Discrimination

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Anthony Sangiuliano replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Discrimination against, for example, women, racial or religious minorities, LGBTQ2S+ persons, children, the elderly, or persons with physical or mental disabilities is widely thought to be a serious moral wrong. It is also at the epicenter of some of the most explosive political and legal controversies of the past century. Yet philosophical reflection on this topic is of relatively recent vintage. Moreau wrote in 2010 that “few philosophers have written on the topic” (Moreau 2010, 124). In 2015, Lippert-Rasmussen described discrimination as “an intriguing but underexplored issue in ethics and political philosophy” (Lippert-Rasmussen, 2015). That year Eidelson also wrote that “[s]ince the idea of wrongful discrimination is expected to do so much normative work in our social and political lives, it is something of a philosophical embarrassment that so little has been done to explore or account for it” (Eidelson 2015).

Over the past decade, however, the philosophy of discrimination has matured considerably, to the extent that there have even emerged second-order methodological views on how to theorize about it. At the first-order level, it has become possible to speak of this field as having a general part and a special part. The former concerns core questions about what makes a thing “discriminatory” and views on what makes discrimination morally wrong. The latter concerns specific topics to which views on the former are applied or in whose contexts those views are tested and refined. Each of these issues will be discussed below.

• 1. Method
• 2. The Definition of “Discrimination”
  • 2.1 A Generic Definition: Disadvantage Because of a Trait
  • 2.2 Disadvantage
  • 2.3 Because of
  • 2.4 A Trait
  • 2.5 Is “Discrimination” a Moralized Concept?
• 3. What Makes Discrimination Morally Wrong?
  • 3.1 Harm
  • 3.2 Disrespect
  • 3.3 Social Meaning
  • 3.4 Pluralism
• 4. Indirect Discrimination
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Method

This entry focuses on the moral philosophy of discrimination as a branch of normative ethics or political theory. This area of philosophical inquiry is intertwined with legal scholarship since the concept of discrimination appears prominently in legal systems around the world. But it is distinct from the philosophy of antidiscrimination law, a branch of normative jurisprudence that aims to illuminate the justifications for legal practices of antidiscrimination or identify opportunities for law reform. The data against which a moral theory of discrimination is tested are ordinary moral intuitions about discrimination. The data against which a theory of antidiscrimination law is tested are legal norms. For example, Khaitan has developed an account of the purpose of antidiscrimination law that is meant to justify the law’s main features across commonwealth jurisdictions. Khaitan holds that the law’s overall systemic point is to reduce advantage gaps between social groups to enhance their members’ freedom and wellbeing. The law achieves this goal by imposing duties of non-discrimination on certain entities, such as the state and private persons, provided that these entities’ interests would not be thereby unduly burdened (Khaitan 2015).

The interaction between the moral philosophy of discrimination and the philosophy of antidiscrimination law is a matter for debate. It is sometimes claimed that our ordinary moral intuitions about the ethics of antidiscrimination have been heavily influenced by the law’s structure and historical development (Sangiuliano 2022, 1132–1133. See also Dinur 2022a). This claim might entail that theories of what discrimination is and what makes it wrong can both seek guidance from and, in turn, provide insight into the purposes of antidiscrimination law. On the other hand, it is sometimes claimed that there are significant divergences between “lay” and “legal” conceptions of discrimination (Khaitan 2015, 1–7. See also Shin 2013, 169–170). This claim might entail that the purpose of antidiscrimination law is not to reflect or mirror the lay morality of discrimination but to function as an instrument for preventing harm or pursuing other public policy goals. If so, the moral philosophy of discrimination has less relevance to the philosophy of antidiscrimination law (Sangiuliano 2023b). Hence it is helpful to maintain a distinction between the fields and for philosophers to clarify their assumptions about which field their writing is meant to contribute to.

Setting law aside, empirical methods of psychology and experimental philosophy may illuminate the data that a moral theory of discrimination is tested against. These methods have been employed to investigate folk concepts of “discrimination” and ordinary moral intuitions about the wrongness of discrimination (Albertson et al 2023; Lippert-Rasmussen et. al. 2024; Bruun Nørregaard 2026; Willemsen et. al. forthcoming).

2. The Definition of “Discrimination”

The general part of the moral philosophy of discrimination includes conceptual analysis of necessary and sufficient conditions for properly referring to a thing as “discriminatory.” Consider the following case:

Termination: A employs B, a woman, and out of dislike for women A fires B.

A definition of “discrimination” must explain what conditions obtain to make A’s action correctly described as “discriminatory” against B.

2.1 A Generic Definition: Disadvantage Because of a Trait

According to a generic definition, a thing is “discriminatory” against a victim if and only if it:

1. disadvantages the victim
2. because of
3. some trait that the victim possesses.

In a slogan, discrimination against a victim occurs when the fact that the victim has some specified property is held against them. In Termination, A holds B’s being a woman against her. More precisely, A’s act is discriminatory against B since it: (i) terminates B’s employment (ii) based on A’s dislike of women and (iii) B is a woman.

This generic definition supplies only a skeletal framework for defining “discrimination.” Philosophers disagree over how best to flesh out its components. Different elaborations carry different implications for normative evaluations of the wrongness of discrimination.

In Termination, the thing that is “discriminatory”—A’s firing of B—is an action. It may have been precipitated by a decision in A’s mind to fire B and consisted of, say, handing B a pink slip or uttering a speech act that effects B’s termination. This disambiguation reveals the variety of things besides actions that can be “discriminatory.” Suppose that A decided to fire B and intended to act upon it, but out of carelessness forgot to hand B a pink slip. It might be said that A had a discriminatory thought or character disposition (Hellman 2021; Beeghly 2025, 63–64). Furthermore, A might have reached a decision, not out of any dislike towards B particularly, but out of dislike for women generally such that he follows a policy, rule, or practice of always firing female employees. If so, A’s policy is discriminatory. That policy may be publicly expressed orally or in writing. This expression may enact a discriminatory policy (McGowan 2019, 168–180). But even expression that does not express a policy that A acts on, such as a sexist slur that A might utter towards B in the course of employment, could qualify as discriminatory.

2.2 Disadvantage

What kind of disadvantageous treatment of a victim contributes to making the treatment discriminatory?

Discrimination is commonly thought to involve some sort of comparison. Suppose that, in Termination, A always fires female but not male employees. A treats women worse interpersonally by comparison to men (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 16–17; Ishida 2021, 488). Suppose, however, that the workplace has only female employees. If A fires B because B is a woman, the firing still seems discriminatory. That may be because the relevant notion of disadvantage is intrapersonal and counterfactual rather than interpersonal (Gardner 2018, 57). A makes B worse off relative to a world where B is not a woman but a man. Still, interpersonal comparison is difficult to escape, since even on this view, where there are both male and female workers, if A fires B because B is a woman, but A never fires men, interpersonal comparison of how A treats women relative to men can still function as evidence of how A would have treated B if, counterfactually, B were a man (Berndt Rasmussen 2019, 880–881).

Suppose that after getting fired, B finds a job with better pay than her job working for A. It appears that A’s act was beneficial, yet still discriminatory. To make sense of this, we can distinguish between global and local disadvantage (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 61). B was disadvantaged locally in that an aspect of her wellbeing, having a job working for A, was set back, even if she was not disadvantaged globally, in that her overall wellbeing was increased a consequence of A’s act. On this view, the “disadvantage” component of discrimination refers to local disadvantage.

A’s act in Termination disadvantages B in the commercial sphere of employment. Other commercial spheres in which disadvantageous treatment may contribute to discrimination include housing or the provision of goods and services in market (Zwolinski 2006). However, a perpetrator may disadvantage a victim in a more intimate sphere (Liu 2015). A parent may disinvite a child from a family gathering because the child is gay. We might regard this disadvantage as part of what makes the disinvitation discriminatory. Similarly, we usually think of disadvantage as only occurring against the notionally weaker party within a commercial sphere, such as an employee or customer. But in principle a weaker party can disadvantage their notionally stronger counterparty. A customer may refuse to purchase goods from a storeowner of a certain religion. This disadvantage might contribute to the occurrence of discrimination against the counterparty (Blake 2006).

The “disadvantage” component demarcates disadvantageous discrimination against a victim from beneficial discrimination in favor of a beneficiary, which is sometimes called “positive” or “reverse” discrimination (Wodak forthcoming). However, it has been argued that it is not necessary to disadvantage a victim to discriminate against them. For example, it might be possible to entertain a discriminatory belief a person without ever acting on it (Horta 2015, 280–281). There are also cases of “paternalistic discrimination” against victims, where a perpetrator confers a benefit on a victim because of a trait without the victim’s consent. An example is banning women from working what is perceived as a dangerous job.

A possible rejoinder is that, appearances notwithstanding, there is some unnoticed form of disadvantage at play in putative cases of non-disadvantageous discrimination against a victim. Entertaining a discriminatory belief about a person disposes one to acting in a manner that is disadvantageous to the person, thereby imposing a risk of disadvantage on them that itself constitutes a disadvantage. Victims of paternalistic discrimination may not be globally disadvantaged, but they still suffer a local disadvantage in the form of a setback to an interest in maintaining authority over self-regarding matters (Statman 2021, 319–320; Flinch Midtgaard and Lyngby Pederson 2025, 240).

2.3 Because of

Since discrimination is holding a trait against a victim, it involves some link between trait and disadvantage. When is disadvantage “because of” a victim’s trait?

On a motivational approach, the requisite link obtains when a perpetrator harbors a mental state whose propositional content includes a representation that the victim possesses some specified property and, moreover, this content is among the perpetrator’s set of motivating reasons for disadvantaging the victim, a consideration the perpetrator counts in favor of the disadvantage. On this approach, Termination is an instance of discrimination since A’s representation of B as a woman is part of what motivated A to fire B.

Several observations are in order. First, for the representation ascribing a trait to the victim to form part of the perpetrator’s motivating reasons for disadvantaging the victim, it not necessary for it to constitute the only or dominant reason or for it to play any preset role in the perpetrator’s reasoning process. In Termination, if A’s motivation for firing B is that B is a woman of a certain age, and A reasons that woman of B’s age are likely to be absent from work after a pregnancy such that A’s dominant reason is to constantly maintain a fully staffed workforce, A still commits sex discrimination (Eidelson 2015, 21).

Second, a perpetrator’s belief about the ascriptive representation may be false. Thus, A commits sex discrimination against B by taking the belief that B is a woman as a reason for the termination even if B is in fact not a woman (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 20).

Third, it is possible for the representation and attendant belief to extend somewhat beyond the unmediated ascription of the trait to the victim and instead more mediately associate the trait with the victim. For instance, an employer commits racial discrimination by firing a white employee while motivated by a true belief that the employee is married to a Black person (Jonker 2019; Singh and Wodak 2024).

Fourth, the belief that undergirds a perpetrator’s motivating reason need only have descriptive content which represents that the victim has the relevant trait. It need not include evaluative content to the effect that, say, people with that trait are morally inferior or deserving of disadvantageous treatment. A’s dislike for women in Termination may coincide with a belief in women’s moral inferiority. That might make the firing morally wrong. But A would discriminate against B even if A believed that women have higher moral status than other people.

The motivational approach has difficulty accommodating cases of implicit bias. In these cases, a representation of the victim as having a given trait is not part of a perpetrator’s motivating reasons for disadvantaging the victim. Rather than consciously influencing cognitive processes, the representation functions by generating a reflex response in a manner that operates below one’s phenomenological awareness or control, never entering faculties of rational reflection, even if one explicitly disavows this response (Lippert-Rasmussen 2025, 49–50). Yet in Termination A seems to commit sex discrimination against B even if A has an implicit rather than explicit bias towards women.

It might be replied that, despite the peculiar cognitive features of implicit biases, representational ascriptions of traits can still tacitly function as motivating reasons (Eidelson 2015, 22). This reply classifies conscious and unconscious discrimination as essentially the same type of act, namely, disadvantaging a victim for the motivating reason that the victim has some trait. That might offend the intuition that they attract distinct moral appraisals. For example, perpetrators seem to be more morally responsible for conscious than unconscious discrimination (Berndt Rasmussen 2020, 733).

Another way to handle unconscious discrimination is to adopt an explanatory view, which holds that a perpetrator disadvantages a victim “because of” a trait, not when possession of the trait is among their motivating reasons, but when the victim’s having the trait causally explains why the victim was disadvantaged by the perpetrator (Shin 2010, 86–88). This view shifts emphasis from mental states to how certain facts about the mind-independent world causally explain other facts. In Termination, the fact that B is a woman causally explains the fact that A disadvantaged her. This explanation just so happens to run through A’s mental representations about B. And it could do so even if it is A’s subconscious representation about B that causally explains why B was disadvantaged by A.

A standard way of tracing a causal relationship between a victim’s trait and disadvantage they experience is by applying a “but for” test of counterfactual dependence. This test instructs us inspect a nearby possible world, where everything is the same as in the actual world except that the victim lacks the trait in question, and ask whether the victim would not have been disadvantaged in that world. But for B’s being a woman in Termination, would B have been terminated? If not, then B’s womanhood explains the termination, and the termination was because of B’s womanhood.

However, this approach encounters familiar difficulties that confront counterfactual accounts of causation generally, including, for example, problems of overdetermination. If A fires B because B is a woman, but B would have been fired anyway by a higher manager because B divulged trade secrets to a competitor, and each of these facts suffices for the termination, it is not the case that but for B’s womanhood she would not have been fired. Yet A still intuitively commits sex discrimination against B.

Hu presents a challenge of potential circularity for the counterfactual dependence approach (Hu 2025). The “but for” test requires us to conceive of a counterfactual while holding constant everything about the victim except the trait because of which she is allegedly discriminated against. However, we must choose whether to hold constant factors that are closely related to the trait in question. Suppose that Termination is a case of workplace sexual harassment, where A fires B because B rejects A’s sexual advances. Under the but for test, whether the termination counterfactually depends on B’s sex depends on whether B would not have been fired had she not been female. But we must also choose whether to hold constant A’s sexual orientation. If we conceive of a world where B is male, but A is still sexually attracted to B, presumably B would still have been terminated for resisting A’s sexual advances, and the termination would not counterfactually depend on B’s sex. Conversely, if in the counterfactual world B is male and there is no termination since A is not sexually attracted to B and never makes sexual advances, only then does the termination come out as having been causally explained by B’s sex. The difficulty is that whether we should hold the sex-related factor of A’s sexual orientation constant depends on whether being disadvantaged because of another’s sexual attraction towards you amounts to being disadvantaged because of your sex. But the explanatory approach cannot beg the latter question, since it is supposed to offer an account when whether B’s termination is because of her sex.

Moreover, if disadvantage is because of a victim’s possession of a trait when the trait causally explains the disadvantage, we might be forced to admit, counterintuitively, that the disadvantage is also causally explained by whatever causally explains the victim’s possession of the trait (Eidelson 2015, 19). Suppose that a landlord refuses to rent an apartment to a prospective tenant out of dislike for the tenant’s religion. Since the tenant’s faith explains the disadvantage, the explanatory account predicts that the landlord perpetrates religious discrimination. But suppose further that the tenant came by their faith from being taught it by their parents, who taught their children about that faith after their own parents taught them about it. It now appears that the tenant’s parents’ and grandparents’ teachings causally explain the possession of their faith. But it would seem strange to describe the landlord’s discriminatory refusal to rent as because of these teachings.

Whether we endorse the explanatory approach has important implications for whether the generic definition of discrimination captures cases of indirect discrimination or only cases of direct discrimination. The issue of indirect discrimination is addressed in depth later in this entry. Briefly, indirect discrimination occurs when a perpetrator lacks a mental representation that the victim has some trait but performs an action that has the effect of disadvantaging people who have that trait worse than people who do not. An example is an employer who, without ever representing the race of job applicants, follows a rule of hiring only applicants with a high school diploma under conditions where fewer Black people than white people have completed high school. If the “because” component is construed in terms of motivating reasons, the definition does not capture indirect discrimination, whose perpetrators lack the sort of representation capable of grounding a motivating reason to disadvantage a victim. But if “because” is construed in the causal-explanatory sense, the definition can capture indirect discrimination. A victim’s possession of a trait causally explains why they are disadvantaged by an act that disadvantages a group defined by that trait worse than a group that is not so defined.

2.4 A Trait

We ordinarily think of discrimination as occurring when disadvantage is because of a paradigm trait like a victim’s race, sex, age, religion, sexual orientation, disability, and so on. But if disadvantage is because of any trait at all, without restriction to paradigm traits, does it still count as discrimination?

On an unrestricted view, discrimination can occur if any trait whatsoever is held against a victim, however random or idiosyncratic. We can, on this view, speak of discrimination against people “from Omaha who did well at sports in high school and live in a county the name of which contains at least one ‘s’” (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 30); people “born in pink hospitals as opposed to hospitals painted some other color” (Arneson 2006, 794); or people with less than two syllables in their first name or an even numerical sum of numbers in their year of birth (Thomsen 2013, 124).

To defend this view, one may combine two thoughts: (i) disadvantage because of a trait is “discriminatory” whenever the trait is irrelevant, irrational, or arbitrary relative to some goal that the perpetrator aims at when disadvantaging the victim, and (ii) depending on the context, any trait whatsoever can be arbitrary in this sense (Halldenius 2005, 457; Pinto 2021). Suppose that a restauranteur’s goal is to earn profit and that to achieve this goal it is rational to accept all customers with an ability to pay. A customer’s race is irrelevant relative to this goal. But their astrological sign, say, seems just as irrelevant. If the restauranteur refuses service because the customer is a Scorpio, this counts as “discriminatory” according to the unrestricted view.

However, there are acts involving disadvantage because of a contextually irrelevant trait that are not best characterized as “discriminatory.” An example is nepotism, when an employer refuses to hire a person who is not a blood relative. Not being a blood relative is arbitrary relative to the goal of hiring qualified persons for the job. But disadvantage because of this trait is distinct from discrimination (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 23). Also consider an employer who decides which job applicant to hire by flipping a coin. It is arbitrary how the coin lands for a given applicant. But again, disadvantage because of this trait is distinct from discrimination (Arneson 2006, 784). Conversely, an act might disadvantage a victim because of a trait that is rational relative to the perpetrator’s goals but still be “discriminatory.” A restauranteur, aiming to profit, may realize that he would lose customers if he hired employees of a certain race, given his customers’ racist preferences. Then race becomes relevant to the restauranteur’s goals, but it still seems discriminatory to refuse to hire a person because of race (Wisniewska 2024).

Rather than defending the unrestricted view by tying a trait’s irrelevance to some contextual goal of a putative perpetrator of discrimination, one could narrow this view by claiming that a trait grounds discrimination just in case it is inherently or universally arbitrary, no matter the context. One view is that a trait is inherently arbitrary if it is immutable, in that a person cannot be held responsible for having voluntarily acquired it or cannot voluntarily choose not to have it. Certainly, paradigm traits, such as race or age, are immutable, so disadvantage because of them is discriminatory on the present view. However, it seems possible for disadvantage because of traits that are typically subject to our control or choice, such as our religious beliefs or marital status, to be “discriminatory” (Thomsen 2013, 133–134, 136).

Some views of traits narrow the unrestricted view by invoking, not inherent features of traits or contextual facts about someone’s goals, but the surrounding social context. One such view holds that a trait must be socially salient (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 30). A trait is socially salient if people iteratively interact with each other in a manner that is influenced by possession of the trait as part of a widespread pattern through many different spheres of social life. The paradigm traits of race, sex, or religion have long shaped a wide range of social interactions, including in employment, the market, university admissions, policing, immigration, and candidacy for political offices. But one’s eye or hair color, astrological sign, or other random traits have not. If the latter govern interpersonal interactions, they do so only occasionally and idiosyncratically, without constituting part of broader patterns, and only within the confines of specific types of interactions without spilling over to into other types.

A different view of traits that also invokes the surrounding social context is a group disadvantage view. On this view, discrimination is restricted to traits that characterize social groups who are subject to historical disadvantage, who are among the worst off in social patterns of inequality, or whose members have been frequent victims of past discrimination. This view entails that disadvantage because of a trait like a person’s eye color that does not define a disadvantaged group is not discriminatory.

While they both invoke social context, the social salience and group disadvantage views differ in at least one an important way. A trait could be socially salient if it frequently constitutes grounds for disadvantaging people who possess it across an array of social interactions. This tendency can correlate with those people’s being badly off. However, a socially salient trait can also frequently ground widespread beneficial treatment towards people who possess it across many social contexts. If so, those people may constitute an advantaged group. Nevertheless, we can still imagine “discrimination” against members of this group, that is, disadvantage because of the preferred group’s defining socially salient trait. Therefore, a social salience view of traits is symmetrical, encompassing advantaged and disadvantaged groups. By contrast, a group disadvantage view is asymmetrical, encompassing only disadvantaged groups.

In fact, of all the views of traits canvassed above, only the group disadvantage view is asymmetrical. Whether this is a flaw for the latter depends on the plausibility of symmetry. It has been argued that it is indeed possible to discriminate against a person by disadvantaging them because they possess a trait that defines an advantaged group (Sommer Degn 2025; Laborde 2026, 8–12). Yet when we think about the paradigm traits because of which discrimination can be committed (sex, race, sexual orientation), there is a powerful intuition that what we are really thinking about are the disadvantaged social groups that form a subset of people with these traits (women, Black people, the LGBTQ2S+ community). Proponents of the group disadvantage view must either reject symmetry or explain why symmetry is compatible with maintaining that “discrimination” only occurs because of traits that define disadvantaged groups.

There are other problems for the group disadvantage view. First, it may be overinclusive. Low intelligence correlates with socioeconomic deprivation, but it seems counterintuitive to label disadvantage because of one’s intelligence, in university admissions say, as “discriminatory.” Second, the view derives plausibility from how discrimination against marginalized groups is usually more objectionable than idiosyncratic discrimination that is isolated from broader patterns of inequality. But is has been argued that there are objectionable cases of latter too (Thomsen 2013, 140).

2.5 Is “Discrimination” a Moralized Concept?

Under the generic definition, “discrimination” is not a moralized concept. A thing is not pro tanto morally wrong simply in virtue of satisfying it. We can intelligibly speak of pro tanto permissible discrimination.

The morally neutral skeletal baseline established by the definition provides a framework for subsequent inquiries into what makes discrimination wrongful. For example, it might be thought that wrongful discrimination only involves disadvantage within commercial spheres like employment (but not intimate spheres like dating), or disadvantage because of the perpetrator’s motivating reason that a victim has some trait (in which case indirect discrimination is not wrongful), or disadvantage because of certain traits, such traits that define badly off groups (not well off groups).

However, sometimes linguistic norms surrounding “discrimination” appear to treat this word as morally loaded. While the classification of something as “discriminatory” may not definitionally entail opprobrium, the way we use the term suggests that often the classification at least has a priming effect; it amounts to an allegation or presumption of wrongdoing (Malnes 2015, 246). The non-moralized generic definition allows us to sort out when calling something “discriminatory” has this priming effect. For example, the label might raise a suspicion of wrongdoing only when applied to acts that disadvantage victims in commercial spheres, or based on suspect motivating reasons, or because of traits that characterize marginalized groups.

To capture the priming effect, Lippert-Rasmussen advances a quasi-moralized definition of “discrimination,” with built in features designed to achieve the result that, although something satisfying it is not by definition morally wrongful, satisfaction “is a good, but fallible, indicator of moral wrongness” (Lippert-Rasmussen 2014, 29). On this definition, an act is discriminatory if and only if, in addition to satisfying the three components of the generic definition, the action constitutes part of a widespread pattern of such acts, and this fact makes the act harmful or disrespectful (28). This definition is naturally allied with a social salience view of traits, which repeatedly shape patterns of social interactions across many contexts. The result is a definition that, if something satisfies it, the thing is thought to be presumptively wrongful given how the definition’s built-in components load the dice in favor the thing being wrongful.

A different approach is to strictly separate the generic definition from inquiries into when things that satisfy it are morally wrong. Eidelson claims that conflating these matters invites confusion (Eidelson 2015, 30). For instance, the exercise of narrowing the definition of “discrimination” to exclude acts that we hesitate to label as discriminatory, given that they are typically regarded as morally permissible, might unwittingly smuggle in moral considerations without subjecting them to exacting scrutiny or comparing them to alternatives. For example, this concern might vex efforts to delineate what traits can ground discrimination. Many of the views of traits on offer derive plausibility from a promise to restrict the definition of “discrimination” to acts that we find intuitively wrongful, ruling out cases of disadvantage because of certain traits based on the notion that wrongdoing is not present in them. But adverting to these views potentially allows normative considerations to bleed into a definition of discrimination in a manner that eludes critique. Rigorous evaluation of these considerations might be best served by keeping moral inquiry separate from the exercise of defining “discrimination.”

3. What Makes Discrimination Morally Wrong?

The general part of the moral philosophy of discrimination also comprises views about what makes discrimination morally wrong. Here too, second-order questions may be raised. First, is there a unique wrong-making feature of discrimination? Or does assessing whether discrimination is wrong simply require us to apply universal moral theories which also pertain to a wider range of conduct? (Segev 2021; Moreau 2022, 159–162). Second, is discrimination an individual wrong against its specific victim or does it also wrong all members of the social group to which the victim belongs? (Hellman 2008, 32–33; Moreau 2022, 178–180). Third, does the wrongness of discrimination consist in a violation of a moral right of the victim? (Vallentyne 2018). Fourth, is there one wrong-making feature of discrimination or many?

3.1 Harm

Discrimination often sets back is victims’ wellbeing. A harm-based view maintains that discrimination is made pro tanto wrong by the harm it causes.

This view can be elaborated in several possible directions that reflect different possible accounts of the concepts of wellbeing, harm, and causation in the broader moral philosophy literature (Slavny and Parr 2015, 102–104; Arneson 2018, 151–156; Ishida 2021, 492–494). It may or may not be derived from a broader view that a necessary feature of all moral wrongdoing is harmdoing. While it is compatible with a broader act consequentialist view according to which an act is all things considered impermissible when its harmful effects on wellbeing outweigh its beneficial effects on wellbeing, it is also compatible with a non-consequentialist view according to which discrimination violates some duty against harmdoing, or a right of the victim to not be harmed in the relevant sense, that constrains the maximization of aggregate wellbeing.

A question that surfaces in the literature particular to the moral philosophy of discrimination is whether the pro tanto wrong-making harm of discrimination is a local or global harm to a victim (Slavny and Parr 2015, 106). Discrimination against a person is disadvantaging the person because of a trait they have. It might be said that the very disadvantage that discrimination necessarily incorporates is a local harm that sets back an aspect of the victim’s wellbeing, regardless of how we compare the victim’s global or overall wellbeing before and after discrimination, and this local harm is what makes discrimination pro tanto wrong. In Termination, where A fires B because B is a woman, the loss of employment is, it might be thought, a local harm that makes the termination pro tanto wrong.

By equating the pro tanto wrong-making feature of discrimination with a component of the definition of “discrimination”—equating local harm with disadvantage—this approach seems to imply that every instance of discrimination is pro tanto wrong-by-definition. This may be a flaw. To avoid the flaw, one may follow Ishida and claim that only global harm to a victim makes discrimination wrong (Ishida 2021, 489–492). Alternatively, one may appeal to the fact that discrimination involves many different possible kinds of local harm. Only certain of these harms are pro tanto wrong-making features. For example, in Termination, B is locally harmed by losing her job, but she may also suffer an additional local harm in the form of psychological or emotional distress, humiliation, or embarrassment about how her sex was held against her in employment. This local harm may be distinct from the concept of disadvantage incorporated in the definition of “discrimination”, and it may be what makes A’s act pro tanto wrong.

The wrong-making harm of discrimination might be regarded as even further downstream in terms of effects on patterns of social inequality or relative group disadvantage (Eidelson 2021, 256–259). In Termination, A’s discrimination seems to sustain the social marginalization of women, not just visit harm on B individually. As Lippert-Rasmussen and Arneson argue, this gives the harm-based view a prioritarian orientation. It reflects a concern for not undeservedly harming those who are already badly off under unequal distributive patterns (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 166). Furthermore, on this approach, the harm of discrimination is cumulative. It materializes and is perpetuated through many discriminatory acts committed across society over time that each make small contributions to relative group disadvantage but that result in this harmful state of affairs in the aggregate (158–170). Thus construed, the harm-based view can explain the intuition that disadvantage because of traits that define groups who are worst off under unequal distributions is morally worse than discrimination against advantaged groups. This is more likely to contribute to a harmful social state of affairs. This view thus seemingly entails that wrongful discrimination cannot be committed symmetrically against advantaged groups.

By locating the wrong-making harm of discrimination in perpetrators’ contribution to unjust social patterns, the view that discrimination flouts prioritarian regard by causing cumulative harm to the worst off confronts a problem of explaining how perpetrators can be morally responsible for wrongful discrimination. A perpetrator’s refraining from discrimination would seem to make no difference to whether the cumulative harms arise if the perpetrator’s contribution to patterns of disadvantage is infinitesimally small and hence inconsequential. As well, the view in question controversially presupposes that individual people can bear responsibility for unjust social patterns. But principles of justice might only regulate society’s major economic and political institutions, not the behavior of individual citizens, and responsibility for ameliorating social inequality might fall primarily on the state rather than individual citizens.

Another problem for the harm-based view is the apparent possibility of wrongful yet harmless discrimination (Slavny and Parr 2015; Berndt Rasmussen 2019, 882–884; Sangiuliano 2022). Consider a variant on Termination:

Harmless Termination: After getting fired, B finds a job with better pay than her job working for A. A convincingly represents that his motive for firing B was B’s subpar performance, and his sexist motivations never become known by anyone, so B is not psychologically harmed, and A’s act makes no contribution to the group disadvantage of women.

It still seems that B’s act is made wrong. This can only be explained by a factor other than harm.

There are various possible replies to this problem. First, if A’s act in Harmless Termination is truly harmless, one may deny that it is morally impermissible. One may seek instead to vindicate the intuition that something is morally amiss in this case by holding that A displays a morally reprehensible character (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 130).

Second, while A’s discriminatory act appears to be made wrong by his bad motivations rather than any setback to B’s wellbeing, Berndt Rasmussen argues that we can redescribe the fact of being the object of a bad motivation or negative attitude as a “non-welfarist” type of harm (Berndt Rasmussen 2019, 888). But it is not clear whether there is a viable non-welfarist category of harm. If not, this reply seems ad hoc (Slavny and Parr 2015, 108–109).

Third, one could claim that A’s act is made wrong by a local harm to B—her losing her job—even if B is not globally harmed. This reply perhaps unattractively entails that A’s discriminatory act against B is pro tanto wrong-by-definition, since to satisfy the definition of “discrimination” it must involve disadvantage against B in the form of B’s lost employment.

Fourth, Ishida claims that although A’s act is not globally harmful to B, it sets back a particular aspect of B’s wellbeing by frustrating a reasonable preference of hers to not be discriminated against (Ishida 2021, 494–495). The heavy lifting of this reply may seem to be done by the objective reasonableness of a subjective preference to not be discriminated against. On pain of circularity, an account of when such a preference is reasonable cannot appeal to the harmfulness of being discriminated against. If it appeals to a factor other than harm, it would be that factor, not harm, that explains the wrongness of discrimination.

Fifth, a harm-based view of wrongful discrimination could take a rule consequentialist shape. Discrimination may be wrong, not in virtue of the harmfulness of discrete discriminatory acts, but by contravening a social rule prohibiting discrimination that we ought to inculcate since consistent adherence to this rule is more likely than non-adherence to reduce harm overall (Arneson 2013, 110–111). A’s act in Harmless Termination might be thought to contravene a rule that proscribes discrimination even in cases where it is harmless. Such a rule may be justified by the fact that, despite its overbreadth, discrimination is usually harmful. So, following it in all cases is more likely to reduce harm overall than when people are left to their own devices to deliberate on a case-by-case basis whether a discriminatory act is permissible given that it appears to be harmless.

3.2 Disrespect

Harmless Termination suggests that a factor other than harm can make discrimination wrong, such as A’s morally objectionable sexist attitude towards B. It supports the view that discrimination is made pro tanto wrong, not by harm, but by the disrespect a perpetrator shows towards a victim or a victim’s group (Slavny and Parr 2015, 112–113).

Alexander initially argued that discrimination is wrongfully disrespectful, independently of its harmful effects, if its perpetrator holds and acts on a mental state consisting of false belief or judgment that the victim, or any member of the victim’s group, has inferior moral worth or moral status (Alexander 1992, 158–159. See also Cavanagh 2002, 166; Arneson 2006, 779). Harmless Termination provides an example. A might believe that women have inferior moral status than they really do have, in an absolute sense, or less moral status compared to men.

However, sometimes acts based on a false belief about moral status are not more disrespectful than acts based on true beliefs about moral status. Suppose that non-human animals and humans have equal moral status. Now compare two cases (Lippert-Rasmussen 2006, 183):

Inegalitarian Experimenter: X holds a false belief that animals have lower moral status than humans and performs painful experiments on animals.

Egalitarian Experimenter: X holds a true belief that animals and humans have equal moral status and performs painful experiments on animals.

Intuitively, the Inegalitarian Experimenter is not more disrespectful towards animals than the Egalitarian Experimenter. Hence, the truth or falsity of X’s belief in the inferior moral status of animals makes no difference to the disrespectfulness of animal experimentation. Similarly, the falsity of A’s belief in women’s status in Harmless Discrimination cannot explain why A’s discriminatory act would be more wrongful, by being disrespectful, than where A fires B despite holding a true belief in women’s status.

A view developed by Eidelson holds that disrespect does not emerge primarily from an agent’s acting on false beliefs about or active animus or hostility towards a person’s moral status. It emerges more basically from how the practical deliberations precipitating an agent’s conduct fail to properly recognize a person’s moral status (Eidelson 2015, 76–80). On this view, recognizing a person’s status involves appropriately integrating the fact of their status into one’s deliberations affecting them and acting on reasons that are given by that status. To respect a person’s status as a moral equal accordingly requires making efforts to ascertain what their interests are, taking the fulfillment or non-fulfillment of their interests as a reason for or against an action, treating their interests as having presumptively equal moral weight or value compared to the interests of others, and not discounting their interests by showing partiality for others’ without justification (96–101). This view implies that the Inegalitarian and Egalitarian Experimenters both disrespect non-human animals. Regardless of the content of their beliefs, in their deliberations they both fail to give animals’ interests equal weight compared to the interests of humans (103). Similarly, in Harmless Discrimination, A’s discriminatory act is disrespectful, not in virtue of a false judgment that women to have inferior moral status, but in virtue of A failing to give equal weight to B’s interests. A takes B’s sex as a reason to discount her interests when B’s sex in fact gives no such reason (Eidelson 2015, 98; Gardner 2018, 64–65).

The deliberative view of disrespect may still be vulnerable to the Inegalitarian/Egalitarian Experimenter counterexample (Lippert-Rasmussen 2018, 326–329; Thomsen 2023, 435–436). A separate problem, however, is the intuition some may have that, even if in both cases X acts disrespectfully, the Egalitarian Experimenter’s act is somehow worse than the Inegalitarian Experimenter’s. That is, discounting a person’s interests despite accepting their equal moral status is worse than acting on the false belief that a disparity of status justifies discounting their interests. Eidelson seeks to accommodate this intuition by holding that disrespect, construed in terms of a failure to recognize a person’s moral status, can come in differing degrees. We can explain why Egalitarian Experimenter is worse than Inegalitarian Experimenter by positing that, there, X displays “contempt” for the equal moral status, painfully experimenting on animals in active repudiation or defiance of the truth that non-humans are equals which X at some level accepts. Suppose that in Inegalitarian Experimenter X came by his false belief in the lesser moral worth of animals in a good faith, epistemically responsible fashion. If so, X’s act does not involve contempt, which is why it seems not as wrong as in Egalitarian Experimenter (Eidelson 2015, 106–107). The upshot is that when it appears that, in Harmless Termination, A’s act is made wrong by a misestimation of women’s moral worth, it is not A’s acting on this misestimate as such that makes the act wrong. Rather, our sense of wrongdoing here can be explained by either how A came by this belief culpably or in bad faith, or what is worse, A really does hold a belief in the moral equality of women but contemptuously disavows it. Either way, A is led to discount A’s interests because of her sex. That common disrespectful deliberative failure remains the central wrong-making feature of A’s act.

Disrespect views locate the wrongfulness of discrimination in some internal mental state of a perpetrator, whether it is a mistaken belief or failure of deliberation. These views therefore presuppose that an agent’s reasons, motives, beliefs, or other mental states are relevant to determining whether acts flowing from these states are morally permissible. In other words, wrongfully disrespectful discrimination is a “thickly described” complex of external-act-plus-objectionable-internal-mental-state (Arneson 2006, 781). But moral philosophers, Scanlon most prominently in recent years, have argued that an act’s permissibility is determined only by an act’s external consequences, or simply by features of an act “thinly described,” with a perpetrator’s internal states omitted (Scanlon 2008; Arneson 2006, 782). On this view, it is possible to do a permissible act for the wrong reasons, such as rescuing a person from drowning out of hope for reward rather than concern for the person’s wellbeing. The reasons for which an act is done are relevant not to determining an act’s permissibility but to the blameworthiness of praiseworthiness of the agent who does an act.

This account of permissibility presents a choice-point. One option, taken by Alexander, is to accept the account wholesale and maintain that it wholly undermines the disrespect view of wrongful discrimination (Alexander 2015, 873). Under this option, A’s act in Harmless Discrimination, thinly described, is not impermissible, since its bad external effects on B are neutral, although A’s sexist attitude moves us to denounce A’s character (Thomsen 2023, 441). Another option is to hold, as Scanlon himself argues, that cases of wrongful discrimination constitute exceptions to the principle that internal mental states are irrelevant to permissibility determinations (Scanlon 2008, 69–71; Eidelson 2015, 82–84). For example, employers have wide discretion to fire employees, but it intuitively appears that if an employer’s reason for a termination is that the erstwhile employee is a woman, as in Harmless Termination, rather than defensible business reasons, this turns what would otherwise be a permissible discretionary termination into an impermissible discriminatory one. Disrespect views seem able to explain how wrongful discrimination is exceptional because it is only in virtue of a thick description of such acts that incorporates a perpetrator’s reasons that we can understand why an otherwise permissible thinly described act becomes impermissible. A recent attempt by Cullity and Wodak to develop a disrespect view that takes this second option holds that, while the manifestation of objectionable internal attitudes does not generally make permissible acts wrongful, their manifestation through discrimination against members of marginalized groups is wrongful by being partially constitutive of unjust social conditions involving the subordinate social and moral standing of these groups (Cullity and Wodak, 2025).

3.3 Social Meaning

According to expressivist views, discrimination is wrong when disadvantaging a person because of a specified trait, within a specified sphere of life, can be reasonably interpreted as expressing an objectionable social message. Such conduct may carry a morally objectionable conventional social meaning acquired from a history of injustices experienced by the group that the trait defines within the sphere in question.

For example, since, in the past, sexists have used a person’s sex to disrespect women’s equal moral status in employment, A’s use of sex in Termination to guide decision-making about B’s employment in the present can be interpreted as conventionally expressing a demeaning social message about women that signifies disrespect for their status as moral equals. By contrast, had A fired B because of a random trait such as the number of syllables in B’s last name, this would not be demeaning. This trait does not define a marginalized group in the workforce. It lacks the expressive social meaning of sex.

On Hellman’s expressivist view, a demeaning message can be conveyed by a discriminatory act only if the perpetrator occupies a position of social power over the victim. A’s act in Termination expressively demeans B in part because, as A’s employer, A wields economic and social power over B. That power imbalance renders an employee unable to expressively demean their employer through discrimination (Hellman 2008, 35–38). A problem for this view is that it may be possible for a person to demean someone in a situation where the two have the same level of power. For example, a male student in a class can demean a female student in the same class by excluding her from a study group because of her sex (Moreau 2020, 47).

Views that identify disrespect for equal moral status as the wrong-making feature of discrimination link disrespect to an internal mental state of a perpetrator of discrimination, like a mistaken belief about the victim’s status or a more general failure to deliberate with due sensitivity to reasons given by the victim’s moral status. Harm-based views hold that discrimination is made wrong by some setback to victims’ wellbeing. But for expressivist views, whether discrimination has an objectionable social meaning is irreducible to either perpetrators’ mental states or external harm to victims. It is a public or objective fact about how an act’s meaning is best interpreted in the light of surrounding social conventions. This is not discerned by probing for a particular private or subjective state of mind of the perpetrator, such as an intent to manifest disrespect, or by examining the perpetrator’s internal deliberations (Anderson and Pildes 2000, 1512–1513; Sangiovanni 2017, 123–125). Expressive disrespectfulness also does not derive from the effects on the victim of being the object of expressive disrespect, such as making it more likely that the victim will be denied certain goods or opportunities or the negative psychological feeling of being socially stigmatized (Hellman 2008, 26–27). Discrimination can express a demeaning message even if these effects do not obtain.

However, a problem for expressivist views is that the wrong-making feature of discrimination that they fix on—a conventionally demeaning or disrespectful social meaning—may lack independent moral significance. (Eidelson 2015, 88). Whether a person’s behavior violates operative social conventions pertaining to respect seems to derive its moral significance either from how the violation can harm victims of conventional disrespect, psychologically or by contributing to deprivations of opportunities, or how the person knows or ought to know of these harms and fails to take them as reasons for compliance with the operative conventions, that is, the nature of the person’s internal deliberations. The conventional violation on its own seems to lack freestanding, non-derivative moral import. Consider a case of a tourist inadvertently uttering a disrespectful slur out of ignorance of foreign social conventions about what particular words express disrespect. If the slur is not harmful, and the tourist had no culpable mental state, it is unclear that the words’ mere contextual conventional meaning is still sufficient to make uttering them wrong. If it is harmful, or the tourist had a culpable mentality, these would make it wrong to express the slur’s conventional meaning. But then the expressivist view devolves into either a harm-based or disrespect view.

It may be uncharitable to portray expressivist views as assigning independent moral significance to the conventional social meanings of discrimination. Rather, on these views, perhaps observers ascertain the social meanings that discrimination expresses through an evaluative interpretation of what attitude can be reasonably or objectively attributed or imputed to perpetrators of discriminatory acts, given the surrounding context (Shin 2009, 166; Sangiovanni 2017, 123–125). An attributed or imputed attitude of a perpetrator might be seen as a normative construct that differs from a subjective mental state one might descriptively discover in a perpetrator, for example through a psychological inquiry. It also presumably differs from the conventional public meaning of the perpetrator’s behavior, which can be ascertained through purely descriptive or empirical sociological inquiry into operative conventions.

Sangiovanni maintains that disrespectful conventional social meanings expressed by discrimination do not always derive moral significance from the harm they cause because they can cause unique harms that, to the contrary, derive their significance from this expressive fact. Thus, in Harmless Termination, A’s act of terminating B because of B’s sex might be made wrong, not by broad downstream deprivations of opportunities for women as a group, but by how, in virtue of the conventionally demeaning nature of sex-based decision-making, the act alters the immediate “relational nexus” between A and B (Sangiovanni 2017, 121). B’s having her sex held against her deprives her of an interest in “social recognition,” that is, in having her sense of self and her identity as a woman positively acknowledged as valuable through relational dialogue and interaction with A. A’s weaponization of the conventional stigmatization of womanhood to disadvantage B frustrates B’s ability to invest herself with value and affirmatively identify with her own self-presentation in the social world. This constitutes a unique “expressive harm” (131).

3.4 Pluralism

“Pluralist” views hold that there is more than one wrong-making feature of discrimination (Blum 2013; Segev 2014; Munch and Steglich-Petersen, 2025). “Monist” views hold that there is only one such feature.

Disrespect or expressivist views can be pluralist since they need not deny that discrimination is sometimes made wrong by harm (Alexander 1992, 153; Eidelson 2015, 9). They simply add there are other wrong-making features, drawing support from harmless yet wrongful discriminatory acts. For a harm-based view to be monist, harmless discrimination must be either not morally impermissible or made impermissible by some unnoticed form of harm. This view can remain monist by being committed to only one genus of wrong-making feature of discrimination, namely harm, while recognizing plural species of harms of discrimination (Lippert-Rasmussen 2021, 580–581).

According to a recent pluralist view developed by Moreau, discrimination wrongs its victims when it fails to treat them as the equals of others. But there are plural ways that discrimination can amount to treatment as an unequal. Each is individually sufficient, but not necessary, to wrong the victim (Moreau 2020).

First, discrimination can sustain or exacerbate the “social subordination” of the group to which the victim belongs. “Social subordination” is a state of affairs in which one socially salient group has a standing in society as a whole that is lower than that of another, dominant group (50). Members of the subordinated group have less political power and authority than members of other groups, and less epistemic power, as their complaints are not listened to or taken seriously by others (51–53). Subordinated groups are also objects of censure, condemnation, and ostracism, rather than being recipients of consideration and deference like dominant groups are, and these censorial attitudes are associated with stereotypes of their members as having negative qualities and dispositions (53–54). Lastly, these differences in power and consideration are rationalized by “structural accommodations.” These are social structures, patterns, and practices that, while seemingly neutral, normalize and accommodate the needs and circumstances of dominant groups while rendering those of subordinate groups abnormal, deviant, or invisible (56–61). An example of a structural accommodation is the practice of segregating public washrooms by gender, which accommodates binary gender norms and constructs persons who do not fit these norms as divergent while rendering them invisible (58).

Second, discrimination can violate the victim’s right to “deliberative freedom.” “Deliberative freedom” is the freedom to make autonomous decisions in one’s life—where to live and work, who to associate with, how to present oneself in public, and so on—without having to regard a certain trait one has as a cost that is always looming before one’s eyes (84–85). A person has a right to deliberative freedom when denying it fails to respect the person’s capacity for autonomy (89–90). This in turn is more likely to occur when the denial reflects others’ assumptions about them, rather their own choices. A person lacks a right to deliberative freedom if the unburdened exercise of their freedom unduly sets back others’ interests (90–92).

Third, discrimination can deny victims access to a “basic goods.” A “basic good” is a good or opportunity a person’s access to which is necessary for the person to be and to be seen as a full and equal participant in their society (126).

Moreau’s pluralist view captures the complex reality of discrimination and the diverse ways that victims report their experience of being morally wronged by not being treated as an equal. Some forms of unequal treatment under the view may apply in a particular case, rather than others, or they all may apply (174). The view also illuminates persistent disagreements over whether discrimination is an individual or group wrong, and whether it involves interpersonal comparison, since it enables us to disentangle how wrongful discrimination can have seemingly incompatible qualities. The forms of unequal treatment have differing implications for the disagreements, and we might be able to dissolve the disagreements by figuring out which forms are or are not in play in a particular case (175–181).

Each facet of Moreau’s view is liable to critique, however, including its overall claim that wrongful discrimination is fundamentally about failing to treat victims as equals, its accounts of ways that discrimination can fail to treat a victim as an equal, and how to resolve conflicts between these accounts. One may specifically question the extent to which it is genuinely pluralistic. Firstly, the view seeks to unify the forms of unequal treatment, rather than leaving them as a potentially unconnected list of discrimination’s wrong-making features, by depicting them as different “conceptions” of the “concept” of failing to treat others as moral equals (158–159). It has been argued that this unifying strategy is unsuccessful (Smith 2024). But even if it succeeds, it might make the view monist rather than pluralist. It appeals to only one genus of wrong-making feature of discrimination—unequal treatment—while appealing to plural species of unequal treatment to render this feature more determinate. The question then becomes whether the view is at bottom a disrespect view, maintaining that what makes discrimination wrong is the disrespect it shows for its victims’ moral status as an equal. If so, its pluralism may reside in how proponents of disrespect views can admit that harm is also a wrong-making feature of discrimination.

Secondly, the three ways of failing to treat others as equals under the view may not be distinctive. Moreau argues that there are cases of wrongful discrimination featuring only subordination, only the violation of deliberative freedom, or only the denial of access to basic goods, without any other form of unequal treatment (162–165). It might be objected that some forms are subsumed by others. For instance, the denial of access to basic goods amounts to wrongful discrimination when the relevant good is necessary for the person to be and to be seen as a full and equal participant in society. Hence what appears to make the denial wrongful is how it contributes to social subordination. Similarly, a violation of deliberative freedom amounts to wrongful discrimination when it unjustifiably violates the victim’s autonomy. But whether a person is forced to have their membership in a social group constantly before their eyes in every decision they make seems to depend on their social context and whether, across many different spheres, they encounter systematic or widespread disadvantageous treatment because of the trait that defines the group of which they are a member. This in turn seems to make the violation depend on whether the person belongs to a socially subordinated group (Hellman 2021b, 567–579; Calhoun 2022, 71–77; Sangiovanni 2024, 35–36). If social subordination is the prime wrong-making feature of discrimination to which others are reducible, it is doubtful whether we still have a pluralist view on hand.

Considerable interest in social subordination has developed in recent philosophical writing on wrongful discrimination (Kolodny 2023, ch 13; Lippert-Rasmussen 2025, ch 4). If social subordination is central to our understanding of when discrimination is morally wrong, we must ask what makes it morally objectionable. Does it disrespect the moral status of members of subordinate groups as equals? Or is it that it is harmful for members of these groups? (Sangiuliano 2023a). These questions return us to the antinomy between harm-based and disrespect views or the possibility of pluralism as between them.

4. Indirect Discrimination

The special part of the moral philosophy of discrimination concerns specific topics to which views on the general part are applied or in whose contexts those views are tested and refined. Topics include: discrimination in dating (Sommer Degn 2023; Sommer Degn and Flinch Midtgaard 2025) or policing (Hosein 2018); specific traits because of which discrimination can occur, such as a person’s appearance (Mason 2023), socioeconomic status (Steuwer and Lippert-Rasmussen 2024), or political belief (Simpson 2025); affirmative action (Lippert-Rasmussen 2020); stereotyping (Beeghly 2025); the relation between discrimination and racism (Glasgow 2009), “structural injustice” (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 49–53; Sangiovanni 2017, 164–172; Moreau, forthcoming), or equality, including “relational” (Dinur 2023) and “basic” equality (Lippert-Rasmussen 2022a); and algorithmic discrimination through the use of artificial intelligence (Eidelson 2021; Hu 2024; Hellman 2024).

One prominent special topic is indirect discrimination (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 72; Thomsen 2015, 311; Cossette-Lefebvre 2020, 357). Consider the following case:

Termination 2: A employs B and has a policy of firing employees under 5′10″. The average height of women is under 5′10″. A invokes the policy to fire B, who is a woman under 5′10″.

Policies like A’s are legally prohibited in jurisdictions around the world. The question for moral philosophy is whether A’s act falls under the definition of “discrimination” and what, if anything, makes A’s policy morally wrong independently its legal prohibition.

The generic definition of “discrimination” as disadvantage because of a trait can capture A’s conduct in Termination 2. A’s policy disadvantages B, who is a woman, by depriving her of employment. It explicitly represents employees’ height. With respect to sex, however, it is facially neutral. Moreover, assume that A harbors no mental representation of employees like B as a woman, and B’s womanhood is not among A’s motivating reasons for disadvantaging B by invoking the policy. Hence, on a motivational view of the “because” condition of the generic definition of “discrimination,” A’s policy is not discriminatory against women. Despite these facts, the policy disadvantages woman worse than men. It produces more terminations of women, including B, than men. Thus, B’s womanhood causally explains why she is disadvantaged by the policy. The explanation relies on how women are less likely than men to be 5′10″. Therefore, on an explanatory view of “because”, A’s policy is “discriminatory.”

Had the policy in Termination 2 explicitly represented employees’ womanhood, or had A harbored a corresponding mental state, the explanation for why the policy disadvantaged B would have traveled through this representation. Then the policy would have been directly discriminatory against woman. Therefore, if we accept an explanatory account of the link between a victim’s trait and disadvantage in the generic definition of “discrimination,” direct and indirect discrimination are distinguishable along the axis of the explanatory pathway between trait and disadvantage, that is, whether it traverses a representation of the victim’s trait (Moreau 2020, 19–20). This approach reveals continuity between the two types of discrimination. Both occur when a trait is held against a victim. The difference between them turns on whether the explanation for why this occurs appeals to a representation of the victim as having a trait or whether, irrespective of this representation, the effects of a perpetrator’s conduct are worse for people sharing the victim’s trait.

The difference, notice, is not drawn along the axis of a perpetrator’s intentions. There can be unintentional direct discrimination. A perpetrator may have an implicit bias against people with a certain trait, and even while consciously disavowing it be motivated to disadvantage people who they represent as having that trait (Dinur 2022b, 126–128). There can also be intentional indirect discrimination. In Termination 2, A might have intended to fire women out of misogyny but hidden his intentions by adopting a policy that uses a criterion that strongly correlates with sex, namely height, as the explicit ground for firing employees, knowing that this policy will tend to result in more terminations of men than women (Thomsen 2015, 317; Eidelson 2015, 41–42).

But how exactly does indirect discrimination involve imposing “worse” disadvantage on people with some trait rather than others? Is the policy in Termination 2 indirectly discriminatory in virtue of treating women worse than men in an interpersonally comparative sense or worse compared to some alternative policy in an intrapersonal counterfactual sense? The first option seems the more natural. But it is said to presuppose a controversial moral view that unequal outcomes for different social groups are intrinsically objectionable (Lippert-Rasmussen 2014, 47–48).

Must indirect discrimination have a worse impact only for an individual victim or the entire group defined by the trait that the victim possesses? Since women are more likely than men to be under 5′10″, A’s policy in Termination 2 tends to generate more terminations for women as a group compared to men. But not all women are under 5′10″, and not all men are 5′10″ or taller. The category of employees who the policy disadvantages is not perfectly co-extensive with women and does not exclude all men. Thus, the policy potentially disadvantages some men and benefits some women. Does this fact prevent the policy from being indirectly discriminatory against B? (Hellman 2018, 118–119). Suppose that C, a woman who is over 5′10″, and D, a man who is under 5′10″, both work for A. When the policy is applied to them, C is not fired and D is. It is unclear if C and D are indirectly discriminated against (Thomsen 2015, 309–310; Lippert-Rasmussen 2022, 90–97).

An agent may make decisions about people using an explicit differentiating criterion whose extension includes all people with some trait while excluding all people who do not have that trait. For example, A might deploy the height criterion in Termination 2 in a possible world where all women are under and all men are over 5′10″. The use of such a perfect proxy entails that the agent will disadvantage all people with that trait, and nobody without it. The agent’s decisions may seem difficult to classify as directly discriminatory since are not explicitly guided by a representation of certain people as possessing that trait. Yet they may also be difficult to classify as indirectly discrimination since use of the proxy so reliably tracks possession of this trait that functionally they mirror a situation where they are explicitly guided by such a representation. Cossette-Lefebvre and Lippert-Rasmussen argue that this sort of case therefore involves neither direct nor indirect but a sui generis form of “non-direct” discrimination (Cossette-Lefebvre and Lippert-Rasmussen 2025).

Some might believe that indirect discrimination is committed only if a facially neutral rule imposes a worse disadvantage on some groups and this is not outweighed by the interests of the agent who imposes it. For example, suppose that, in Termination 2, the relevant workplace is a municipal fire department, and being 5′10″ or taller is a genuine physical fitness standard for working as a firefighter. If the costs to municipal fire safety outweigh the disadvantage imposed by A’s policy of terminating employees who are under 5′10″, the policy is not indirectly discriminatory. On a different view, the policy is indirectly discriminatory, but the costs of foregoing it render it justified (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 68–72; Lippert-Rasmussen 2022, 97–102).

Can any trait constitute a ground of indirect discrimination, or only certain traits? This question can be explored by examining whether indirect discrimination is subsidiary to direct discrimination (Ishida 2022, 8). According to the prevailing view, a neutral act that does not involve an explicit representation of a person as possessing some trait but that disadvantages people with that trait worse than others is indirectly discriminatory only if the worse disadvantage is “suitably related to” or “tracks” past direct discrimination against people with the trait (Lippert-Rasmussen 2013, 70–71; Laborde 2026, 19–21). Suppose that the policy in Termination 2 is implemented in a fire department. If women have been directly discriminated against in the firefighting profession, having been deliberately excluded due to sexist assumptions about their physical fitness relative to that of men, then if a policy of terminating firefighters who are under 5′10″ unjustifiably disadvantages women worse than men, the worse disadvantage seems to suitably track past direct discrimination. A strict version of the prevailing view holds that the past direct discrimination must have been committed by the very same agent who performs the neutral yet disadvantageous act presently. A more permissive version holds that the past direct discrimination could have been committed by any agent all (Hellman 2018, 117). However, both versions entail that a trait can ground indirect discrimination only if it characterizes groups subject to past discrimination who are likely to constitute a marginalized social group. This in turn entails that, when it comes to indirect discrimination, traits are not symmetrical. It is not possible to indirectly discriminate because of a trait that characterizes a group that is seldom subject to direct discrimination and attendant social disadvantage. The prevailing view, it should be noted, is not free of difficulties (Cossette-Lefebvre, 2020, 351–352). On a contrasting view, there can be indirect discrimination because of traits that define groups who are worst off under patterns of inequality regardless of whether their being worst off is the product of direct discrimination against them (Eidelson 2021, 261–262). But even on this view, indirect discrimination is asymmetrical and limited to traits that define worst off groups.

A deflationary view denies that indirect discrimination is a variety of discrimination on par with direct discrimination (Ishida 2022, 8). On this view, the “because” component of “discrimination” should be construed in the motivational sense by holding that discrimination occurs only when a perpetrator represents the victim as having some trait and takes the victim’s having the trait as a motivating reason to disadvantage the victim. Or, if the component is construed in the explanatory sense, discrimination occurs only when the relevant causal explanation linking a victim’s trait to disadvantage travels through a mental representation of the victim as having this trait harbored by the perpetrator. Once the component is narrowed in these ways, “discrimination” refers only to direct discrimination, and the moral wrong-making feature of discrimination is narrowed to the internal mental deliberations of perpetrators rather than external effects on victims.

Eidelson advances two claims to support a deflationary view of indirect discrimination. First, adopting the explanatory approach to “because” without narrowing it to explanations that flow through a perpetrator’s mentality inordinately proliferates discriminatory conduct. For example, such an approach would counterintuitively entail that the state’s omission to increase funding for middle schools is discriminatory, since the omission would tend to disadvantage already marginalized groups worse than privileged groups, so diminished future opportunities for marginalized students would be causally explained by the omission. Second, by manufacturing continuity between direct and indirect discrimination, the approach distorts common sense intuition by failing to portray discrimination that is motivated by animus, hatred, or similar mental states as the paradigmatic or central case (Eidelson 2015, 55–56).

The deflationary view is compatible with there being good instrumental reasons to legally prohibit conduct that unjustifiably disadvantages some groups worse than others regardless of the mental states of the perpetrator, even if, unlike disadvantage precipitated by bad mental states, such conduct is not pre-legally morally wrongful “discrimination.” For Eidelson, by burdening citizens such as employers who hold positions of social or economic power, the prohibitions open opportunities for subordinated groups and thereby implement a social program of rectifying patterns of inequality (Gardner 1989, 8–11; Eidelson 2015, 51). Others claim that there are good instrumental reasons to label the legally prohibited conduct as a form of (“indirect”) “discrimination.” There are usually condemnatory moral attitudes associated with the “discrimination” label. These are pre-legally reserved for wrongful direct discrimination. But transferring their moral force to conduct that is not pre-legally wrong but that it would be instrumentally valuable to legally prohibit might engender public support for the prohibitions and enhance social compliance with them (Waldron 1985, 94; Gardner 2018, 75).

Some philosophers have developed views of indirect discrimination as, like direct discrimination, a form of moral wrongdoing independently of legal prohibitions. These views can be divided into two types.

First, there are views that regard direct and indirect discrimination as separate yet related moral wrongs. Hellman argues that direct discrimination expresses a demeaning social message that disrespects victims’ equal moral worth, but indirect discrimination “compounds injustice.” According to the subsidiary view of indirect discrimination, indirect discrimination occurs only when an otherwise neutral act disadvantages people with some trait worse than people who lack the trait where the disadvantage tracks historical direct discrimination against people with this trait. For example, the act may deploy a decisional criterion that is a proxy for membership in the group defined by the trait given past direct discrimination against the group; an employer may use an employee’s level of educational attainment to decide who to fire, but this criterion may correlate with membership in a racial minority group due to past direct discrimination against racial minorities in education. In these cases, using the criterion to disadvantage victims with the trait in the present compounds the past injustice of indirect discrimination. Hellman holds that this is because the perpetrator is “implicated” in and “amplifies” the past injustice (Hellman 2018).

Second, there are views that unify direct and indirect discrimination as the same kind of wrong. Suppose, for example, that direct discrimination is made wrong by contributing to cumulative harms against members of worst-off social groups under patterns of inequality. It has been argued that indirect discrimination causes the same kind of harm by contributing to group disadvantage (Arneson 2013, 109–111; Thomsen 2015, 323–324). Conversely, suppose that direct discrimination is made wrong by how perpetrators’ internal deliberations disrespect victims as persons by failing to weigh victims’ interests equally with the interests of others, or by expressing a conventionally disrespectful social message. Indirect discrimination may involve the same kind of disrespect. Moreau argues that an agent who performs an act without any motivation to disadvantage people with some trait, but that unjustifiably disadvantages these people worse than others, acts from negligence. This is disrespectful since it consists in the agent’s failure to deliberate in a way that regards the interests of members of the disadvantaged group as equals. The agent does not treat these interests as having equal importance to the agent’s own interests or the interests of others (Moreau 2018, 143). Sangiovanni similarly argues that a perpetrator of indirect discrimination expresses a message of disregard or indifference towards members of disadvantaged groups (Sangiovanni 2017, 161). Finally, suppose that direct discrimination is made wrong by plural features, including its contribution to harmful social patterns and deliberative or expressive disrespect. It has been argued that indirect discrimination can also be made wrong by the same plural features (Cossette-Lefebvre 2025).

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• Altman, Andrew, “Discrimination”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2026 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2026/entries/discrimination/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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