1. As for abstract objects, textual evidence strongly suggests that what Zalta attempts to characterize is their whatness essence rather than their modal essence. He holds that abstract objects have two ways of having properties—exemplifying and encoding. Exemplifying is the usual way of having a property. Both ordinary and abstract objects exemplify properties. But abstract objects alone encode properties. To say that an abstract object encodes a property is to say that the property is included in our conception of the object. Consider the fictional character Sherlock Holmes. Holmes exemplifies such properties as being a fictional character and having been portrayed by Jeremy Brett and Benedict Cumberbatch. Holmes encodes such properties as being a detective and playing the violin. These encoded properties are ones that Holmes does not exemplify, since an abstract object cannot be a detective or play the violin. Now that the exemplifying/encoding distinction has been clarified, we can back up our initial claim. Zalta’s view is that the properties that are essential to an abstract object are those that it encodes (2006, p. 687). The textual evidence that this claim targets whatness essence rather than modal essence includes the following passages:

Clearly we do not want to identify not being a detective as one of Holmes’s essential properties, and this shows that encoded properties are more closely connected with the identity of Holmes than are the properties he exemplifies necessarily. (2006, p. 686)

It should be clear that the mathematical properties singleton Socrates encodes are even more central to its identity than the properties it necessarily exemplifies. Though singleton Socrates necessarily exemplifies the modal negations of concreteness-entailing properties, these are not part of its nature. (p. 689)

2. The distinction between logical and metaphysical possibility is sometimes talked about as the distinction between narrowly logical possibility and broadly logical possibility (see Plantinga 1974). That there is genuinely a distinction here is attested to by the fact that typical mathematical claims—such as Goldbach’s Conjecture that every even number greater than two is the sum of two primes, that there are infinitely many primes, that two plus two is four, and so on—are metaphysically but not logically necessary, if they are true at all. Similarly, typical philosophical claims—such as that personal identity consists in a certain kind of continuity of consciousness, that torturing innocent people is wrong, and so on—are metaphysically but not logically necessary, if they are true at all. For more on the distinction between metaphysical and logical possibility, see Clarke-Doane (2019).

3. Note that the phrase “any given object” is used to convey existential commitment — that is, the presupposition that there are objects. Without this commitment, neither “minimal essentialism” nor “maximal essentialism” will count as a form of essentialism, given that essentialism, as it was characterized at the outset, implies that some objects do have essential properties.

4. Quine may have had in mind only that there are intelligible sentences of this form. Kripke (2017a, n. 11), which is a paper that he wrote in a seminar given by Quine in the academic year 1961/2, says, “By ‘essentialism’ I think I simply meant that modal operators can apply to open sentences, and that quantifying in to such modally-operated open sentences is acceptable. No deeper philosophical doctrine was involved.”

5. It is also plausible to understand the sentence ‘Water is H\(_2\)O’ as an identity claim rather than in the way it is being understood here. On that understanding, the claim may be knowable a priori. For it may be that ‘Water’ and ‘H\(_2\)O’ function as logically proper names of a certain chemical substance, so that ‘Water is H\(_2\)O’ has the same content as ‘Water is water’ and ‘H\(_2\)O is H\(_2\)O’ (see Salmon (2003, p. 488) and Salmon (1987/1988, p. 197, n. 5)).

6. Fine treats ‘\(x\)’s essence’, ‘what \(x\) is’, ‘\(x\)’s nature’, ‘\(x\)’s identity’, ‘\(x\)’s real definition’, and ‘\(x\)’s objectual definition’ as interchangeable. (Fine does not to our knowledge use the locution ‘what it is to be \(x\)’.)

7. Fine (1994) holds that whatness essence “is not to be understood in modal terms or even to be regarded as extensionally equivalent to a modal notion” (p. 3, our emphasis). Much of his case consists of providing counterexamples to the claim that modal essentiality and whatness essentiality are coextensive. But he also says that it is not critical that the reader actually endorse the particular modal and whatness essential claims to which his counterexamples appeal: “All that is necessary is that he [the reader] should recognize the intelligibility of a position which makes such claims” (p. 5). While such a recognition would arguably be enough to refute an account according to which whatness essential properties are to be understood (in the relevant way) in terms of modally essential properties, it would not be enough to refute the coextensionality claim that Fine has in his sights.

8. Although these types of counterexamples are most closely associated with Fine (1994), they were discussed earlier in Dunn (1990). In fact, as Dunn points out, Marcus (1967) and Parsons (1967) discussed similar examples of “trivially essential” properties, even though Marcus and Parsons were not thinking of them as counterexamples to MAW.

9. Our neutral stance reflects that when one of the authors of the present encyclopedia entry asked, “Can you name anyone working within the framework of QML [quantified modal logic] in the 1970s–1980s who you think held the modal account of whatness?”, Fine replied, “I am not sure anyone did, but the evidence is not clear” (personal correspondence of July 10, 2021).

10. For the sake of simplicity, we are ignoring the view that nothing can belong to a set unless it and the set both exist. Taking that view on board, the features that should be invoked are \((\lambda z)[z \rexists \rightarrow z \in \{\rSocrates\}]\) and \((\lambda z)[z\rexists \rightarrow z \in \{z\}]\) rather than \((\lambda z)[z \in \{\rSocrates\}]\) and \((\lambda z)[z \in \{z\}]\), respectively.

11. It may be worth pointing out that the intuition that if one’s parents had not gotten together, then one would never have existed does not straightforwardly offer support for origin essentialism. Compare: the fact that if Ed had not lit the cigarette, then the house would never have burned down does not mean that it is impossible for the house to have burned down without Ed’s lighting the cigarette. In general it is one thing to say that \(B\) would not have happened had \(A\) not happened and another to say that \(B\) could not have happened without \(A\)’s happening.

12. The three versions of the argument that appear in this section are taken—with some minor changes—from Salmon (1981, Chapter 7 and Appendix I). Salmon offers translations of the argument into the language of quantified modal logic. Those who are so inclined may verify their validity by means of the formal translations. For those who are not so inclined, we hope our explanation makes the reasoning clear.

13. To see modal tolerance as a direct threat to the sufficiency premise of the argument for origin essentialism rather than as a direct threat to the thesis of origin essentialism itself, just start from its being possible for \(a\) to be the only table originally made from \(m\) according to plan \(p\) and its being possible for \(b\) to be the only table originally made from \(m_n\) according to plan \(p\). In the case of \(a\), repeated applications of modal tolerance for origins together with the assumption that whatever is possibly possible is possible gets us to a possible world in which it is the only table originally made from \(m_{n/2}\) according to plan \(p\). In the case of \(b\), repeated applications of modal tolerance for origins together with the assumption that whatever is possibly possible is possible gets us to a possible world in which \(it\) is the only table originally made from \(m_{n/2}\) according to plan \(p\). The sufficiency premise then incorrectly identifies \(a\) and \(b\).