Ernst Mach

First published Tue Sep 15, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Pietro Gori and Luca Guzzardi replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

The work of Ernst Mach (1838–1916) has been influential in physics, physiological psychology, and philosophy, shaping debates on both the foundations of physics and the nature and scope of scientific knowledge. Trained and active primarily as an experimental physicist, Mach conducted significant research on acoustics, shock waves, and the physiology of the sense organs, as well as on problems concerning motion, space, and measurement. In physics, the speed of sound famously bears his name, as he was the first to systematically study supersonic motion. Moreover, his critique of Newtonian ideas of absolute space and time inspired the young Einstein, who credited Mach as the philosophical forerunner of relativity theory. Ranging from experimental studies of perception to analyses of mechanical concepts, Mach’s scientific inquiries formed the empirical basis of a broader epistemological program concerned with the analysis of experience and the conceptual structure of science.

The basic tenets of his philosophy of science include a historically oriented approach to scientific inquiry, emphasizing the provisional, functional, and economical character of scientific concepts. For Mach, this history-based approach serves as an “anti-metaphysical” (or “enlightenment”) tool: enabling the epistemological criticism of established scientific notions, it sheds light on concepts that have undergone dogmatic solidification and need to be reassessed. Mach’s principle of the economy of thought, according to which scientific laws do not reveal hidden essences but operate as efficient and systematically organized summaries of experience, follows directly from his critiques of absolute space, atomism, and traditional causal explanation, which were also closely connected to his relational account of mass and inertia. His epistemological concerns are therefore the expression of reflections developed during actual scientific research. These reflections also allowed Mach to outline a conception of scientific knowledge inspired by Darwinian evolutionism and focused on the view that, in science, an ongoing process of adaptation of thought to facts and of thoughts to each other is at work.

Mach’s ideas exerted a wide and complex influence on later science and philosophy, shaping debates among physicists such as Einstein and contributing to the intellectual background of logical empiricism. This legacy strongly contributed to preserving and transmitting the image of Mach as a straightforward phenomenalist who reduced the physical world to pure psychological phenomena, namely sensations. However, recent reassessments have challenged this image, reconsidering both the epistemological and metaphysical commitments present in Mach’s works and emphasizing further dimensions of his reflections, such as their evolutionary, historical, and pluralist features. By undermining the received view, this reassessment calls for a renewed evaluation of Mach’s contribution to the philosophy of science.

1. Life

Ernst Mach was born on February 18, 1838, in Chirlitz (Chrlice), now a city district in the southern part of Brno, the former capital of Moravia. In 1840 his family moved to a farm in Untersiebenbrunn, a small rural town northeast of Vienna. Mach began his classical education at the Benedictine Gymnasium in Seitenstetten, approximately 80 miles west of the capital. Since the Benedictine fathers were dissatisfied with the child’s performance, Mach’s father decided to educate him at home. During these years, Mach studied Greek, Latin, history, basic geometry and algebra, probably French, covering most of the standard subjects taught in schools at the time.

In the autumn of 1853, Mach was admitted to the sixth class of the Public Piarist Gymnasium in Kremsier (Kroměříž), Moravia, where he graduated two years later. In 1855 he entered the University of Vienna to study physics. It was in these years that Mach began his interest in physiology, chemistry, and anatomy, in connection with the school started by Johannes Müller. In 1860, Mach received his doctorate and continued at the university of Vienna as a Privatdozent – an unsalaried lecturer whose classes were paid for directly by students – until 1864. His classes included themes such as physics for medical students, psychophysics, and the principles of the science of mechanics.

After spending three years as Professor of Mathematics (1864) and then of Physics (1866) at Graz, Mach was appointed in 1867 to the Chair of Experimental Physics at the University of Prague. He remained there until 1895 and served twice as Rector of the University of Prague: first in 1879–1880, before the division of the university into German and Czech institutions, and later in 1883–1884, as Rector of the German University of Prague.

In September 1894, his son Heinrich – a gifted chemist who had received his doctorate in Göttingen shortly before – committed suicide. This event profoundly affected Mach’s personal and family life. Around the same period, and possibly in connection with Heinrich’s suicide, Mach began to consider leaving Prague for Vienna. An opportunity arose a few months later: although no chair in physics was available, chairs in philosophy were expected to open. Following discussions within the philosophical faculty and negotiations with the Ministry of Education, in 1895 Mach was appointed to the Chair of the History and Philosophy of the Inductive Sciences at the University of Vienna.

After three years of successful teaching, productive work, and growing national and international recognition – marked by well-attended popular lectures, new publications, and revised editions of major books – Mach suffered a stroke in July 1898 while traveling by train, which permanently paralyzed the right side of his body. He never fully recovered and was forced to retire from his position in 1901. Mach relied on assistance from his wife and his son Ludwig for basic daily needs, but this did not prevent him from continuing to study, write on a wide range of topics, and conduct experiments with Ludwig’s help. During this period, he was also able to complete his main philosophical work, Knowledge and Error, first published in 1905. In 1913, Mach moved from Vienna to Vaterstetten, near Munich, where he died on February 19, 1916.

Mach’s name as a scientist is connected with a series of significant contributions to physics, including a new experimental approach to the study of the Doppler effect, the observation of “Mach bands”, and seminal research on supersonic motion. This latter work involved the development of high-speed photographic techniques and led to the naming of the ratio of flow velocity to the local speed of sound as “Mach number”. Parallel to this research activity, Mach developed, as early as the mid-1860s, an interest in the history of physics, which resulted in a series of pioneering texts, some of which were also aimed at a popular audience, that profoundly influenced philosophical discussions about science in the following decades.

2. Physics and its interface with physiological and psychological phenomena

Mach was an experimental physicist for most of his professional life. His experimental practice profoundly shaped his interests and activities across nearly all the fields he explored, including epistemology (Jung 2019; Guzzardi 2023).

Mach’s main dissertation for the doctoral degree was a coauthored study on electrical discharge and induction (“Über elektrische Entladung und Induction”, 1859), written with Pietro Blaserna and Julius Peterin. Shortly thereafter, with the support of Andreas von Ettingshausen – then director of the Viennese Physical Institute – Mach constructed an apparatus to demonstrate the Doppler effect, which led to an experimentally grounded theoretical paper (1860). In 1862, he presented a general theory of the “pulse wave recorder” (Pulswellenzeichner), an instrument designed to graphically register variations in blood pressure. The device had antecedents in early nineteenth-century physiology and had been significantly improved in the 1840s by Carl Ludwig.

Investigations of this kind were multifaceted. They could be approached, on one level, in purely physical terms – optical and acoustic phenomena in the case of the Doppler effect, or applications of fluid dynamics to medicine in the case of the pulse wave recorder. Yet they also had potential correlates in the physiological domain, particularly in the physiology of the senses. This, in turn, had implications for psychology and, ultimately, for the theory of knowledge.

2.1 The psychophysics of visual phenomena and Mach bands

Research at the intersection of physics, physiology, and psychology had gained wide currency in the German-speaking world through the work of Johannes Müller and his pupils. Among the latter, Carl Ludwig and Ernst Wilhelm Brücke emerged as leading physiologists at the University of Vienna from the 1850s to the early 1860s. According to Mach’s own recollections (as reported in Blackmore 1992: 24), it was through their acquaintance that he “gained insight into the scientific work taking place in Germany and entered the field of sensory physiology, where he could carry out experiments without costly equipment”. As a result, physics and the physiology of the sense organs – or psychophysics, defined by Mach as “the science of the connections between psychological and physiological phenomena” (Mach 1863: 147) – became deeply interwoven in his early research trajectory, with inquiries in one domain often stimulating developments in the other.

Throughout the 1860s, while developing his experimental work on the Doppler effect, Mach also delivered a series of public lectures on psychophysics (Mach 1863), explored hearing sensations and investigated visual phenomena such as the influence of eye movements on perception, color contrast, and retinal fatigue. In this context, between 1865 and 1868 he published a study devoted to explaining “the effect of the spatial distribution of the light stimulus on the retina”, divided into four parts (“Über die Wirkung der räumlichen Vertheilung des Lichtreizes auf die Netzhaut”. The four parts of the paper were published in Sitzungsberichte der Kaiserlichen Akademie der Wissenschaften in Wien, Mathematisch-naturwissenschaftliche Classe, vols. 52, 1865: 303–322; 54, 1866: 131–144 and 393–408; and 57, 1868b: 11–19). This research includes Mach’s seminal work on the phenomenon now known as “Mach bands”.

According to Mach’s report (1865: 303), “observing rotating discs endowed with black and white sectors, I casually noted a phenomenon which, as I pursued it, led me to a more general law of physiological optics”. As John Blackmore explains, one might have expected “the rotating disc should have been gray on the outer edge, becoming constantly if irregularly lighter toward the inner edge. In fact, however, there appeared two color bands that were not supposed to exist at all” (Blackmore 1972: 49). The human eye seems to exaggerate the contrast between adjacent regions of slightly differing shades of gray as soon as they come into contact. Whereas such effects were usually interpreted as optical illusions – errors of judgment or failures of understanding – Mach argued that this perceptual process does not occur in the brain: the supposed errors are instead rooted in the structural, physiological properties of the visual apparatus itself.

Mach demonstrated that the band effect is related to the spatial distribution of luminance: wherever the luminance curve bends, that location is perceived as relatively darker or brighter than its surroundings. He interpreted this in light of a “heuristic principle” consonant with Fechner’s concept of psychophysical parallelism, formulated by Mach (1865: 320) as the view that “to equal psychic processes correspond equal physical processes”. In his paper, Mach emphasizes the analytical import, point by point, of this correspondence: “If a psychic process can be analyzed, in purely psychological terms, into a plurality of qualities a, b, c, then an equal number of distinct physical processes – α, β, γ, and so forth – correspond to it. Every detail of the psychic has a corresponding detail in the physical” (Mach 1865: 320). For Mach, therefore, Fechner’s “fundamental law” of psychophysics – the law according to which perceived sensation increases logarithmically with the intensity of the physical stimulus – applies to each photoreceptor cell of the retina. The band effect is thus explained not as an illusion of understanding but as a consequence of the perceptual organization of visual sensation. Since every point of the retina is interconnected with its surroundings, “a characteristic type of perception results: whatever lies close to the average of its surroundings becomes blurred, whereas what stands above or below it is disproportionately emphasized” (Mach 1868b: 19).

2.2 Toward “Gestalt qualities”

The explanation of the band effect, which rests on the idea that perception is not reducible to isolated sensory elements but depends on the relational organization of stimuli within a field, together with the emphasis on how each point of the retina interacts with its surroundings – that is, the insight that the perception of a part is determined by its relation to the whole – anticipates several key intuitions later developed by Gestalt psychologists. Mach would refine and generalize this position in The Analysis of Sensations, particularly in Chapters 6 and 7, both devoted to visual space perception. Here, for example, he presents the following insight that closely echoes core concepts of Gestalt theory: “The tree with its hard, rough, grey trunk, its many branches swayed by the wind, its smooth, soft, shining leaves, appears to us at first a single, indivisible whole. In like manner, we regard the sweet, round, yellow fruit, the warm, bright fire, with its manifold moving tongues, as a single thing” (Mach 1886 [1959: 102]). It comes as no surprise, therefore, that in his 1890 paper “Über Gestaltqualitäten” (the seminal article of Gestalt theory), Christian von Ehrenfels praises Mach’s conception for providing “a substantial strengthening of [his] views concerning the relations to be presented here” (Ehrenfels 1890: 249; see also Blackmore 1972: 47–48).

2.3 Shock waves

In the 1870, once established as chair of experimental physics and director of the physical laboratory at the University of Prague, Mach continued his studies on space and motion, turning more precisely on visual and muscular sensations in spatial orientation and the sense of balance, clarifying the role of the internal ear, particularly that of the labyrinth, in three important experimental studies (Mach 1873a, 1874a, and 1874b) and a comprehensive book (Mach 1875).

At a certain point in the 1870s, Mach’s interest in acoustic phenomena led him to analyze “blast” sounds produced by electric sparks – Funkenwellen (“spark waves”) – and their origin. Initially interpreting these as ordinary sound waves, Mach, together with his assistants and students, launched a systematic study of the physical foundations of the phenomenon, focusing on visualization techniques to reveal the mechanical effects of spark-generated blast waves. They quickly found that the soot figures used to visualize air motion were not specific to electric discharges but could be produced by any explosion, and that measured propagation speeds approached or exceeded the speed of sound. This marked Mach’s transition from a purely acoustic reading to a distinct shock-wave interpretation.

The program culminated in the 1880s, when – together with Peter Salcher – Mach conducted a series of experiments to clarify the nature of these waves. Using a Toepler-type schlieren apparatus in combination with photography, Mach and Salcher captured an image of the compressed-air cone at the nose of a projectile and interpreted it as a stationary shock structure linked to supersonic motion, introducing the term “head wave” and relating cone geometry to the ratio of projectile speed to sound speed (Mach and Salcher 1887). By turning transient, invisible compressions into measurable records and reinterpreting them within a general wave framework, Mach’s work laid core experimental and conceptual foundations for modern shock-wave and supersonic gas dynamics – reflected today in terms such as “Mach cone”, “Mach angle”, and “Mach number” (Merzkirch 1970; Hoffmann and Berz 2001; Hoffmann 2009).

2.4 The foundations of physics: inertia and the space-time relationship

Next to his experimental work in both physiology and physics, Mach developed quite early an interest in the history of science. This interest was partly a result of his teaching activity: historical presentations of scientific subjects were not unusual in university physics courses in the German-speaking countries. As a Privatdozent in Vienna, Mach offered as early as 1862 a course on “Mechanical Principles and Mechanistic Physics in Its Historical Development”. Reflecting on this experience, he later recalled that “the teaching itself led [him] to the opinion that the historical presentation of material was the simplest and the most understandable”(Blackmore 1992: 24).

During these years, Mach crafted a “historico-critical” approach that became a central feature of his philosophy of science. Together with his standpoint as an experimental physicist, this approach also led him to probe deeply into the foundational concepts of physics – such as mass, space, time, and atomism. His investigations on these issues were initially published in a series of short writings, e.g. “Über die Definition der Masse” (1868a), “Über die Versinnlichung einiger Sätze der Mechanik” (1868c), Die Geschichte und die Wurzel des Satzes von der Erhaltung der Arbeit (1872), and “Zur Geschichte des Arbeitsbegriffs” (1873b). These studies were later expanded and systematically presented in one of his main works: Die Mechanik in ihrer Entwickelung: Historisch-kritisch dargestellt (1883).

Mach’s relational definition of mass is based on a kind of thought experiment. Let two perfectly equal bodies be placed opposite each other. According to the principle of symmetry, Mach argues, “they will produce in each other, along the line joining them, equal and opposite accelerations”. However, if the bodies are not assumed to be equal, we have no guarantee or justification for this expectation. On the other hand, we know from “mechanical experience” that bodies are subject to acceleration through the action of other bodies; thus, “nothing stands in the way of our arbitrarily establishing the following definition: all those bodies are bodies of equal mass which, mutually acting on each other, produce in each other equal and opposite accelerations. We have, in this, simply designated, or named, an actual relation of things”. To compare the masses of two bodies A and B, we take one body (say, A) as the unit. The two bodies will experience equal and opposite accelerations, denoted \(-\phi\) and \(+\phi '\) respectively. Since the acceleration \(-\phi\) is produced in A by the mass of body B, and the acceleration \(+\phi '\) is produced in B by the mass of body A, “we then say that B has \(\phi \, /\, \phi '\) times the mass of A.” In symbols, \(-\phi m_A = +\phi ' m_B \Rightarrow m_B = (\phi/\phi')m_A\), where \(\phi\) and \(\phi'\) denote the magnitudes of the respective accelerations (see Mach 1883 [2013: 216–218]).

As Erik Banks (2003: 194) explains, “individual mass values (a pair of a body and a number, for example) did not exist for Mach … Mass values were the result of a system of chained comparisons between one ratio and another and with a standard ratio, which could be verified experimentally. Thus Mach was really defining values always for a system of masses. To say that mass doesn’t vary in a certain event means not that a certain lump of matter is the same as it was before, but that a systematic relationship between all of the ratios is upheld”. This conception eventually led Mach to formulate what is now known as “Mach’s principle”, which, in the version given by Stephen Hawking (1990 [2001]), may be expressed as the view that “matter has inertia only relative to other matter in the universe” (though Mach would likely have rejected many of its modern interpretations. See Misner et al. 1973: 546, and Barbour and Pfister 1995).

Mach also linked his concept of inertia – dependent, in principle, on the distribution of all other masses in the universe – to his own critique of Newton’s concept of absolute space. After reviewing the Newtonian notions of absolute and relative time, space, and motion as set forth in the Scholium to the Principia’s Definitions, Mach concluded that “it is not necessary to refer the law of inertia to a special absolute space. On the contrary, it is perceived that the masses that in the common phraseology exert forces on each other as well as those that exert none, stand with respect to acceleration in quite similar relations. We may, indeed, regard all masses as related to each other” (Mach 1883 [2013: 235–236]). The concept of absolute space is the result of an abstraction: in order to determine the position of a body K, we always need other bodies A, B, C, etc. “Since we always have at our disposal a sufficient number of bodies, that are as respects each other relatively fixed, or only slowly change their positions, we are, in such reference, restricted to no one definite body and can alternately leave out of account now this one and now that one” (Mach 1883 [2013: 230]). In this sense, absolute space is superfluous – it is a mere verbal construct with no physical meaning. It is also a kind of self-delusion, since we would delude ourselves, if this is taken to imply that we could absolutely dispense with other bodies when measuring their positions and motions.

Mach’s conception of the interdependence of all bodies upon one another has a remarkable consequence for the notion of time. In fact, the latter seems to be an independent, fundamental entity, since we measure its passing by reference to the regularity of some process assumed to be constant – e.g., astronomical motions, the swing of a pendulum, or, more recently, the piezoelectric oscillations of quartz crystals and the resonance frequencies of atomic clocks. Yet, in all these cases, what we actually measure is the mutual dependence of things: in practice, time is measured through changes in spatial positions – a view that Mach claimed to have held since the 1860s (see Mach 1872 [1911: 88–90]).

2.5 Anti-atomism sui generis

Another physical concept that Mach frequently criticized as ill-defined was that of atoms as the fundamental constituents of matter. Already in the early 1870s he expressed growing dissatisfaction with the atomic theories of his time. One of his main criticisms, defended for example in The History and Root of the Principle of the Conservation of Energy (Mach 1872 [1911: 50–54]), relies on a form of Occam’s razor: one should not ascribe to unobservable entities of a hypothetical microworld the properties of observable macroscopic phenomena. So long as physical descriptions can dispense with atoms, these remain conceptually superfluous – pure things of thought, just like the notion of absolute space.

Recent historical analyses have shown, however, that Mach’s position on atomism is less straightforward than is often claimed. As summarized by Banks (2003: 12), “some think that Mach accepted atomism in his early writings but later only as an hypothesis for organizing the appearances, as he purportedly told Einstein during their meeting in 1910. Or perhaps the mechanical atomism Mach attacked was a patently false ‘billiard ball’ or ‘Ding an sich’ theory not believed in by anyone (as Feyerabend claimed). Mach sometimes said that he thought atoms were by definition transcendental Dinge an sich, utterly inaccessible to any possible experiment”. According to Banks, Mach’s skepticism toward atomism reflected his broader views on the ultimate theory of matter – seeing in his own theory of “elements” a competing, and possibly more fundamental, alternative. It is also consistent with his general conception of scientific knowledge and the attempt not to endorse metaphysical commitments regarding concepts that have primarily (and perhaps solely) an instrumental value, providing description and orientation instead of explanation. Both aspects represent key topics of Mach’s epistemological stance and his philosophy of science.

3. Philosophy

Throughout his life, Ernst Mach consistently sought to avoid being called a philosopher – at least in the sense the term carried in his time. His explicit aim was to contribute to a renewal of scientific inquiry that would eliminate metaphysical concepts of all kinds from science. Nevertheless, it is uncontroversial that Mach’s contributions to physics, physiology, and psychology had – and continue to have – philosophical relevance, insofar as they express a proper philosophical approach to scientific knowledge as we currently conceive it. Mach’s epistemology, or “philosophy of science”, in fact focuses on the methodology, value, and meaning of scientific knowledge claims, and both the manner in which he pursued his aims and the results of his work profoundly inspired further reflection on these issues. It should therefore come as no surprise that certain fundamental tenets of Mach’s epistemology anticipated features of positions currently under debate, making it possible to place them in a fruitful dialogue with contemporary views on science.

The most relevant tenets of Mach’s reflections revolve around an anti-metaphysical approach that involves two distinct aspects of scientific inquiry. On the one hand, Mach sought to show that key notions in physical and psychological investigation – namely, the “body” and the “ego” – are merely mental symbols devoid of any ontological referent. As such, they should be treated only functionally, as means for efficient orientation within their respective fields of study. On the other hand, and on a broader level, Mach’s anti-metaphysical attitude concerns the role and value of scientific knowledge itself, which he regarded as traditionally overrated, as though it were an expression of absolute and objective truths. Scientific concepts, Mach argues, are only temporary resting points in the ongoing process of research. Their function is merely instrumental and economical – albeit highly fruitful – and we tend to ascribe a “metaphysical” value to them only because we abstract them from their historical process of development. On this basis, in works such as The Science of Mechanics, The Principles of the Theory of Heat, Popular Scientific Lectures, and Knowledge and Error, Mach outlines the principles of a new epistemological approach aimed at enlightening the foundations of classical physics and subjecting them to critical revision.

3.1 The Analysis of sensations and the elements

The most interesting and influential theme that Mach developed in his philosophical writings is arguably the question of elements and sensations. This theme is thoroughly presented in the first chapter of The Analysis of Sensations, which offers a conception of experience programmatically aimed at going beyond Gustav Fechner’s interpretation of the parallelism between the physical and the psychical (see Banks 2003: ch. 6, and Gori 2015). In that chapter, Mach develops a series of anti-metaphysical reflections grounded in the view that, when we describe natural phenomena as “physical” or “psychical”, we are not attributing intrinsic features to the content or object itself. Rather, we are interpreting something that is, in this respect, neutral to our interpretation. These objects are called by Mach “elements”, a term that serves only the theoretical purpose of designating something for which we may not yet have an adequate name. Mach’s “elements” are in fact conceived as the “ultimate component parts, which hitherto we have been unable to subdivide any further”, of the complexes of “colours, sounds, temperatures, pressures, spaces, times, and so forth” that populate our perceptions (Mach 1886 [1959: 2, 5–6]). Thus, when we experience something, we experience a relatively stable group of elements that can be identified (albeit only temporarily) within the flux of perceptions. We assign a name to such a group merely as a practical means of identifying it and orienting ourselves in experience (see Mach 1886 [1959: 6, 14]). That name, however, does not correspond to a metaphysically distinct entity, nor to a cluster endowed with permanent consistency.

These reflections crucially involve the two key concepts of “body” and “ego” (Körper and Ich), which in Mach lose their metaphysical significance. According to Mach, they can no longer be regarded as entities with an ontological status independent of their theoretical function. Rather, Mach argues that there are neither bodies nor an ego (or I, or subject) as such, but only a series of elements forming relatively stable clusters that we may interpret as either physical or psychical objects, depending on the interests guiding our inquiry (Mach 1886 [1959: 17]). Both the body and the ego are only “ideal mental unities, not real unities,” yet they are of “high practical importance” insofar as they enable us to engage fruitfully with the world (Mach 1886 [1959: 23–24]). Mach’s claim that “the primary fact is not the ego, but the elements,” that “the elements constitute the I,” and, consistently, that “complexes of elements make up the bodies” (Mach 1886 [1959: 23, 29]) strongly undermines traditional metaphysical conceptions of these notions, offering an original anti-foundationalist and anti-essentialist approach to both physics and psychology that would deeply influence those fields in the following decades.

An important link to Mach’s epistemological reflections is provided by his conception of both the body and the ego as “thought-symbols for complexes of elements” (Mach 1886 [1959: 29]). Such symbols are, in fact, what scientists are primarily concerned with. Science focuses on facts and deals with notions that are intended to be operationally fruitful rather than metaphysically robust. As Mach argues in a paper from 1892, science aims to “mentally supply” experience with thought-symbols (Mach 1892: 200), thereby fulfilling its task of providing an economically efficient means of managing the vast amount of information available to us. Developing this line of thought, Mach observes that “every physical notion is nothing more than a definite connection of the sensory elements … and every physical fact rests on such a connection. These elements – elements in the sense that no further resolution has for the present been effected of them – are the most ultimate building stones of the physical world that we have as yet been able to seize” (Mach 1892: 205). There is thus a direct connection between scientific notions, scientific facts, and the elements. The elements themselves, however, are not the direct aim of scientific inquiry; rather, they represent only a provisional resting point for research, whose further development may yield a quite different picture. For this reason, Mach seems to have no intention of offering a final word on an issue that is metaphysical at its core, instead confining his analysis to the functional relationships among elements.

Within this framework of Mach’s theory of elements, the theme of sensations also emerges. For Mach, sensations constitute a special type of elements (see Mach 1905 [1976: 356], and Wolters 2008: xvii), arising from the functional relationship between two classes of elements that he identifies as “body elements” and “intra-psychical” elements (Mach 1886 [1959: 16]). Roughly speaking, Mach’s view is that we call sensations those elements that we perceive as referring to our psychophysical dimension – that is, to our own body as reflected in the ego. This allows him to defend the claim that the world we can know and meaningfully describe in fact consists of our sensations (Mach 1886 [1959: 12]), and that we may “call all elements, insofar as we regard them as dependent on … our body, sensations” (Mach 1895: 209) – a view that has sparked intense debate among interpreters. As remarked by Goeres (2004: 50), this view should not lead us to conceive of elements as “conscious contents” (Bewusstseinsinhalte), for they are a far more fundamental entity. They are archetypal phenomena (Urphänomene), which can be perceived as sensations depending on the way we look at them. Thus, it is possible to say that, for Mach, when we speak of “sensations”, we project a human viewpoint onto the elements, which is the neutral substrate of our relationship with the world.

As noted above, Mach’s treatment of elements (and sensations) has long posed interpretive difficulties, since his texts admit of different readings. Canonical in the earlier literature on Mach (e.g Cohen 1968; Agassi 1978 [1988]; Hentschel 1985; Blackmore et. al. 2001) was a phenomenalist interpretation, where phenomenalism may be understood as the view that “everything concrete, including physical objects, can be ‘reduced’ to ‘sensations,’ with the latter conceived as purely psychological phenomena” (Preston 2021). Several features of Mach’s position appear to support this interpretation, in particular the way in which he closely ties sensations to our meaningful experience of the world. However, Mach’s notion of sensation is far more nuanced than it may appear at first sight. In particular, the relationship between sensations and elements is so multifaceted that it can hardly be reduced to the kind of idealistic position characteristic of phenomenalism (see Preston 2021 for a thorough analysis of this issue).

In opposition to this received view, and through a sustained critique of it, Erik Banks has more recently defended a direct realist interpretation of Mach by focusing on his “neutral monism” – that is, the view that the world consists of a flux of states that are neither physical nor psychical in themselves, but are instead objects of interpretation depending on the observer who engages with them (see Russell 1914; Banks 2004, 2014, and 2021; Hatfield 2002 and 2004; Preston 2021. Historical interpretations of Mach as a direct realist include Carus 1893; Becher 1905; Kleinpeter 1906). For Banks (2021: 276), a thorough reading of Mach’s writings – especially those in which he reflects more extensively on the physiology of the sense organs (e.g. the 1910 paper “Sensory Elements and Scientific Concepts” published in Blackmore 1992. See also Mach 1895: 212) – allows us to appreciate the realistic tenor of Mach’s neutral elements and to recognize that Mach was genuinely “convinced that the most realistic portrait of the world was in terms of individually unique, irrepeatable states of events” that “are not human sensations under any interpretation” (Banks 2004: 25 and 41).

The neutral monist stance, however, can also be interpreted as an expression of the so-called “Philosophy of immanence” (Immanenzphilosophie), advocated, for example, by Wilhelm Schuppe and influential in German and Austrian philosophical debates at the time of Mach. Given that Mach claimed to be sympathetic with “the representatives of a philosophy of immanence” (especially Schuppe; Mach 1886 [1959: 46]) and given that immanentist philosophers were commonly regarded as supporters of an idealist epistemology (see e.g. Sass 1976: 237), there may be space for an idealist interpretation of Mach’s neutral monism. But Mach also declared his aversion to any attempt to accuse him of “idealism, Berkeleianism, … and of other ‘-isms’” (Mach 1886 [1959: 48]), and he tried to avoid the realist as much as the idealist conception, which he viewed as dispensable starting commitments of any research (see Mach 1886 [1959: 56]). All things considered, a viable approach to this discussion should begin with a contextualization of Mach’s position. That is, one should bear in mind that his criticism was directed, on the one hand, against materialistic realism and, on the other, against the solipsistic tendencies that may follow from idealism (see Goeres 2004: 45 and 54), thereby leaving room for a more nuanced interpretation of the basic tenets of his epistemology.

3.2 The Anti-metaphysical Approach

Mach’s reflections on the elements, and the consequent dissolution of both physical and psychological purported substances (the body and the ego), express an anti-metaphysical approach that is more fully developed in his epistemological investigations. Among Mach’s most significant contributions to the philosophy of science is his attempt to offer a “historico-critical” exposition of central scientific concepts, such as the conservation of work or energy (Mach 1872 [1911]), the principles of mechanics (Mach 1883 [2013]), the theory of heat (Mach 1896 [1986]), and physical optics (Mach 1921 [2003]). This mode of exposition functions as a tool for advancing what Mach calls an “enlightening or antimetaphysical intention”, namely the aim “to clear up ideas, expose the real significance of the matter, and get rid of metaphysical obscurities” (Mach 1883 [2013: ix]). As Mach observes in the 1909 preface to his early essay The History and Root of the Principle of the Conservation of Energy (originally delivered as a lecture in Prague in 1871 and published in 1872), such obscurities arise from the scientists’ reifying habits of thought that lead to the problematic, albeit highly widespread, tendency “to call concepts metaphysical, if we have forgotten how we reached them” (Mach 1872 [1911: 16–17]). A critical exposition capable of shedding light on the true nature of these concepts must therefore rely on historical inquiry, tracing their origins through the often obscure paths of past cultures and civilizations.

Inspired by the “historical trend” characteristic of his cultural framework (see Haller 1988: 69; Nemeth 2019: 28), and by adopting a terminology that deliberately evokes the Kantian philosophical tradition (Kant’s critical philosophy being among the most significant expressions of Enlightenment ideals in the German-speaking world. See Uebel 2021: 85; Gori 2023: § 1), Mach embraced historical inquiry as the primary means of reassessing the value that should be attributed to scientific concepts, theories, and laws, which are supposed to be “truthful explanations” of facts. To invoke another Machian notion, the historico-critical method discloses the purely economic value of scientific knowledge and clarifies its function in our effort to “find our way in the bewildering tangle of facts” (Mach 1905 [1976: 98]).

Mach’s anti-metaphysical stance may therefore be characterized by three main tenets: first, the enlightenment function of philosophical analysis; second, the central role of historical inquiry as the most effective instrument of critical inquiry; and third, the resulting assessment of the economic value of scientific knowledge – an assessment with significant implications for Mach’s (largely indirect) position in the realism versus antirealism debate.

3.2.1 Enlightenment

In the preface to the first edition of Principles of the Theory of Heat, Mach states that he “aims to give a critical epistemological clarification [eine erkenntniskritische Aufklärung] of the foundations of the theory of heat, to lay out for inspection the facts that influenced the formation of the relevant concepts, and to show why and to what extent the former are to be understood in the light of the latter” (Mach 1896 [1986: 1]). By pursuing this aim, Mach maintains that “idle and superfluous notions and unwarranted metaphysical assumptions” can be eliminated from this branch of physics (Mach 1896 [1986: 1]). This form of critical elucidation, developed in each of Mach’s major works, is intended to remove any obscure, that is, nonsensical or meaningless, conceptions from scientific inquiry.

As Philipp Frank already emphasized in 1917, in highlighting Mach’s role as a philosopher of enlightenment, it is precisely the “struggle against the misuse of auxiliary concepts” – that is, the effort to show that concepts possess a limited domain of validity beyond which they cannot be legitimately applied – that characterizes the “Age of Enlightenment”. In addition, Frank stresses the historically contingent value of the auxiliary concepts and argues that every period in the history of science tends to misuse the concepts inherited from the previous one; therefore, “in every period a new enlightenment is required in order to abolish this misuse…. To this work Mach dedicated himself” (Frank 1970: 229, 231. This theme has been further developed in Uebel 2021).

Key to Mach’s enlightenment stance is the idea that our description of the world – in particular, scientific explanation – must be understood as a continuous process of development. Individual moments of this process, contextualized as they are within specific historical or cultural frameworks, do not provide a complete or literally accurate reproduction of the states of affairs they concern. Like any historical event, scientific conceptualizations are in a constant state of becoming, and no direct correspondence between these abstract models and the facts they aim to represent can be properly assessed. Furthermore, Mach’s ideal of enlightenment is expressed in his effort to reassess the value of scientific knowledge based on anti-foundationalist principles (see Feyerabend 1970: 178; Haller 1988; Uebel 2021: 92 ff.). To act critically on an issue means to confront its nature and attempt to grasp its proper meaning – one that is not grounded in any metaphysical essence accessible to human knowledge. As Uebel (2021: 88) observes, for Mach the purpose of critical elucidation is precisely to bring scientific “conceptualizations, whether mere concepts or whole theories, back down to earth and make them available for critical discussion”.

Thus, Mach’s critique supports the view that our concepts depend on the frameworks from which they arise and within which they are applied. Consequently, their meaning can be modified, reassessed, or even rejected when those frameworks change. This perspective calls for a new method, a new analytical tool. Crucially, this activity cannot be conceived as a transcendental enterprise aimed at uncovering abstract, immutable principles of knowledge. Rather, it should be a procedure that allows us to recognize the evolving nature of our conceptualizations and to evaluate them pragmatically, based on how effectively they address the specific problems posed within the perspective adopted. Such a procedure must be historical in character, since history appears to be the only means through which we can properly engage with the “real living manifestation of the human race” that is science (von Mises 1987: 171. See also Uebel 2019: 504).

3.2.2 Historical Studies

The role played by history in Mach’s critical elucidation is clearly expressed in the Introduction to Principles of the Theory of Heat, where he offers a relativized and instrumental interpretation of the value of scientific knowledge, based on the view that we should “regard our conceptions as merely a means for attainment of definite ends” (Mach 1896 [1986: 5]). According to Mach’s renewed critical method, an enlightenment of the various aspects that constitute our world-description is possible not as a mere logical analysis, but rather as a process of reconstructing the historical development of those elements. Such a process allows us to assess a discipline, for it “lets the current development of a certain science appear in an essentially contingent light, and thus prevents dogmatic solidification” (Heidelberger 2016: xiii). That is to say, history sheds light on the conceptual frameworks that are commonly adopted and traces their origins in the biological, cultural, and technological development of humankind. By contextualizing these frameworks, it reveals the situated character of scientific knowledge and, consequently, its relative value.

Mach’s historical approach to epistemology traces back to his early writings, especially to the lecture on the History and Root of the Principle of the Conservation of Energy, which was his “first attempt to give an adequate exposition of [his] critical epistemological standpoint … with respect to science as a whole” (Mach 1872 [1911: 9]). For Mach, the lack of a sense of history when approaching “propositions which have often cost several thousand years’ labour of thought” (Mach 1872 [1911: 17]) may promote a reifying, metaphysical attitude, shedding light on the origin of concepts that are traditionally (and misleadingly) considered as fixed and with absolute values – that is, “metaphysical” (Mach 1872 [1911: 17]. See on this Guzzardi 2021). “Let us not let go the guiding hand of history” – continues Mach (1872 [1911: 18]) – for “history has made all; history can alter all”. And “if from history one learned nothing else than the variability of views, it would be invaluable”. The danger Mach sought to counteract lies in our persistent temptation to reify mental constructs such as substance, force, and energy: concepts that, though originally provisional, acquire metaphysical authority over time through repeated fruitful use. As observed by Hiebert (1970: 188–189), for Mach, “the conceptual products of science, always incomplete, take on a form at any particular time which reflects the historical circumstances and the focus of attention of the particular investigator – now physicist, now physiologist, now psychologist”. Over time, what was originally acquired accidentally or contingently can become philosophically argued, and the scientist must remain vigilant against the subtle process by which such constructs come to be regarded as philosophically necessary rather than historically contingent.

It is for this reason that Mach regarded history as a central critical tool. By studying the historical development of scientific ideas, concepts, theories, and laws, we can see that they are not literal reflections of states of affairs, but rather the contingent, momentary products of empirical and technical activity. History thus allows us to appreciate the provisional and context-dependent nature of scientific knowledge, providing the means to critically examine, reassess, and situate our conceptual frameworks within the evolving practice of science itself (this reflects Mach’s personal experience, actually, given that his epistemological concerns arose from his experimental works and scientific practice. See on this Hui 2013 and 2021; Staley 2017 and 2021b; Guzzardi 2023).

The problem at issue in Mach’s works thus involves the actual value of scientific knowledge – that is, its “value of use” as a means for a fruitful world-representation, which is not necessarily an explanation of the relevant states of affairs in the traditional (metaphysical) sense. His critical reflections on the historically contingent character of scientific claims, their being situated, do not imply that we cannot use science consistently. That is, Mach does not reject the operational efficiency of scientific theoretical systems but only the ordinary belief that they can provide adequate descriptions of events occurring in the world. For that reason, such a clarification is of the greatest importance for Mach, for it allows us to rid science of metaphysical obscurities that may be detrimental to the development of future inquiries. Therefore, the history of science has an important function insofar as it shows that ordinary scientific concepts result from a process of intellectual solidification that isolated them from their historical origin, and this implies a misinterpretation of their value, which Mach claims to be properly assessable only on a functional or operational basis.

3.2.3 The Economy of thought

Along with the enlightenment ideal and the view of historical studies as a critical tool for epistemological inquiry, Mach’s anti-metaphysical approach to scientific knowledge is also represented by his conception of the economical nature of human knowledge in general and scientific knowledge in particular. The issue of the economy of thought is pervasive in Mach’s writings and operates on two interconnected levels. On the one hand, it concerns scientific practice itself, embodying a principle of minimisation – that is the minimising tendency that underlies scientific inquiry (see Patton 2021 for a detailed discussion of this aspect). On the other hand, it provides a framework for Mach’s more developed reflections on the nature and function of knowledge.

Important remarks on the process of scientific inquiry can be found, for example, in the early essay History and Root of the Principle of the Conservation of Energy as well as in Knowledge and Error. In these writings, Mach (1872 [1911: 55]) conceives of the economy of thought as the broad aim of science “to resolve the more complicated facts into as few and as simple ones as possible”, thereby providing an “abstraction, simplification, schematization and idealization of the facts” (Mach 1905 [1976: 355]) that enables us to save mental effort both in handling acquired information and in pursuing future research. Furthermore, in The Science of Mechanics and Principles of the Theory of Heat, Mach conceives of scientific principles as ways of organising experience and identifying order within it. For him, science is guided by the economy of thought insofar as it strives toward “the completest possible presentment of facts with the least possible expenditure of thought” (Mach 1883 [2013: 490]). For further comments on this, see Patton 2021 and Guzzardi 2021). In these writings, Mach argues, in particular, that a principle of thought economy has guided the generalization of the laws of statics into the principle of virtual displacement and of virtual work (Mach 1883 [2013: 49–77]); the reduction of Kepler’s three laws into Newton’s single law of gravitation (Mach 1883 [2013: 187–189]); and the clarification of the concept of heat into the paired notions of temperature and quantity of heat, later generalized into energy and entropy (Mach 1896 [1986: 146–281]).

This general conception of scientific knowledge has important consequences for the value of the conceptual structures and principles employed in science. It entails the idea that the laws of nature do not possess “more real value than the aggregate of the individual facts” they summarize, but only an “economical value” (Mach 1872 [1911: 55]). This raises the question of how Mach should be situated within the classic debate on the relation between facts and theories. Mach addresses the issue explicitly, maintaining that scientific inquiry is guided by the ideal of mirroring facts in thought. Such an ideal presupposes a dynamic yet empirically grounded relationship between theoretical constructions on the one hand and the factual referent on the other hand. On this account, theories are reconstructions of facts in thought, achieved through an economical process of minimisation and abstraction (see, e.g., Mach 1895: 233; Mach 1905 [1976: 98]. On what a fact is for Mach, see De Waal and Ten Hagen 2020; and Gori 2021. The issue is also indirectly addressed in Blackmore 1972: 32; Holton 1988: 247. On minimisation and abstraction, see Patton 2021). At the same time, Mach maintains a minimal realist tenet according to which theories require constant confirmation from facts, thereby enabling science to provide a “purer expression of facts” (see Mach 1910: 230; 1872 [1911: 57]; 1883 [2013: 514]). This apparent tension has given rise to diverging interpretations, each supported by substantial textual evidence. On the one hand, strong anti-realist readers of Mach have emphasized his interest in the constructive dimension of human knowledge (e.g. Uebel 2019); on the other hand, some scholars have stressed Mach’s attempt to provide a robust realist world description (e.g. Banks 2004; 2014). To reconcile these interpretations, it may be argued that Mach’s concerns were consistently directed toward the necessarily inexact, albeit operationally efficient, reconstruction of facts in thought carried out by scientists, and that he had no intention of taking a definitive stance on issues that are inherently problematic and entail the very metaphysical commitments he repeatedly sought to avoid (see e.g. Mach 1905 [1976: 355] and, for discussion, Gori 2021).

To appreciate Mach’s economical conception of scientific knowledge and grasp its philosophical relevance, however, it is important to consider it in light of his broader epistemological reflections, that is, his view of human conceptualisation. In a series of papers and book chapters (e.g. Mach 1896 [1986: ch. 5]; 1905 [1976: ch. 10]), Mach argues that conceptualization is a product of the mental-economical (denkökonomisch) activity of conceptual completion of facts in thought, which especially characterizes any scientific description of the world. Hence, in dealing with facts, scientists “mentally supply” them with economical symbols (Mach 1892: 200), that is, they put “in the place of a fact something different, something more simple, which is qualified to represent it in some certain aspect, but for the very reason that it is different does not represent it in other aspects” (Mach 1892: 201). Significantly, Mach addresses the apparent tension between the instrumental activity of reproducing natural events in the form of mental-economical symbols and the idea that theoretical statements are rooted in observation statements by maintaining that science is a process of adapting thoughts to facts and thoughts to each other (see e.g. Mach 1895: ch. 12; 1896 [1986: ch. 25]; 1905 [1976: ch. 10]; 1910: 255). This process is based on a biological conception of knowledge that Mach defends consistently in a series of works. In the Popular Scientific Lectures he seems to anticipate a strong form of evolutionary epistemology when he argues that “knowledge is a product of organic nature and … if Darwin reasoned rightly, the general imprint of evolution and transformation must be noticeable in ideas also” (Mach 1895: 217–218). Similarly, in The Analysis of Sensations, Mach claims that new light is shed on the concept of the economy of thought as soon as “in conformity with the stimulus given by Darwinism, we conceive of all psychical life – including science – as a biological phenomenon, and apply to [the economy of thought] the Darwinian conceptions of struggle for existence, of development, and of selection” (Mach 1886 [1959: 49–50], our translation. See also Mach 1896 [1986: 350 ff.]). Given that science is a highly elaborated form of human knowledge, theories and laws of nature may be understood as adapting to their environment – an environment constituted both by the domain of facts to be explained or described and by the network of other theoretical statements developed in pursuit of that aim (on this, see Čapek 1968; Haller 1988; Pojman 2011. For a contextualization of this conception in Mach’s intellectual framework, see also von Mises 1987; Wolters 2008: xiii; Goeres 2004: 46 ff.).

Consistent with that view, in Knowledge and Error Mach argues that “scientific thought arises out of popular thought, and so completes the continuous series of biological development that begins with the first simple manifestation of life” (Mach 1905 [1976: 1]). For him, scientific knowledge is but a sophisticated attempt to mentally supply incomplete observational findings, and the concepts it elaborates “consist in consciousness tied to a word of the reactions to be expected from the class of objects or facts denoted…. The object corresponds to the concept, if it yields the expected reaction when tested in the way intended” (Mach 1905 [1976: 97; see also p. 93]). Thus, although maintaining that concepts are “rooted in facts” (Mach 1905 [1976: 99]) and have a “factual correlative” (Mach 1905 [1976: 102]), Mach defends that the agreement between our mental symbols and the results of observation should be evaluated pragmatically, as a matter of the response elicited by our attempts at explanation (see e.g. Gori 2018). Scientific knowledge is therefore described as “a mental experience directly or indirectly beneficial to us” that “flows from the same mental source” as error; as Mach further argues, “only success can tell the one from the other” (Mach 1905 [1976: 84]). What is relevant to evaluating our judgements, then, is only whether they “stand up” (Mach 1905 [1976: 84]) and allow us to achieve the expected result.

This perspective – which incorporates proto-falsificationist tenets, insofar as focuses on the selection of theories based on the agreement with facts – gains further depth when combined with Mach’s idea that “experience never ceases, and science … stands midway in the evolutionary process” of adaptation that yields ever “richer” (that is, more complete and therefore adequate) conceptions of facts (Mach 1895: 227). Similarly, in Knowledge and Error he remarks that “more accurate quantitative enquiry aims at determining facts as completely as possible”, and that “the progressive refinement of the laws of nature and the increasing restriction of expectations corresponds to a more precise adaptation of thought to fact” (Mach 1905 [1976: 355]). Therefore, for Mach, by “eliminating” the theories and ideas that are inconsistent with the observed facts, we are left with the “fittest” ones, and this process allows us to refine scientific knowledge towards a “richer” and “purer” world representation (Mach 1910: 230). The latter will always remain a representation, however; that is, it will always be nothing more than an indirect description of states of affairs (Mach 1896 [1986: 365]). Mach indeed admits that “it is not possible to achieve perfect adaptation to every individual and incalculable future fact” (Mach 1905 [1976: 355]), and he also argues that “it remains an open question how far nature corresponds to … our formal need of a very simple, palpable, substantial conception of the processes in our environment … or how far we can satisfy it” (Mach 1894: 54).

3.3 The goal and limitations of scientific knowledge

Based on what has been shown thus far, we may say that an apparent tension between two views of scientific knowledge is noticeable in Mach’s epistemology. On the one hand, we find in Mach the idea that the human mind “attempts to mirror in itself the rich life of the world” (Mach 1895: 187; see also Mach 1896 [1986: 361]), which is consistent with the ideal of mental adaptation to facts as an attempt to reproduce observed phenomena as adequately as possible (in Knowledge and Error, Mach indeed argues that “the course of representations should adapt itself as closely as possible to physical and psychical experience” and should constitute “as faithful a picture as possible of the course of nature herself”; Mach 1905 [1976: 81–82]). On the other hand, Mach conceives of science as a mere tool for orienting ourselves in the natural world (Mach 1886 [1959: 37]; 1905 [1976: 2, 98 and 354]. See Gori 2019 for more on this point) and sometimes he mainly focuses on how well concepts help us to “cope with the wealth of experience” (Mach 1905 [1976: 81, 83]). For him, the elaboration of conceptual symbols allows us to spare mental effort and to reproduce a large number of facts in thought (Mach 1895: 191 ff.), but this activity implies an intervention into the received data and, consequently, results in a contraposition between theoretical and observational statements (Mach 1896 [1986: 365]).

Given the fundamentally economical character of our theoretical relationship with worldly events, it may be argued that Mach rejects objective realism as a viable option. However, it also remains uncontroversial that Mach does not defend an instrumentalism that leads to a sterile form of sceptical relativism – and this is the case precisely because of his general attitude towards the relationship between concepts and facts which has been outlined above (which has sometimes been interpreted in a pragmatist fashion; see e.g. Uebel 2021: 99; Gori 2018). This relationship may be viewed as a mild constructivist conception, according to which concepts are the product of a mental-economical activity while nevertheless remaining rooted in facts and therefore required to comply with their factual correlates – at least to some extent (see Mach 1895: 227). Constructivist features are indeed pervasive throughout Mach’s epistemology. In the Popular Scientific Lectures, for example, he argues that we achieve the scientific goal of “comprehend[ing] without effort” a domain of facts once we “mentally construct the whole province” (Mach 1895: 194). Moreover, in Principles of the Theory of Heat, Mach maintains that scientific “description” is “a construction of facts in thought” (Mach 1896 [1986: 370]), and that “the strict definition of a concept and … even the name of the concept is a stimulus to a precisely determined though often complicated … constructing activity whose result … is a term in the extension of the concept” (Mach 1896 [1986: 369]).

These ideas may be moderated by the fact that Mach never abandoned the notion that our engagement with the world is grounded on the physiological plane (see e.g. Mach 1905 [1976: 99]). This does not mean that the concepts elaborated by science correspond to something independent of the inquirer, but rather that the stimuli which science efficiently organizes into a coherent system may themselves be grounded in a further plane lying at the basis of human experience and which cannot be completely dismissed. In other words, about that natural world which “exists only once” (Mach 1895: 199), we may perhaps say nothing literally true; and yet, it still limits the proliferation of inconsistent ideas, whose value depends on the compliance of our mental symbols with the facts they reconstruct in thought (see Mach 1895: 227).

Mach’s view may be appreciated if one considers that, in developing his reflections on scientific knowledge, he consistently pays particular attention to the actual interests of the scientific community, whose main goal is to deal fruitfully with a wide range of facts (Mach 1905 [1976: 102]). The intellectual tools they develop are designed above all to achieve this goal, and the reconstruction of facts in thought should be understood as an activity of simplification that modifies the representation of the phenomena to be explained, both by extending their range and by highlighting different or new features (see e.g. Mach 1905 [1976: 98]). However, this theoretical activity constitutes only the first part of a process in which we elaborate hypotheses that must be successfully tested against sensible reality in order to become actual “knowledge.” This limitation is central to Mach’s epistemology, whose constructivist features sometimes appear more prominent than its (mildly) realist tenets. This becomes particularly evident in Mach’s conception of the laws of nature, which are, for him, mere “descriptions, that is, mimetic reproductions of facts in thought,” reproducing facts only “in that aspect which is important for us” (Mach 1895: 193; see also Mach 1883 [2013: 482]). Furthermore, Mach argues that “facts are always somewhat arbitrarily and forcibly defined with a view to the momentary intellectual aim” (Mach 1905 [1976: 3]), thereby situating scientific knowledge within the historical development of human culture and civilization.

In conclusion, Mach’s economical conception of science, closely connected to his historico-critical approach, highlights the situated nature of scientific knowledge and invites a reassessment of its value, particularly its metaphysical significance. More broadly, it enables Mach to reconcile a moderate constructivist thesis – according to which science is a multifactorial product shaped by human beings and their biologically and socially conditioned needs – with the realist tenet that the aim of science is to reflect facts in thought, that is, to provide a description that approximates worldly events as closely as possible. What emerges is a conception of science as an open-ended, self-correcting process of adaptation, in which theoretical constructions arise from, and are continually revised in response to, the practical and cognitive demands of a changing environment. In this respect, Mach anticipated a tendency that remains characteristic of much contemporary philosophy of science, insofar as he was already concerned with the tension between instrumentalist-constructivist and realist conceptions of knowledge.

4. Reception

Accounting for Mach’s influence in Vienna after World War I, Blackmore (1972: 301) cites the following recollection by Freidrich von Hayek: “I studied in Vienna exactly three years, 1918 to 1921, and as far as philosophical discussion went it essentially revolved around Mach’s ideas … Mach’s role was great not only in the narrow realm of the natural sciences, but especially in those fields where there were serious problems with respect to the methodological or scientific character of their theories”. Mach’s influence, however, extended well beyond academic philosophy and the sciences, reaching into Vienna’s cultural and literary milieu. In a short essay of 1904, entitled “Das unrettbare Ich” (“The Unsaveable Self”) – which clearly echoes Mach’s dictum in the Analysis of sensation, “Das Ich ist unrettbar” (usually translated as “the ego must be given up”, Mach 1886 [1959: 24]) – the Austrian writer and critic Hermann Bahr drew a parallel between Mach’s analysis of subjectivity and the tendencies of the circle of young writers known as Jung-Wien he helped shape at the Viennese Café Griensteidl during the 1890s. Among the members of this group was the poet, novelist, and dramatist Hugo von Hofmannstahl, who is reported to have attended Mach’s lectures in 1896 and whose engagement with Mach’s conceptions has been studied in depth (see Wunberg 1965: 23–40; O’Brien 1977). Mach also exerted a strong influence on the Austrian novelist and essayist Robert Musil, who completed his doctoral degree in philosophy at the University of Berlin in 1908 with a thesis entitled A Contribution to the Assessments of Mach’s Theories (Musil 1982). Beyond this early academic engagement, Machian motifs recur throughout Musil’s later work – most notably in The Man Without Qualities, where the reflections of the protagonist, the mathematician Ulrich Anders, repeatedly echo Mach’s ideas. More generally, Mach’s presence has been shown to permeate Musil’s broader essayistic production (Feng 2024; Sebastian 2005, 23–35).

More substantial – and, of course, longer-lasting – was Mach’s influence in science (especially physics) and philosophy. Much has been written about Mach’s complex relation to Albert Einstein, prompted both by Mach’s early endorsement of the principle of relativity and by his alleged later reservations about it. In a passage from a short essay on the development of spatial representations – extensively cited in the notes to The History and Root of the Principle of the Conservation of Energy – Mach wrote: “The physical space which I have in mind … contains time in itself” (Mach 1866: 232; 1872 [1911: 89]). In the 1909 revised edition of this essay, he added: “I subscribe, then, to the principle of relativity, which is also firmly upheld in my Mechanics and Theory of Heat” (Mach 1872 [1911: 95]), and referred to Hermann Minkowski’s 1908 lecture Raum und Zeit, where Minkowski declared that “space by itself and time by itself will recede completely to become mere shadows”, while exploring, in accordance with Einstein’s special relativity, the mathematical relations within the remaining single “type of union of the two [that] will still stand independently on its own” (Minkowski 2012: 39). Of course, one may question whether Mach had a clear or merely superficial grasp of the theory of relativity and of Minkowski’s four-dimensional space-time (Holton 1993: 60–65). Nevertheless, this passage seems to be a clear endorsement of Einstein’s conception, which also emerges from the Mach-Einstein correspondence and from other episodes of their lives, writings, and testimonies (Blackmore 1972, 252–53; Wolters 2012). Things changed abruptly with the posthumous publication, in 1921, of Mach’s Principles of Physical Optics, whose foreword rejected the theory of relativity – described as “growing more and more dogmatical” – as well as any attempt to consider Mach as one of its forerunners (Mach 1921 [2003: vii–viii]).

The reasons for Mach’s alleged dissatisfaction with the theory of relativity remain unclear and have long provoked debate among his readers, admirers (including Einstein), and later scholars. A compelling explanation has been provided by Gereon Wolters, who argues that the foreword to Mach’s Optics, in which Mach supposedly rejected Einstein’s theory, was almost certainly forged by his son, Ludwig Mach. Drawing on archival sources, correspondence, and a study of both Ernst and Ludwig Mach’s contexts, Wolters shows that the foreword’s date and content are inconsistent with the historical record. He attributes the alteration to Ludwig’s ambition and dependence: lacking theoretical competence yet seeking recognition as his father’s intellectual heir, Ludwig manipulated the text after Ernst Mach’s death to enhance his own standing and to appeal to anti-relativity circles. As Wolters observes, this distortion not only misled generations of scholars into portraying Mach as an opponent of Einstein, but also cast a dark shadow over his philosophy of science, accused of being sterile and anachronistic, insofar as it was thought to lead to consequences deemed untenable in light of the most advanced physical theories (Wolters 1987; 1989).

On the other hand, Einstein expressed on more than one occasion how important Mach had been for him, especially because Mach’s ideas helped Einstein to critically revise the foundations of physics, with particular regard to classical mechanics (see e.g. Einstein 1970: 21; 1916: 102). More broadly, Einstein argued that the influence of Mach’s historical and critical writings on the development of the individual sciences was such that even his opponents were unaware of how much of Mach’s thinking they had absorbed, “so to speak, with their mother’s milk” (Einstein 1916: 102; for more on this, see Staley 2021a).

If Mach’s engagement with relativity situates him at the center of early twentieth-century debates in physics, his most consequential and enduring philosophical reception took shape in interwar Vienna. From 1922 onward, the appointment of the physicist Moritz Schlick to Mach’s (and Boltzmann’s) former chair at the University of Vienna, together with the weekly private philosophical seminar he organized, attracted growing interest from scientifically oriented philosophers. Out of this milieu there gradually emerged a relatively stable group that became known as the Vienna Circle. Its manifesto, The scientific conception of world. The Vienna Circle, was published in 1929 under the auspices of the Verein Ernst Mach, an association founded shortly beforehand with the aim of promoting scientific and technical culture and whose membership substantially overlapped with that of the Circle itself (see Stadler 1992; 1997; 2007; 2021). The authors of the manifesto – Rudolf Carnap, Hans Hahn, and Otto Neurath – explicitly invoked Mach’s doctrines, highlighting his “intent on cleansing empirical science, and in the first place, physics, of metaphysical notions …, his critique of absolute space …, his struggle against the metaphysics of the thing-in-itself and of the concept of substance, and his investigations of the construction of scientific concepts from ultimate elements, namely sense data” (Carnap et al. 1929 [1973: 302]).

These emphases crystallized into what may be called a phenomenalist reading of Mach. According to this interpretation, Mach’s thought was primarily characterized by a sharp demarcation between empirical science and metaphysics, and by the role of sense data as the ultimate basis of knowledge, while his historico-critical methodology and his distinctive psycho-physical standpoint were accorded comparatively little significance. This phenomenalist image of Mach, however, did not originate with the Vienna Circle. It had already been central to Max Planck’s (1909) polemics against Mach and to Lenin’s attacks against the alleged “machist” interpretation of Marxism in Materialism and Empirio-Criticism (see Steila 2018). From the late 1920s onward, however, phenomenalism became closely associated with Mach’s name and came to dominate both sympathetic and critical receptions of his work. A particularly influential example is Karl Popper, who repeatedly portrayed Mach as a defender of “the view that physical things are bundles, or complexes, or constructs of phenomenal qualities, of particular experienced colors, noises, etc.”; this would imply, for Popper, that Mach rejected “that there is a physical world … behind the world of physical appearances” (Popper 1953: 173). This characterization, although polemical, proved remarkably persistent and played a decisive role in shaping Mach’s philosophical legacy for subsequent generations of philosophers.

The phenomenalist received view was challenged in the early 1970s, when the publication of John Blackmore’s (1972) biography of Mach, together with emerging trends in the philosophy and history of science, stimulated a renewed and more historically grounded interest in Mach’s scientific and philosophical work. A key figure in this re-evaluation was Paul Feyerabend, whose later engagement with Mach was at least partly motivated by his tendency to recognize in Mach early endorsements of views akin to his own. After largely adhering, in the late 1950s and 1960s, to the traditional, Popper-mediated interpretation of Mach as aligned with neo-positivism and logical empiricism, Feyerabend gradually revised his position. From the first edition of Against Method (1975) onward – and most explicitly in “Mach’s Theory of Research and its Relation to Einstein” (1984) – Feyerabend portrayed Mach as one of the earliest proponents of a fallibilist and evolutionary conception of science, committed to a fundamentally pluralist worldview (Preston 2024).

Bibliography

Works by Mach

  • 1860, “Über die Änderung des Tones und der Farbe durch Bewegung”, Sitzungsberichte der Kaiserlichen Akademie der Wissenschaften in Wien, Mathematisch-naturwissenschaftliche Classe, 41: 543–560.
  • 1863, “Vorträge über Psychophysik”, Österreichische Zeitschrift für Praktische Heilkunde, 9: 146–148, 167–170, 202–204, 225–228, 242–245, 260–261, 277–279, 294–298, 316–318, 335–338, 352–354, and 362–366.
  • 1865, “Über die Wirkung der räumlichen Vertheilung des Lichtreizes auf die Netzhaut”, Sitzungsberichte der Kaiserlichen Akademie der Wissenschaften in Wien. Mathematisch-Naturwissenschaftliche Classe, 52(2): 303–22.
  • 1866, “Bemerkungen über die Entwickelung der Raumvorstellungen”, Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Philosophische Kritik, 49: 227–232.
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  • 1874b, “Über den Gleichgewichtssinn. Dritte Mittheilung”, Sitzungsberichte der Kaiserlichen Akademie der Wissenschaften in Wien, Mathematisch-Naturwissenschaftliche Classe, 69(3): 44–51.
  • 1875, Grundlinien der Lehre von den Bewegungsempfindungen, Leipzig: Engelmann.
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  • 1886 [1959], Die Analyse der Empfindungen und das Verhältnis des Physischen zum Psychischen, Jena, Germany: Verlag von Gustav Fischer; translated as The Analysis of Sensations and the Relation of the Physical to the Psychical by M. Williams, revised and supplemented from the fifth German edition by Sydney Waterlow, New York: Dover Publications.
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  • 1894, “On the Principle of the Conservation of Energy”, The Monist, 5(1): 22–54.
  • 1895, lectures first given between 1864 and 1894, translated as Popular Scientific Lectures by Thomas J. McCormack, London: Open Court.
  • 1896 [1986], Die Prinzipien der Wärmelehre, Leipzig: Johann Ambrosius Barth Verlag; translated as Principles of the Theory of Heat: Historically and Critically Elucidated by P. E. B. Jourdain and A. E. Heath, Dordrecht: Springer/Reidel.
  • 1905 [1976], Erkenntnis und Irrtum: Skizzen zur Psychologie der Forschung, Leipzig: Johann Ambrosius Barth; translated as Knowledge and Error: Sketches on the Psychology of Enquiry by Thomas J. McCormack and Paul Foulkes, Dordrecht: Reidel, 1976.
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  • 1921 [2003], Die Prinzipien der physikalischen Optik Historisch und erkenntnispsychologisch entwickelt​​​​​​, ​Leipzig: Johann Ambrosius Barth Verlag; translated as The Principles of Physical Optics: An Historical and Philosophical Treatment by John S. Anderson and A. F. A. Young, New York: Dover.

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