:75, CSM 2:52). The Second Replies defines thought “to include everything that is within us in such a way that we are immediately aware of it”; it defines idea in terms of the “immediate perception” that makes us “aware of the thought” (AT 7:160, CSM 2:113). And in the Third Replies Descartes writes: “I make it quite clear in several places … that I am taking the word ‘idea’ to refer to whatever is immediately perceived by the mind” (AT 7:181, CSM 2:127).

Complicating an understanding of such passages is that Descartes scholarship is divided on whether to attribute to him some version of an indirect theory of perception, or instead some version of a direct theory. According to indirect perception accounts, in normal sensation the mind’s perception of bodies is mediated by an awareness of its ideas of those bodies. By contrast, direct perception interpretations allow that in normal sensation the mind’s ideas play a mediating role, though this role doesn’t have ideas functioning as items of awareness; rather, the objects of direct awareness are the external things, themselves. On both accounts, ideas mediate our perception of external objects. On direct theory accounts, the mediating role is only a process role. By analogy, various brain processes mediate our perception of external objects, but in the normal course of perception we are not consciously aware of those processes; and likewise for the mind’s ideas, according to direct perception accounts. On one recent version of an indirect perception interpretation, sensory ideas mediate our perception of the external bodies they’re of, in much the same way that pictures (or other representational media) mediate our perception of what they portray (Newman 2009). More generally, Descartes seems to view all ideas as mental pictures, of a sort. As he writes: “the term ‘idea’ is strictly appropriate” only for thoughts that “are as it were the images of things” (Med. 3, AT 7:37, CSM 2:25); he adds that “the ideas in me are like {pictures, or} images” (Med. 3, AT 7:42, CSM 2:29).

Indirect perception interpretations have figured prominently in the history of Descartes scholarship. A number of recent commentators, however, have challenged this traditional view. For example, Carriero defends a direct perception interpretation: “I don’t read Descartes as holding that I am (immediately) aware only of my sensory ideas and only subsequently (and perhaps indirectly) aware of bodies or their qualities” (2009, 25). Thus on Carriero’s reading, Descartes’ broader argument rebutting our doubts about the external world is not to be understood as an effort to get on the other side (as it were) of our ideas:

The argument (as I understand it) is not intended to get us from a realm of inner mental objects (“sensory ideas”) to some other realm of outer, physical objects (“bodies”); rather, it is to confirm our instinctive feeling that we have been receiving information (“directly”) from outer objects, bodies, all along. (2009, 26)

(For further discussion of Descartes’ theory of ideas and perception, see Carriero 2009, Chappell 1986, Cunning 2010, Hoffman 1996 and 2009, Jolley 1990, Nadler 2006, Nelson 1997, Newman 2009, 2011, and Smith 2014.)

9.2 Whether We Perfectly Know Our Own Minds

We have seen that the proper use of our cognitive faculties requires us to withhold assent except when our perception is clear and distinct – indeed, that forming judgments in accord with the C&D Rule provides the only guarantee of truth. Let’s apply this standard to introspective judgments. Suppose that the present contents of my mind include a confused array of ideas – say, a confused assemblage of auditory ideas, or color ideas, or perhaps I am presently flooded with a confused assortment of ideas of emotion. In such cases, the proper use of my faculties requires me to withhold judgment about the present state of my mind.

It is surprising, therefore, to learn that on the standard view in Descartes scholarship, he holds a strong view of privileged access guaranteeing the truth of all introspective judgments about the present contents of our own minds. The usual result is an infallibility thesis whereby judgments about our own mental states cannot be mistaken if based on introspective awareness: if I seem to be in mental state x, then I am in x. (A variety of related doctrines are also sometimes attributed to him, including the indubitability of the mental – roughly, that introspective judgments are indubitable; and omniscience with respect to the mental – roughly, that one has knowledge of every true proposition about one’s own present contents of consciousness. There is some variation in the way these doctrines are formulated in the literature.)

At least two lines of argument are widely cited in support of this standard interpretation. One draws on the transparency doctrine. The other draws on texts interpreted as providing support. Let’s examine both.

The transparency doctrine has it that we are aware of everything occurring in our minds – this, a result of Descartes’ view that thinking constitutes the whole essence of mind:

As to the fact that there can be nothing in the mind, in so far as it is a thinking thing, of which it is not aware, this seems to me to be self-evident. For there is nothing that we can understand to be in the mind, regarded in this way, that is not a thought or dependent on a thought. … and we cannot have any thought of which we are not aware at the very moment when it is in us. (Replies 4, AT 7:246, CSM 2:171f)

Add to this that, unlike with external sensation, there is no introspective appearance/reality gap, and there can seem to be no room for introspective errors. Zeno Vendler explains:

If the mind, at any given time, is identical with a certain complex of thoughts … then the very idea of a medium between the mind and its thoughts is impossible from the outset. Accordingly, it is an understatement to say that the mind knows its thoughts; the mind is these thoughts. (1972, 191)

Kenny adds:

The occurrence of thoughts is not open to doubt or error. Thoughts cannot occur without our knowing that they occur, and we cannot think that a thought is occurring unless that thought actually is occurring. (1968, 72)

In opposition to this standard interpretation, note that from the fact that I have awareness of whatever is occurring in my mind, it does not follow that I have distinct awareness. If what’s occurring in my mind is a confused muddle of ideas, then I’ll be aware of a confused muddle of ideas. But in that case, forming a judgment about the present state of my mind is a recipe for error – i.e., given the Fourth Meditation account of proper judgment. The situation is arguably better in cases in which I am experiencing fewer and simpler ideas; this is because such ideas are generally easier to render clear and distinct. Even so, such ideas must actually be rendered as clear and distinct. Noteworthy is that Descartes writes, of “sensations, emotions and appetites,” that “we are frequently wrong in our judgements concerning them”; adding, that we can avoid such errors “provided we take great care in our judgements concerning them to include no more than what is strictly contained in our perception – no more than that of which we have inner awareness” (Prin 1:66, AT 8a:32, CSM 1:216).

Consider another case that seems at odds with the standard interpretation. Were Descartes committed to introspective infallibility, then he should say that we could never be mistaken as to whether our occurring ideas are ideas of sensation, or instead ideas of imagination occurring in a dream. Yet as we’ve seen, he takes dreaming-based scepticism utterly seriously.

What about the textual line of argument regularly cited in support of the standard interpretation? Consider two Meditations passages that can seem to entail the infallibility thesis:

I certainly seem to see, to hear, and to be warmed. This cannot be false; what is called “having a sensory perception” is strictly just this, and in this restricted sense of the term it is simply thinking. (Med. 2, AT 7:29, CSM 2:19)

Now as far as ideas are concerned, provided they are considered solely in themselves and I do not refer them to anything else, they cannot strictly speaking be false; for whether it is a goat or a chimera that I am imagining, it is just as true that I imagine the former as the latter. As for the will and the emotions, here too one need not worry about falsity; for even if the things which I may desire are wicked or even non-existent, that does not make it any less true that I desire them. (Med. 3, AT 7:37, CSM 2:26)

Prima facie, it is plausible to take such passages to entail that if I seem to be having an idea of blue, or an idea of a noise, or of warmth, etc., then I am. Indeed, one might take such passages to convey that judgments to this effect “cannot be false” because introspective judgments are infallible. But note the continuation of the second passage: “Thus the only remaining thoughts where I must be on my guard against making a mistake are judgements.” This suggests that these passages can be read in a very different way. Accordingly, a mere seeming “cannot be false” because it is not the kind of mental state that could be false; on Descartes’ view, falsity arises not simply from the mind’s awareness of its ideas, but from judgments – i.e., from acts of will assenting to those items of awareness. Read in this way, these passages anticipate the Fourth Meditation theory of judgment:

Now all that the intellect does is to enable me to perceive the ideas which are subjects for possible judgements; and when regarded strictly in this light, it turns out to contain no error in the proper sense of that term. (AT 7:56, CSM 2:39)

Arguably, Descartes’ mind-better-known-than-body doctrine is intended as a comparative rather than a superlative thesis. We have seen that, for Descartes, the only superlative perceptual state is that of clarity and distinctness. This suggests that the only guarantee of truth in our introspective judgments is, like all other judgments, that they be based on clear and distinct perception: if I clearly and distinctly perceive myself to be in mental state x, then I am in x.

(For further discussion of related issues in Descartes, see Alanen 2003, Broughton 2008, Curley 2006, Jolley 2013, Kenny 1968, LoLordo 2005, McRae 1972, Newman 2023, Nolan & Whipple 2005, Vendler 1972, and Wilson 1978.)

Bibliography

Primary Sources

Abbreviations Used:

Rules = Rules for the Direction of our Native Intelligence
Discourse = Discourse on Method
Synopsis = Synopsis of the Meditations
Meditations = Meditations on First Philosophy
Med. = any one of the six Meditations
Objs./Replies = any of the seven sets of objections/replies that Descartes published along with the Meditations
Prin. = Principles of Philosophy
Passions = The Passions of the Soul
Search = The Search for Truth
AT = Oeuvres de Descartes, Adam, Charles, and Paul Tannery (eds.), 1904. Paris: J. Vrin. (References are to volume number and page.)
CSM = The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Cottingham, John, and Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch. (eds.) 1984. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

Dates in parentheses indicate a reference to Descartes’ correspondence. All quoted texts are from CSM. For full bibliographic information on Descartes’ writings, see the entry on Descartes.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Thanks to Robert Audi, Alan Nelson, Ram Neta, and Shaun Nichols, for helpful discussions about the ideas in this essay.

Copyright © 2023 by
Lex Newman <Lex.Newman@utah.edu>

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