Paul Grice

Herbert Paul Grice, universally known as Paul, was born on March 13, 1913 in Birmingham, England and died on August 28, 1988 in Berkeley CA. Grice received firsts in classical honours moderation (1933) and literae humaniores (1935) from Corpus Christi College, Oxford. After a year teaching in a public school, he returned to Oxford where, with a nearly five year interruption for service in the Royal Navy, he taught in various positions until 1967 when he moved to the University of California-Berkeley. He taught there past his official 1979 retirement until his death in 1988. He was philosophically active until his death—holding discussions at his home, giving lectures and editing a collection of his work that was posthumously published as Studies in the Way of Words. He is best known for his highly innovative work in philosophy of language, but also made important contributions to metaphysics, ethics and to the study of Aristotle and Kant. His work continues to be very influential (and controversial) not just in philosophy, but also in areas such as linguistics, artificial intelligence studies and animal communication studies. Although relatively little work was published during his life, he had a very wide influence via lectures and unpublished manuscripts. The best known of these were the William James Lectures which he gave at Harvard in early 1967 and which circulated widely in unauthorized manuscript form until they were published as part of Studies in the Way of Words. He also played cricket, chess and piano, each at a very high level of accomplishment. A useful biography including both Grice’s personal and professional life is Chapman 2005; the review by Potts provides more perspective on some of the points.

• 1. Overview
• 2. Defending a dogma
• 3. Conversational implicature
• 4. Meaning
  • 4.1 Speaker Meaning
  • 4.2 Sentence Meaning
• 5. Reasoning
• 6. Everyday Psychological Explanation
• 7. Ontology
• 8. Ordinary Language Philosophy
• 9. Ethics
• 10. Conclusion
• Bibliography
  • Primary Sources
  • Secondary Sources
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Overview

The best known of the works published during Grice’s lifetime was his joint paper with Peter Strawson, “In Defense Of A Dogma”, a widely reprinted defense of the analytic/synthetic distinction against Quine’s attack in “Two Dogmas Of Empiricism”. The best known of his ideas, that of a conversational implicature, first appeared in a 1961 paper “The Causal Theory Of Perception”, but was a focus of the James Lectures. In contrast to the slogan, “meaning is use”, often associated (though perhaps inaccurately) with Wittgenstein, Grice distinguished those elements of language use which were due to meaning from those which are due to other aspects. To illustrate, the sentence “He has not been convicted of a crime yet” means that the person being referred to has not yet been convicted of a crime. But in many contexts, the speaker would be taken to imply that the person had committed at least one crime and was likely to be convicted in the future. In “The Causal Theory of Perception,” Grice deploys the distinction against J. L. Austin’s claim in Sense and Sensibilia that a sentence like ‘It looks to me as if I see something red’ is only correctly used when someone (in this case the speaker) has reason to doubt or deny that the speaker actually sees something red. Austin’s target is sense-datum theorists who attempt to introduce sense-data by appeal to such sentences. Grice argues convincingly that, while using the sentence may typically imply the doubt-or-denial condition, that implication is not part of the meaning of the sentence since the speaker can cancel the implication by adding ‘I do not mean to imply that there is any reason to doubt or deny that I see something red.’ What the speaker means on such a occasion can be true even if the speaker is using the sentence in an usual way, and there is no reason to doubt or deny the speaker sees something red.

This distinction between meaning and use has found many applications in philosophy, linguistics and artificial intelligence. Both the analytic/synthetic distinction, which relies on a conception of truth by virtue of meaning, and the idea of a conversational implicature require for their full philosophical development a theory of meaning. Grice provided the beginning of a theory of meaning starting with his 1957 paper “Meaning” and elaborated in later papers (Grice 1968, 1969a, 1982). The basic idea was to distinguish two notions of meaning: what a sentence means in general apart from any use of it, and what a specific speaker means by using the sentence on a particular occasion. Grice sees the latter notion as entirely a matter of what the speaker intends. Grice is widely seen as arguing that the abstract notion of sentence meaning is to be understood in terms of what specific speakers intend on specific occasions. His early work (Grice 1957) proposes this, but his later work (Grice 1982) significantly refines the proposal. The following sections will outline the Grice-Strawson arguments for an analytic-synthetic distinction (Section 2), notions of conversational implicature (3), and then delve into his theories about meaning (4), reasoning (5), psychology (6), ontology (7), Oxford Ordinary Language Philosophy (8), and ethics (9).

2. Defending a dogma

Grice and Strawson begin their article with a dissection of the various ways one can reject a dichotomy and conclude that Quine’s rejection of the analytic/synthetic distinction is one of the more extreme cases: “He declares, or seems to declare, not merely that the distinction is useless or inadequately clarified, but that it is altogether illusory, that the belief in its existence is a philosophical mistake” (Grice & Strawson, 142). They deploy a number of arguments against Quine’s position. But the two main ones involve the distinction between an utterance meaning something and not meaning anything, and between the kind of revision of belief that merely recognize a previous belief as false and the kind which involves a change of concept, and hence a change in the meaning of a word. These can both be illustrated with their pair of example sentences:

1. My neighbor’s three year old child understands Russell’s theory of types.
2. My neighbor’s three year old child is an adult.

They claim that it is not difficult to understand what someone would mean by uttering (1), and it is fairly clear what it would take to persuade someone that (1) is not false, as seems initially evident. But in the case of (2), they argue, in effect, that with further investigation one would either conclude that the speaker was using familiar words to express new concepts, or else would conclude that nothing at all was being said.

Grice’s views on Ordinary Language Philosophy shed light on his stance regarding the Quinean claim that no statements are by virtue of meaning immune to rational revision. Grice subscribed to a version of the Ordinary Language methodology Austin outlined in “A Plea for Excuses,” where Austin insists on the importance to philosophical inquiries of clarifying what we mean by the relevant parts of ordinary language. See Section 8. The inquiries need not, however, end with the mere clarification of what we mean. “Ordinary language is not the last word; in principle, it can everywhere be supplemented and improved on and superseded. Only remember, it is the first word” (Austin 1979, 185). One can consistently hold (a) that a “first word” investigation shows some claims are true (or false) by virtue of what words mean now as evidenced by the fact that we cannot now give a coherent description of a cases in which, for example, ‘My neighbor’s three-year old child is an adult’ is true, or in which ‘Green is a color’ is false, and also hold (b) that truth-by-virtue-of-meaning of this sort does not confer immunity to rational revision. Grice and Strawson make essentially this point: “Now for the doctrine that there is no statement which is in principle immune from revision, no statement which might not be given up in the face of experience. Acceptance of this doctrine is quite consistent with adherence to the distinction between analytic and synthetic statements” (Grice & Strawson 1956, 156–57). Nothing in the claim that what we mean now makes ‘Green is a color’ true by virtue of meaning entails that we may not later come to regard it as false. Grice and Strawson add, however, that proponents of no immunity to revision must also acknowledge “the distinction between that kind of giving up which consists in merely admitting falsity, and that kind of giving up which involves changing or dropping a concept or set of concepts” (Grice & Strawson 1956, 157). This, however, is what Quineans deny. They insist that, for purposes of describing and evaluating changes over time in what people are willing to assent to—especially the changes that occur in the evolution of scientific theories—there is no empirically meaningful distinction between change of meaning and change of belief (see for example, Harman 1973, 98). To illustrate (but not argue for) the claim, consider Newton and Einstein on mass. For Newton, mass is constant regardless of motion, is the same for all observers, and satisfies the formula force = mass times acceleration. For Einstein, mass varies with the observer’s frame of reference, increases with velocity, curves spacetime, and satisfies the formula energy = mass times the square to the speed of light. When former Newtonians embrace the theory of relativity, do they change what they mean by ‘mass,’ or do they change what they believe about mass? Grice and Strawson insist that the answer must be one or the other. Quineans deny that one can (without question begging assumptions) produce empirical evidence that decides in favor of one of the options. Grice and Strawson owe an explanation of how a “first word” inquiry into what we mean now can establish that such a evidence exists.

No attempt will be made here to adjudicate this dispute with Quine. Further consideration depends on elucidating the notion of the meaning of an utterance, and Section 4 will explore Grice’s account of this notion further.

3. Conversational implicature

Conversational implicatures are, roughly, things that a hearer can work out from the way something was said rather than what was said. People process conversational implicatures all of the time and are mostly unaware of it. For example, if someone asks “Could you close the door?” the hearer does not usually answer “Yes”, instead they perform the non-linguistic act of closing the door. In this case, although the speaker used a form of words that is conventionally a question, the hearer can infer that the speaker is making a request.

Grice was the first to note this ubiquitous feature of language use and also the first to present a philosophical analysis. His analysis shares a feature with his work on communicative interactions generally. That work focused on “the rationality or irrationality of conversational conduct,” which he was “concerned to track down rather than any more general characterization of conversational adequacy” (Grice 1989, 369). Grice’s work on implicature, meaning, and reasoning suggests that two conditions characterize the cases he focused on in his account of implicature. (1) Shared goal: the parties are communicating in order to achieve a shared goal. (2) Shared knowledge: the parties know (1). For later reference, call cases meeting (1)–(2) “Cooperative Communication Situations.” Grice’s account of such situations is spread through his work on implicature, meaning, and reasoning. He uses only commonsense psychological assumptions to paint a picture of how—in principle if not in fact—a speaker could reason about how to produce a response in an audience, and an audience could reason about how to respond. The point of using only those resources is to deepen “our understanding by reflection on what is already closest to us—the experiences, thoughts, concepts, and activities that make up our lives [and constitute and inform everyday psychological explanation], and that ordinarily escape notice because they are so familiar.” The words are Thomas Nagel’s (Nagel 2009), but the goal was one of Grice’s lifelong philosophical ambitions.

A key component of analysis of implicature is the Cooperative Principle: “Make your conversational contribution such as is required, at the stage at which it occurs, by the accepted purpose or direction of the talk exchange in which you are engaged” (Grice 1989, 26). At a more detailed level, he distinguishes four categories with more specific maxims. The category of Quantity includes two injunctions, one to make your contribution as informative as is required, and the second to make it no more informative than is required. The category of Quality is governed by a supermaxim: “Try to make your contribution one that is true”. The category of Relation has a single maxim, “Be relevant”, while the final category of Manner has a short “super” maxim “Be perspicuous” which has various submaxims (Grice 1989, 27).

Perhaps the first thing to note is that conversational maxims often come into conflict. One party to the conversation may be caught between saying something less informative than is desired (violating Quantity) and saying something for which there is insufficient evidence (violating Quality). One example of the application of these principles given by Grice is the following exchange between A and B:

1. I’m low on gas.
2. There is a station around the corner on Main St.

In this situation the sentence B uttered does not logically imply that the station is open. However, the remark is irrelevant unless the station is open, so A can infer from the combination of Manner and Quality that B believes he has good evidence that the station is open. Thus B’s utterance conversationally implicates that the station is open. One characteristic of conversational implicatures is that they can be cancelled. Thus if B adds to his remark above, “but I don’t know whether it is open” then there is no conversational implicature that the station is open. This contrasts with logical or semantic implications which cannot be cancelled without contradiction.

Perhaps the most famous application of Grice’s ideas is to the debate about whether the truth conditions of declarative conditional statements, such as “If George is driving, he will be late” are accurately captured by the material conditional. Representing the sample sentences as ‘George is driving \(\rightarrow\) he will be late’ would make the sentence true if it is false that George is driving or true that he will be late (or both). Many writers argued that it would be inappropriate for someone to make the assertion if they knew that George was not driving. Grice’s response is that to argue that in most circumstances it is conversationally inappropriate to make that assertion, not because it is false, but because it violates conversational principles.

Symbolically, \(A \rightarrow B\) should not be asserted in circumstances where the speaker knows that \(A\) is false because the statement not-\(A\) is true and simpler; similarly, if the speakers knows \(B\) is true, \(B\) is a shorter simpler statement. The maxim of Quantify imposes the desideratum of simplicity. And, if the speaker knows both of those facts, then not-\(A\) and \(B\), is more informative. Thus the only circumstances in which the conditional is appropriate is where the speaker is ignorant of the truth values of \(A\) and \(B\), but has some good reason to think that if \(A\) does prove to be true, \(B\) will as well. On this account, the truth conditions of the conditional are those of the material implication, but the appropriate assertibility of a conditional tracks the conditional probability of \(B\) given \(A\).

It should be noted that while this explanation of the circumstances in which a conditional is asserted seems very plausible, the account does not readily extend to apparent discrepancies between ordinary language conditionals and the material conditional when the conditional is embedded in a larger context, e.g., “Mary believes that if George is driving, he will be late”. Mary’s believing that George will be late allows Mary to immediately form the material conditional belief George is driving \(\rightarrow\) George will be late. But this is clearly not enough for a speaker reporting on Mary’s beliefs to assert that Mary therefore believes that if George is driving then George will be late. Grice’s explanation cannot say why.

In the last two decades, there has been a burgeoning number of researchers investigating conversational implicature and Grice’s principles. Criticisms have come from two opposing directions. Some critics argue that Grice’s maxims are not sufficiently worked out to explain many of the phenomena related to implicature. For example, in the sentence, “Joan believes that some of her students will fail,” there seems to be an implicature that not all of her students will fail, even though the contained sentence is not asserted. In another direction, Wilson and Sperber, and separately Bardzokas, argue that Grice’s principles can be derived from more general principles and should be understood in the context of some version of relevance theory.

This section concludes by addressing the criticisms (1) that Grice’s principles can be derived from some more general theory, and (2) that some version of relevance theory can serve as the general theory. It seems that (1) would not have surprised Grice nor elicited much disagreement. Regarding (2), it seems that Grice’s account of conversational implicatures and a relevance theory account of the same have different but compatible goals, which was Grice’s view (in conversation). To see how conversational maxims can be derived from a more general theory, assume Alice (driver) and Bob (passenger) are in a car and running very low on gas. Assume that they are in a Cooperative Communicative Situation where they are communicating to achieve the shared goal of reaching their destination without running out of gas. Adherence to the conversational maxims facilitates achieving that goal, and Bob, as a rational participant in the Cooperative Communicative Situation, adheres to them when he utters Bob utters ‘Pat’s is nearby.’ The best explanation of Bob’s utterance is that he is implicating that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. Alice, as a rational participant in the Cooperative Communication Situation, so infers. Grice’s maxims, including the Cooperative Principle, are simply precepts that rational participants in a Cooperative Communicative Situation would follow. Note this explanation is consistent with the goal of deepening our understanding of what is already closest to us. The explanation just employs concepts and principles that are part of everyday commonsense psychology.

There is an illuminating contrast with Sperber and Wilson’s relevance theory. For Sperber and Wilson, when a speaker makes an utterance in an intentional effort to convey information, the audience’s task is to interpret the utterance in light of their knowledge of the language and of the context of the utterance. The process is governed by Cognitive Principle of Relevance. That is an empirical hypothesis advanced with the goal of increasing our understanding of communicative interactions beyond what is found in everyday psychological explanation. Grice and relevance theory have different, arguably compatible and complementary, goals. A version of relevance theory will not, however, provide an explanation solely by reflection on what is already closest to us.

Another continuing topic generated by Grice’s ideas is the relation between semantics and pragmatics (see the entry on Pragmatics). The nature of the distinction is controversial, as argued by Bach 1997 and Horn 2006. Korta & Perry 2011 (Ch. 11) points out that there are various theoretical meanings to “proposition” and that the extent to which pragmatic principles are needed to determine the proposition expressed by an utterance depends on which understanding of proposition is in play. Two examples of the ongoing debate are LePore and Stone 2015 which argues that most, or perhaps all, of what Grice thought as pragmatic is in fact governed by linguistic rules, and Recanati 2010 which argues to the contrary, namely that pragmatics plays a larger role than is generally recognized.

4. Meaning

Grice offers analyses of speaker meaning (the act of meaning something on a particular occasion) and sentence, word, and phrase meaning (hereinafter collectively “sentence meaning”). There is a persistent but mistaken view that the “Gricean Program” consists analyzing speaker meaning in terms of speakers’ intentions and then analyzing sentence meaning without semantic remainder in terms of speaker meaning. The 1957 article “Meaning” does (tentatively) suggest that, but the 1968 article “Utterer’s Meaning, Sentence Meaning, and Word-Meaning” does not. It does analyze sentence meaning in terms of persistent patterns in speaker meaning, but the characterization of those patterns draws on resources that import semantic notions that cannot be reduced to mere patterns in speakers’ intentions.

4.1 Speaker Meaning

4.1.1 The Initial Account

The 1957 article begins with a series of sample statements that lead to the distinction between natural and non-natural meaning. The discussion is an excellent example of an analysis in the style of mid-twentieth century Oxford Ordinary Language philosophy (see Section 8). The point is to raise the question of what distinguishes the two cases. To introduce Grice’s answer, imagine you are stopped at night at an intersection when the driver in an oncoming car flashes her lights. You reason as follows: “Why is she doing that? Oh, she must intend me to believe that my lights are not on. If she has that intention, it must be that my lights are not on. So, they are not.” To summarize, The driver flashes her lights intending:

1. that you believe that your lights are not on;
2. that you recognize her intention (1);
3. that this recognition be part of your reason for believing that your lights are not on.

As Stephen Schiffer notes (Schiffer 1972, 11), this ‘reason for believing’ formulation is essentially the restatement Strawson offers in “Intention and Convention in Speech Acts” (Strawson 1964). Grice motivates the “reason for believing” requirement by asking us to reflect on examples. He asks us, for example, to imagine Herold presenting Salome with the head of John The Baptist. Grice comments, “Herod intended to make Salome believe that St. John the Baptist was dead and no doubt also intended Salome to recognize that he intended her to believe that St. John the Baptist was dead.” But he takes it to be clear on reflection that Herod did not mean that he was dead because his intended reason for Salome’s believing that John The Baptist was dead was that she could see his severed head, not that Herod intended her to believe that.

Call an intention that meets conditions like (1)–(3) an M–intention. Grice’s idea is that, where \(p\) is a proposition, an utterer \(U\) means that \(p\) by uttering \(x\) if and only if \(U\) M-intends that \(p\) by uttering \(x\). We will use ‘M-intends’ in this way in what follows to refer to the intentions constitutive of speaker meaning, however those intentions are specified. Utterances may include, not just sounds and marks but also gesture, grunts, and groans—anything that can signal an M-intention. The example illustrates an indicative M-intention. Grice and Schiffer extend the definition of an M-intention to other speech acts (Grice 1968, 1969a; Schiffer 1972, Chapter 5). It is sufficient for purposes of this discussion to focus on indicative utterances. Grice and Schiffer offer various revisions of the original definition of an M-intention. We will use ‘M-intention’ to cover them all, letting the context indicate which definition we mean.

There are three problems with this analysis.

First: Consider the requirement that the audience have the recognition of an intention as (at least part of) the audience’s reason to believe that p. That is plausible in the flashing lights case. Not only could one reason in the way noted, it is likely one would. The problem is that further reflection makes the requirement at least appear to be obviously wrong. This sentence is an example. You understand it straightaway seemingly without any reasoning at all. The same is true for us (the authors): the words just occurred to us as we wrote them. The discussion of this issue is deferred to Section 5 on reasoning. It is worth noting here, however, one rationale for Grice’s insistence on the “have as a reason” requirement. Grice saw people as end-setters—as freely adopting and pursuing certain ends, where one hallmark of the free action was that it was under the control of reasons and reasoning. For Grice, we value our activity as end-setters, and he sees (at least a central an important range of) voluntary conversational exchanges as an instance of something we value: free, reason-guided activity.

Second: the account of speaker meaning quantifies over an unexplained notion of a proposition. How can this not introduce an unanalyzed semantic notion into the account of speaker meaning? The answer, deferred to the discussion of the 1968 account of sentence meaning, is that it does.

Third, there are well-known prima facie counterexamples to the account. Grice’s response (Grice 1968 and 1969a) is two-fold. In some cases, he argues that the example ceases to be a counterexample when it is described with sufficient care (as in his treatment of Searle’s “Kennst du das Land, wo die Zitronen blühen” example). In other cases, he argues that a well-motivated revision of the definition applies to the example (as in his treatment of “audience-less” cases). It is sufficient here to let Grice speak for himself—with the exception of certain of Schiffer’s counterexamples (Schiffer, 1972). Schiffer offers a series of counterexamples that lead him to introduce creating common knowledge as a requirement for speaker meaning.

The following example (adapted from Schiffer 1972) begins the series. Alice is singing and playing the piano alone in her home when Bob enters the room. She wants Bob to leave, but she does not want to explicitly tell him to leave, so she adopts the following plan. She sings “Moon Over Miami” in a raucous voice, which she knows Bob finds annoying. She sings with the following intentions:

1. Bob should leave;
2. Bob should recognize her intention (1)
3. his recognition should be part of his reason for leaving;
4. Bob should mistakenly believe that Alice does not have intention (3).

Alice’s plan is that Bob should think “She intends me to think that her singing will make me leave the room, but I see through that. I see that she intends my reason for leaving to be that she intends me to leave.” There is a discrepancy between the reason Alice intends Bob to think Alice intends him to have and the reason Alice actually intends him to have for leaving. Given that deception, Schiffer takes it to be clear that Alice does not mean that Bob should leave. An obvious solution is to change (4) to: Bob should recognize Alice’s intention (3). (Compare Strawson, 1964).

Schiffer responds with a series of counterexamples to show that for any such condition

(n) the speaker intends the audience to recognize the speaker’s intention (n−1)

there is a counterexample in which the speaker has the n+1th intention that the audience mistakenly believe that speaker does not have the intention n.

To illustrate, suppose that a few days after the “Moon Over Miami” incident, Bob again joins Alice as she is singing. This time, to reveal her distain for Bob’s intrusion, her plan it to trick him into thinking falsely that he is in another another “Moon Over Miami situation.” She sings “Tipperary” in a raucous voice, intending:

1. Bob should leave;
2. Bob should recognize her intention (1);
3. his recognition should be part of his reason for leaving;
4. Bob should recognize her intention (3).
5. Bob should mistakenly believe that she does not have the intention (4).

Before this incident, Alice arranged for a friend and co-conspirator to send Bob a text telling him that, the next time he intruded on Alice’s singing, she would try to make him think he was in another “Moon Over Miami” situation but would actually intend part of his reason for leaving to be that she intends him to leave. Her plan succeeds. Bob thinks: “She intends part of my reason for leaving to be that she intends me to leave, but she does not intend me to realize that she has that intention. She still intends me to think that she intends her singing to be my reason for leaving.” Again, Alice does not mean that Bob should leave.

Schiffer claims that in principle we could keep constructing examples of the above kind (Schiffer 1972, 23). Schiffer concludes that if a speaker is “to mean something by uttering x, then all of his intentions necessary for meaning something must be out in the open; there must be no possibility of ‘hidden’ intentions which are constitutive of an act of meaning” (Schiffer 1972, 59, citing Strawson 454). He proposes to capture the “open in the open” condition by requiring common knowledge, the recursive belief state of our knowing that p, knowing that we know that p, knowing that we know that we know that we know that p … and so on, potentially but not actually ad infinitum. Thus:

A speaker S means that p for an audience A by uttering U if and only if it is common knowledge between S and A that S M-intends that p for A by uttering U.

The second order knowledge of meaning-relevant intentions comes, not from a speaker’s intention that certain intentions be recognized, but from the existence of common knowledge. Grice disagrees (Grice 1969a, 155–57), and Schiffer replies (Schiffer 1972, 24–26).

For a perspective on this debate, note that counterexamples are not the only reason to require common knowledge. Another reason is that common knowledge plays a key role in facilitating coordination among individuals generally (Pinker 2025, Sloan and Warner 2021), and there is no reason to think communicative interactions are an exception. Indeed, it would be surprising if our concept of speaker meaning failed to incorporate a feature critical to facilitating coordination in a wide range of other cases. A persistent but mistaken objection is that common knowledge requires what is impossible, that people know an infinite amount of knowledge (e.g., Jankovic, 2020, 186). To see why this is wrong, consider that the following condition is sufficient for the common knowledge that p to exist in a group G: (1) all members of G come to know that p in a way W (disjunctive ways allowed), and (2) by virtue of coming to know that p in way W, all members of G know (1) (Sloan and Warner 2021, Chapters 3 and 4, the point is implicit in Schiffer 1972, 34–35, and Lewis 1969). Fulfillment of (1) and (2) ensures that member of G have—in principle—the capacity to generate, for any finite number n, a sequence of n levels of knowledge. In practice, all we ever do is generate relatively small number of levels as needed.

4.1.2 The Account In “Utterer’s Meaning, Sentence Meaning, and Word Meaning”

Grice offers a revised version of his 1957 account of utterers meaning. He notes that

[in] the earlier (1957) account I took the view that the M-intended effect is, in the case of indicatives-type utterance, that the hearer should believe something, and, in the case of imperative-type utterances, that the hearer should do something. I wish for present purposes to make two changes here.

1. I wish to represent the M-intended effect of imperative-type utterances as being that the hearer should intend to do something (with, of course, the ulterior intention on the part of the utter that the hearer go on to do the act in question).
2. I wish to regard the M-intended effect common to indicative-type utterances as being, not that the hearer should believe something (though there will frequently be an ulterior intention to that effect), but the hearer should think that the utterer believes something.

(1968, 230).

The change in (2) avoids a range of counterexamples to the 1957 account. That account required that a speaker intend to produce a belief in an audience and intend the audience’s recognition of that intention to be part of the audience’s reason for so believing. The following exchange illustrates the problem. Rachel is walking with Roger, when a mutual acquaintance approaches. Rachel asks, “What’s her name?” Roger utters “Rose.” He intends Rachel to believe that the acquaintance’s name is ‘Rose,’ but he does not intend to produce this belief through her recognition of his intention to do so. He knows that the mere utterance of the name will be sufficient to jog Rachel’s memory. Schiffer’s response to this and a range of other examples is to drop the “recognition as a reason” requirement (Schiffer 1972, 42–48). The following formulation of Schiffer’s alternative definition simplifies it. There is no need to consider its full complexity. Focusing for convenience on the case of assertion, Schiffer proposes that

S means that p by uttering x for an audience A if and only, for a relation R between x and p, it is common knowledge between S and A that S uttered x intending: (1) that the utterance should cause A to believe that p, and (2) that A should so believe in part on the basis of x’s having R to p.

Here, the “basis” is that x’s having R to p is evidence that p (Schiffer in conversation 2019). Section 4.2 returns to Schiffer’s alternative to Grice’s “recognition of intention as a reason” requirement.

To state his new approach to keeping that requirement , Grice introduces notation that he also uses in his account of sentence meaning. By way of illustration, suppose \(U\), who wants the audience \(A\) to close the door, utters ‘Close the door.’ \(U\) M-intends that \(A\) should intend to close the door, and note: we specify what \(U\) means using the subjunctive mood. \(U\) means that \(A\) should close the door. For the indicative case, suppose \(U\) utters ‘The door is closed,’ M-intending that \(A\) believe \(U\) believes the door is closed. We specify what \(U\) means using the indicative mood—thus: \(U\) means that the door is closed.

Grice captures the role of moods in specifying meaning by introducing a special notation. He represents the indicative case this way: \(U\) means that \(\vdash\)(the door is closed); the imperative: \(U\) means that !(the door is closed). Here ‘the door is closed’ represents a moodless, underlying syntactical element Grice calls a sentence radical; it designates the moodless proposition that the door is closed. Grice calls ‘\(\vdash\)’ and ‘!’ mood operators, and he explains them contextually as follows:

1. \(U\) means that \(\vdash(p)\) by uttering \(x\) if and only if, for some \(A\), \(U\) utters \(x\) M-intending \(A\) to think \(U\) thinks that \(p\);
2. \(U\) means that \(!(p)\) by uttering \(x\) if and only, for some \(A\), if \(U\) utters \(x\) M-intending (a) \(A\) to think \(U\) intends (to bring it about) that \(p\); and (b) \(A\) to intend that \(p\)—having, as part of his reason \(U\)’s intention (a).

More than two operators are required to handle the full range of things utterers mean, but a complete list is not necessary to formulate the revised account of meaning. The account can be stated as follows. Given a function from psychological states onto mood operators, if \(\psi\) is a psychological state and \(*_{\psi}\) the associated mood operator,

\(U\) means that \(*_{\psi}(p)\) by uttering \(x\) if and only if, for some \(A\), \(U\) utters \(x\) M-intending

1. that \(A\) should think \(U\) to \(\psi\) that \(p\); and (in some cases only), depending on \(*_{\psi}\),
2. that \(A\) should via fulfillment of (i), himself \(\psi\) that \(p\).

4.2 Sentence Meaning

This section examines Grice’s account of sentence meaning in “Utterer’s Meaning, Sentence Meaning, and Word Meaning”, The fundamental idea is to define what it is for a sentence σ to mean a proposition p in a group G in terms of actual and possible instances of speaker meaning that p in G. The infinite number of sentences in a natural language means the possible instances of speaker meaning are infinite. How do we associate infinite number of sentences with an infinite number of propositions?

We know the answer in broad outline. In some yet unexplained way, information processing in the brain combines semantically interpreted lexical representations into complex structures in ways that underlie thought and language. We can distinguish two types of components in those structures. Contextually invariant components, and components whose full specification is contextually dependent, such as the mental counterparts of indexicals, proper names, definite descriptions like “The [contextually definite] boy,” grammatical mood, and tense. We can identify those structures, or some subset of them, with propositions. Some propositions contain no contextually invariant components, e.g., the proposition that snow is (timeless),while others contain contextually specified components, e.g., the proposition that that-contextually-specified-item belongs in the contextually-specified place. In identifying and explaining how the components of propositions work, the theory would explain how beliefs and other psychological attitudes refer to things. Our current talk of propositions is a promissory note drawn on such a theory.

The processes (or subset or some extension of them) that generate propositions also associate them with sentences that have the same underlying structure as the associated proposition. In ways we do not yet understand, these processes give those who have mastered a natural language the ability to speaker mean propositions using sentences of that language (see, e.g., Chomsky 1998, 380 and Chomsky 2016).

Grice agrees with the need for processes that generate associations between an infinite number of sentences and an infinite number of propositions. He does not acknowledge the point in “Utterer’s Meaning, Sentence Meaning, and Word Meaning”, but he did so routinely in conversation and teaching. He also agrees that the processes that generate the association explain the ability of those who have mastered a natural language to speaker mean propositions using sentences of that language. His explanation of that ability appeals to implicitly followed rules:

We can, if we are lucky, identify “linguistic rules,” so called, which are such that our linguistic practice is as if we accepted these rules and consciously followed them. But we want to say that this is not just an interesting fact about our linguistic practice but also an explanation of it; and this leads us on to suppose that “in some sense,” “implicitly,” we do accept these rules.Now the proper interpretation of the idea that we do accept these rules becomes something of a mystery, if the “acceptance” of the rules is to be distinguished from the existence of the related practices]but it seems like a mystery which, for the time being at least, we have to swallow, while recognizing that it involves us in an as yet unsolved problem. (Grice 1968, 245)

The appeal to implicitly followed linguistic rules casts a revealing light on Grice as a champion of the view that communication is an exercise in rational coordination through acts of speaker meaning. Since Grice, a central question has been “[h]ow much of this coordination derives from interlocutors’ specific knowledge of one another as people? How much exploits their knowledge of language itself?” (Lepore and Stone 2015, 1). With the appeal to implicitly followed rules, Grice has one foot squarely on “knowledge of language itself” side of that divide.

To define sentence meaning, Grice characterizes the implicit following of the relevant rules as yielding procedures speakers and audiences “have in their repertoire.” He says that

idea [of having a procedure in one’s repertoire seems to me to be intuitively fairly intelligible and to have application outside the realm of linguistic, or otherwise communicative, performances, though it could hardly be denied that it requires further explication. A faintly eccentric lecturer might have in his repertoire the following procedure: if he sees an attractive girl in his audience to pause for half a minute and then take a sedative. His having in his repertoire this procedure would not be incompatible with his also having two further procedures: (a) if he sees an attractive girl, to put on a pair of dark spectacles (instead of pausing to take a sedative); (b) to pause to take a sedative when he sees in his audience not an attractive girl, but a particularly distinguished colleague (1968, 233).

Grice defines sentence meaning in terms of possible patterns or speaker meaning. As Stephen Schiffer notes,“The intimate connection between sentence-meaning and speaker-meaning demands that, if there are such things as sentence meanings, sentence meanings somehow constrain what speakers can mean in uttering sentences with those meanings, and constrain what can be meant narrowly enough so that uttering the sentence is an effective way to communicate propositions that satisfy the constraint.”(Schiffer 2015). To characterizes the possible patterns, Grice first assumes a finite set of basic procedures that semantically interpret lexical representations, and a finite set of combinational processes that perform two tasks: that they associate each sentence with at least one proposition (in the sense explained earlier), and that they generate, for each sentence, at least one resultant procedure linked to a particular instance of speaker meaning. He explains that

[a]s a first approximation, one might say that a procedure for an utterance-type \(X\) will be a resultant procedure if it is determined by (its existence is inferable from) a knowledge of procedures (a) for particular utterance-types which are elements in \(X\), and (b) for any sequence of utterance-types which exemplifies a particular ordering of syntactic categories (a particular syntactic form) (Grice 1969a, 235 SWW, p. 136–).

Grice introduces a canonical form for specifying resultant procedures. He does so by generalizing the special notation he has already used in specifying speaker meaning. Recall that he represented the indicative case by: \(U\) means that \(\vdash\)(the door is closed);the imperative: \(U\) means that !(the door is closed). The indicative sentence ‘\(\vdash\)(the door is closed)’ is associated with the psychological state of belief: speakers can and do utter that sentence with the intention that audiences respond by believing the door is closed. The imperative ‘! (the door is closed)’ is similarly associated with an audience response of action: speakers can and do utter that sentence with intention that that audiences respond by closing the door. ‘\(\vdash\)’ and ‘!’ are examples of a type of syntactic item Grice calls a mood operator. He assumes that the syntactic structure of sentences divides into a mood operator and the rest of the structure. Grice uses ‘\(*+\mathrm{R}\)’ to represent this division. Now let \(\mathrm{P}_{*+R}\) be the set of propositions associated with \(*+\mathrm{R}\), and \(\psi\) the psychological state or action associated with \(*\). Then the resultant procedure for \(*+\mathrm{R}\) is to utter it to M-intend that \(*_{\psi}(p)\).

Grice provides a long and complex examination of the definition of sentence meaning, It is sufficient here to note the general idea: where \(p \in \mathrm{P}_{*+\mathrm{R}}\), \(*+\mathrm{R}\) means \(p\) in a group \(G\) if and only if members of \(G\) have, with respect to \(*+\mathrm{R}\), the resultant procedure of uttering it to M-intend that \(*_{\psi}(p)\).

The implicitly followed rules that yield basic and resultant procedures are (some or all of) the processes that associate sentences with propositions and that yield that ability to perform a range of different types of acts of speaker meaning. Those processes are generally not accessible to introspection. To see why this is a problem, consider the conditions under which one can plausibly be said to implicitly follow a rule. One may in philosophical conversation, for example, follow the rule “Disagree strongly with the first wrong thing one hears,” and one may do so implicitly in the sense that one does not consciously follow the rule when conversing. But suppose that, even after sufficient unbiased and unimpaired reflection, one denies that one follows the rule. Then isn’t one simply disposed to disagree strongly with the first wrong thing one hears? Grice faces this problem to the extent that he insists that language users implicitly follow as rules (some or all of) processes that associate sentences with propositions. Awareness of those processes is generally unavailable even after unbiased reflection under ideal conditions.

Two further comments are in order. First, the notion of a proposition is a semantic notion. Propositions are generated by in part by basic procedures that assign semantic interpretations to lexical items. This has two consequences. First, the definition of sentence meaning is not without any semantic remainder. Second, the same is true of the definition of speaker meaning itself, since it quantifies over propositions. Does this reduce the interest of Grice’s works on meaning? Not if what one wants to understand are the conceptual intricacies of speaker and sentence meaning. The definitions illuminate those intricacies even when one abandons the program of reducing meaning to psychological attitudes.

Second, if we abandon the reduction of meaning to psychological states, it is at least tempting to consider defining speaker meaning in terms of sentence meaning. Doing so simplifies things. To see the idea, recall Schiffer’s definition of speaker meaning (in simplified form):

For a relation R, it is common knowledge between S and A that S uttered x intending: that the utterance should cause A to believe that p, and that A so believe in part on the basis that x has the relation R to p.

In the vast majority of cases, speaker meaning is achieved by uttering sentences that have one or more standard meanings. In cases where, for example, the speaker utters the sentence ‘There is a gas station on the corner’ to mean that there is a gas station on the corner, the relevant relation R is uttering in certain context a sentence which sentence-means “There is a gas station on the corner.” Where one utters, for example, ‘Pat’s in nearby’ to mean that gas is available nearby at Pat’s, the relevant relation R is similarly uttering in a sentence which sentence-means “Pat’s is nearby” in a context. The difference is that in given context utterance is evidence that the speaker means that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. Thus:

For propositions p and q (where p and q may be identical), it is common knowledge between S and A that S uttered a sentence σ intending: (1) that the utterance should cause A to believe that p, and (2) that A so believe in part on the basis of the fact that that σ means q.

The idea is to take this definition as the primary one while seeing a non-sentence-meaning definition like Grice’s or Schiffer’s as a generalization to cover cases of speaker meaning that are not mediated by sentence meaning. In the flashing lights case, for example, one can still the light flasher as meaning that one’s lights are not on. Making sentence meaning central in this way might appeal to those who agree with Noam Chomsky that “[n]ot only in the functional dimension, but also in all other respects—semantic, syntactic, morphological, and phonological—the core properties of human language appear to differ sharply from animal communication systems, and to be largely unique in the organic world” (Chomsky 2016, 64).

The definition is designed to characterize the speaker meaning activities of natural language users, so sufficiently young children and animals will not satisfy it. As children increasingly master a language, they begin to approximate and then fulfill the definition. Animals to whom one is willing to ascribe intentions may satisfy some (modified) version of a non-sentential definition of speaker meaning.

To conclude this section, we return to a key part of Grice’s explanation of communicative interactions: the attribution of reasoning to speakers and audiences. Speakers reason to the conclusion that a certain utterance will result in an audience having the propositional attitude the speaker intends them to have. In response, audience reason their way to the intended attitude. The problem is that it seems patently obvious that speakers and audiences do not reason in this way. So why does Grice insist that speakers and audiences reason? A tempting answer is that, as Richard Grandy once quipped, Grice never met an underdogma that he did not like. In his work on reasoning, Grice offers a more principled answer.

5. Reasoning

In Aspects of Reason, Grice begins by considering the suggestion that reasoning consists in “the entertainment (and often acceptance) in thought or in speech of a set of initial ideas (propositions), together with a sequence of ideas each of which is derivable by an acceptable principle of inference from its predecessors in the set” (2001, 5). He shows that it is scarcely plausible to suppose that reasoning always involves the entertainment or acceptance of a sequence of ideas—the steps in the reasoning—each of which is derivable (or taken by the reasoner to be derivable) from its predecessors. The problem is that reasoning is often, indeed typically, enthymematic in the following way. Jill reasons: “Jack broke his crown, but he is an Englishman; therefore, he will be brave.” She does not employ any suppressed premise. She merely thinks: ‘but he is an Englishman; therefore, he will be brave’. Grice emphasizes that when we articulate our reasoning explicitly, we are often not making previously suppressed premises explicit; rather, we are constructing the steps as we supply them. Suppose, for example, we were to ask Jill, “Why do you think that follows?” She could answer by saying she thinks that all the English are brave; or that the English are brave when they break their crowns; or that people of Jack’s age and description are brave provided that they are also English; and so on. In proposing one of these alternatives, Jill is not reporting her suppressed premise; she is advancing a premise she is willing to put forward now as what she would—or, perhaps, should—have thought or said then if the question of validity had been raised.

To accommodate these points, Grice sees reasoning as involving the exercise of the ability to make reason-preserving transitions between sets of thoughts or beliefs (or intentions or whatever). A transition is reason-preserving if and only if, necessarily, if one has reasons for the initial set, then one also does for the subsequent set (Grice 2001, xxx–xxxii (editor’s introduction)). The necessity holds for both deductive and inductive cases. Like any ability, the ability to make reason-preserving transitions may be impaired. Good reasoning consists in an unimpaired exercise of the ability; reasoning—good or bad—is an exercise that is not too impaired. As Grice says, “[T]o explain what reasoning is (and maybe what the term ‘reasoning’ means), it is necessary in the first instance to specify what good reasoning is, and then to stipulate that ‘reasoning’ applies to good reasoning and also to sequences which approximate, to a given degree, to good reasoning; the idea of good reasoning is, in a certain sense, prior to the idea of reasoning.”

A further point is in order. Jill’s reasoning illustrates it. Jill transitions from “He is English” to “He will be brave.” That transition is only necessarily reason-preserving if Jill has relevant additional beliefs about the English character, or is on reflection willing to assent to additional beliefs sufficient to support the inference. The beliefs need not be mental episodes occurring sotto voce or fully unconsciously at the time she reasons. As noted above, when she articulates possible premises after-the-fact, she need not be reporting suppressed premises; she may be advancing a premise she is willing on later reflection to accept. Jill may have concluded that Jack will be brave because she is disposed to believe something like “All the English are brave,” or “English are brave when they break their crowns,” or “People of Jack’s age and description are brave provided that they are also English,” and so on. The disposition is sufficient to explain her inference. There is no explanatory need to attribute any determinate belief to her concerning English bravery. It is instructive to compare Jill to you when the child suddenly darts onto the street and into the path of your car. You swerved to avoid the child. You reacted instinctively. You did not reason (exercise your ability to make reason-preserving transitions) from the belief “If I do not swerve, I will hit the child” to the conclusion “I should swerve”. This is not to deny that you could reason. Imagine the child is a significant distance in front of you. As soon as you see dart onto the street, the thought flashes through your mind that if you do not swerve, you will hit the child, and that the thought “Swerve!” occupies your consciousness.

When a speaker and an audience interact in a case of speaker meaning, do they reason like Jill or react instinctively like you when you swerve? It is plausible—or at least not implausible—that they reason. Consider the case of uttering ‘Pat’s in nearby’ to mean that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. The speaker reasons from the initial belief that the sentence ‘Pat’s in nearby’ means (has as one of its meanings) the proposition that Pat’s is nearby to the conclusion that uttering it will cause the audience to believe that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. The audience reasons from the belief that the speaker uttered a sentence that means (has as one of its meanings) the proposition that Pat’s is nearby to the belief that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. Like Jill, the reasoning need not be mediated by determinate suppressed premises.

It is no objection that Grice illustrates his definition of speaker meaning with examples of reasoning mediated by determinate premises. One can see those examples as making explicit what speakers and audiences might have said had they been called on to fill out their reasoning.

One may not be convinced. There are two sentences in the above paragraph. When you read it, did you form four beliefs (a premise and conclusion for each sentence)? One may be reluctant to embrace the picture of ordinary communications as populated with evanescent beliefs. One reply is that the beliefs need not be present to consciousness or even readily accessible by introspection. The relevant events could be subdoxastic states that, like beliefs, represent states of affairs; and the reasoning—that is, the reason-preserving transitions—could also be subdoxastic. Such processes plausibly occur, not just in adults, but also in young children and some animals. Note that, in the case of children, exposure to spoken language and social interaction are essential to the initial triggering of the biological endowment that subserves language acquisition (Leneberg 1967), but Gricean speaker meaning interactions are not. They appear later in the acquisition sequence (Thompson 2007). This may answer Strawson’s worry that Grice defines speaker meaning in terms of sophisticated psychological concepts available only to users of a natural language (Strawson 1964). It bears emphasis that, for sufficiently mature language users, this view does not abandon after-the-fact rational evaluation. Compare instinctively swerving to avoid the child. Afterwards, you could exhibit the rationality of the decision by reasoning from the premise that you will hit the child if you do not swerve to the conclusion that you should do so. Similarly, after uttering ‘Pat’s is nearby,’ you could at some later time reason from the premise that the sentence means the proposition that Pat’s is nearby, plus additional premises about the context, to the conclusion that your audience will respond by believing that gas is available nearby at Pat’s. Acts of speaker meaning at at time t may not typically be under the direct guidance of introspection-accessible reasoning occurring at time t, but they would not lie beyond rational evaluation by after-the-fact reasoning.

6. Everyday Psychological Explanation

Grice’s views on everyday psychological explanation are intertwined with his views on rationality. Grice contends that the right picture of rationality is the picture, given us by Plato, Aristotle and others, as something which essentially functions to regulate, direct, and control pre-rational impulses, inclinations, and dispositions. Both everyday psychological explanation and assessments of rationality employ commonsense psychological principles. By such principles we mean a relatively stable body of generally-accepted principles, of which the following are examples:

• If a person desires p, and believes if q then p, then—other things being equal—the person will desire q.
• If a person desires p and desires q, then—other things being equal—the person will act on the stronger of the two desires if the person acts on either.
• If a person stares at a colored surface and subsequently stares at a white surface, then—other things being equal—the person will have an after-image.

The first two examples are arguably partially constitutive of the notion of desire. The third example is an empirical fact. Both qualify as part of the stock of commonsense psychological principles. These examples express relations among complexes consisting of psychological states and behavior, and, as such they serve a descriptive and explanatory function. Other principles play a more evaluative role. Consider for example:

• If a person believes p and that p entails q, and the person believes not-q, then, other things being equal, the person should stop believing p or stop believing q.

Conformity to this principle is a criterion of rationality. The descriptive-explanatory and evaluative principles collectively give us is a specification of how “pre-rational, impulses, inclinations, and dispositions” operate as well as a basis for evaluating that operation.

The essential point for our purposes is that everyday psychology has special status for Grice. He argues:

The psychological theory which I envisage would be deficient as a theory to explain behaviour if it did not contain provision for interests in the ascription of psychological states otherwise than as tools for explaining and predicting behaviour, interests (for example) on the part of one creature to be able to ascribe these rather than those psychological states to another creature because of a concern for the other creature. Within such a theory it should be possible to derive strong motivations on the part of the creatures subject to the theory against the abandonment of the central concepts of the theory (and so of the theory itself), motivations which the creatures would (or should) regard as justified. Indeed, only from within the framework of such a theory, I think, can matters of evaluation, and so, of the evaluation of modes of explanation, be raised at all. If I conjecture aright, then, the entrenched system contains the materials needed to justify its own entrenchment; whereas no rival system contains a basis for the justification of anything at all (1975b, 52).

Thus, while everyday psychology (or some preferred part of it) may not entirely accurately specify how in fact we think and act, it does specify how we ought to think and act.

Assume everyday psychology is uniquely self-justifying in the way Grice suggests; then we must reject the suggestion that everyday psychology is just a rough and ready theory that we will (or could) eventually abandon without loss in favor of a more accurate and complete scientific theory of behavior. Grice objects on this ground to theories that regard only scientific knowledge as truly descriptive and explanatory and that relegate commonsense psychological explanation to a second-class role as a theory, useful in daily life, but not a theory we should endorse as a description or explanation of reality. He remarks:

We must be ever watchful against the Devil of scientism, who would lead us into myopic overconcentration on the nature and importance of knowledge, and of scientific knowledge in particular; the Devil who is even so audacious as to tempt us to call in question the very system of ideas required to make intelligible the idea of calling in question anything at all; and who would even prompt us, in effect, to suggest that since we do not really think but only think that we think, we had better change our minds without undue delay (1975b, 53).

Thus, to return briefly to the theory of meaning, the picture that theory offers of ourselves as rational communicators producing justified psychological attitudes in each other is no mere accident, no explanatory way station to be abandoned as science progresses. It is an ineliminable feature of the way in which we understand ourselves and others. In addition to this result, Grice’s view of psychological explanation also yields consequences both for ontology and for ethics.

7. Ontology

Grice’s ontological views are liberal. As Grice says when commenting on the mind—body problem in ‘Method in Philosophical Psychology’,

I am not greatly enamoured of some of the motivations which prompt the advocacy of psychophysical identifications; I have in mind a concern to exclude such ‘queer’ or ‘mysterious’ entities as souls, purely mental events, purely mental properties and so forth. My taste is for keeping open house for all sorts of conditions of entities, just so long as when they come in they help with the housework. Provided that I can see them work, and provided that they are not detected in illicit logical behaviour (within which I do not include a certain degree of indeterminacy, not even of numerical indeterminacy), I do not find them queer or mysterious at all…. To fangle a new ontological Marxism, they work therefore they exist, even though only some, perhaps those who come on the recommendation of some form of transcendental argument, may qualify for the specially favoured status of entia realissima. To exclude honest working entities seems to me like metaphysical snobbery, a reluctance to be seen in the company of any but the best objects (1975, 30–31).

Our discussion of psychological explanation shows what Grice had in mind in his reference to entities that “come on the recommendation of some form of transcendental argument, [and hence] may qualify for the specially favoured status of entia realissima.” Suppose—as Grice thinks—certain ways of thinking, certain categories, are part of what is entrenched in this way. Then there are certain concepts or categories that we cannot avoid applying to reality.

This theme will not be pursued further here; rather, we turn to the more “Marxist” side of Grice’s ontology: the claim that if entities work, they exist. We illustrate this point with the concept of a proposition. The critical role of that notion in Grice’s theory of meaning motivates our focus on it. Quinean criticisms of the notion have placed it under a cloud of suspicion, a cloud many see as hanging ominously over Grice’s theory.

One of Quine’s arguments is that synonymy is not a well-defined equivalence relation, the identity conditions for propositions are unclear and there is ‘no entity without identity’. On this issue, Grice is not committed to an equivalence relation of synonymy (thus his remark above about indeterminacy), and he parts company with Quine over whether clear identity conditions are required. Grice, as noted earlier, argues for such conditions. But the acceptability of his theory of meaning does not depend on the success of that defense. Within the theory of meaning, propositions are theoretical entities to be understood by the role in the theory, and that role, according to Grice, does not demand a strict criterion of identity. Rather: if they work they exist (1975, 31). It is worth noting in this regard that there are many respectable entities for which we do not have criteria of identity. Suppose your favorite restaurant moves. Is it a new restaurant with the same name? Or suppose it changes owners and names but nothing else? Or that it changes menu entirely? Or that it changes chefs? It would be foolish to look for a single criterion to answer these questions—the answers go different ways in different contexts. But surely the concept of a restaurant is a useful one and restaurants do exists. Quine and Grice differ on the theoretical usefulness of propositions. The main reason for disagreement is due to Quine’s attitude that concepts such as belief and desire are of, at most, secondary importance in the unified canonical science that is his standard for ontology. Grice, as we have already noted, thinks that everyday psychological theory is of first importance.

8. Ordinary Language Philosophy

Grice was a life-long practitioner of ordinary language philosophy. He begins the “Prolegomena” to Studies in the Way of Words by noting that “some may regard [ordinary language philosophy] as an outdated style of philosophy,” but he urges us “not to be too quick to write off such a style.” His 1956 essay “Postwar Oxford Philosophy” offers a three-part characterization of Ordinary Language Philosophy as a kind of conceptual analysis.

First, the goal is to illuminate what one already in some sense knows. Take the example of justice. One already knows what justice is in the sense that one is “more or less adequately equipped to decide, with regard to particular actions of different kinds, whether they are to be called ‘just’ or not” (Grice 1989, 174). In general, with regard to expression E, “one may be in be in a position to apply or withhold E in particular cases” (Grice 1989, 174).

Second, suppose E is an expression for a concept (as, for example, ‘justice’, ‘just’, and the like are for (our various concepts of) justice). The pattern of our applying and withholding E can provide a (perhaps partial) map of conditions for the applicability of the concept. To see why, turn for a moment to Austin, who contends, with obvious exaggeration, that the conceptual scheme reflected in our language incorporates “all the distinctions men have found worth drawing, and the connexions they have found worth marking, in the lifetimes of many generations” (Austin 1979). Less grandly, it is clear that, in acquiring a natural language, one acquires a rich conceptual scheme that one more or less shares with other language users. Given that scheme, investigating the applicability of an expression E can be a useful guide to the conditions of the applicability of a concept in those case in which one is “a position to apply or withhold E in particular cases.” Grice discusses this second step practice in the “Retrospective Epilogue” of Studies in the Way of Words. He presents it as involving “linguistic botanizing,” which he describes as “possibly the most notable corporate achievement of my philosophical early middle age” (Grice 1989, 376). Take the word ‘true’ as an example. One examines a range of examples, for instance “‘true friends,’ ‘true statements,’ ‘true beliefs,’ ‘true bills,’ ‘true measuring instruments,’ ‘true singing voices,’” (377) to ultimately divide them, to the extent feasible, into different kinds of uses. As Grice notes, the practice “is closely linked with Austin’s ideas about the desirability of ‘going through the dictionary’” (376). It is at the second step that one sees “the ruthless and unswerving association of philosophy with the study of ordinary language [which] was peculiar to the Oxford scene, and has never been seen anywhere before or since, except as an application of the methods of philosophizing which originated in Oxford” (376).

Third, “in reaching one’s conceptual analysis of E, one makes use of one’s ability to apply and withhold E, for the characteristic procedure is to think up a possible general characterization of one’s use of E and then to test it by trying to find or imagine a particular situation which fits the suggested characterization and yet would not be a situation in which one would apply E” (Grice 1989, 174). Grice criticized J. L. Austin for mishandling the task of finding a general characterization. Austin thought there was a relatively clear notion of what it is inappropriate to say, and that we could delineate truth-conditions by identifying instances of inappropriateness. For example, he inferred from (1) “Typically, when one acts, it would be inappropriate to say either that one acted voluntarily or that one acted involuntarily” to (2) “Typically, when one acts, one acts neither voluntarily nor involuntarily.” As Grice convincingly argues, the inference fails because being untrue is not the only form of inappropriateness. Something may be true but inappropriate to say for other reasons (Grice 1960, 1975, 1981, 1989). Grice’s notion of an implicature provides the theoretical underpinnings for this criticism. Austin’s error was overlook the fact that what one implicates by uttering a sentence in a certain context need not be part of the truth-conditions for that sentence. The point of the criticism is not to undermine Oxford Ordinary Language philosophy but provide it with a firmer foundation. Grice urges us to build “a theory which will enable one to distinguish between the case in which an utterance is false or fails to be true, or more generally fails to correspond to the world in some favored way, and the case in which it is inappropriate for reasons of a different kind” (Grice 1989, 4).

Why seek a general characterizations of the conditions for applying a concept? Because doing so can deepen “our understanding by reflection on what is already closest to us—the experiences, thoughts, concepts, and activities that make up our lives, and that ordinarily escape notice because they are so familiar” (Nagel 2009, 153). Our ability to apply or withhold an expression qualifies as “closest to us.” But why think that such an investigation of the use of an expression can, at least in some cases, yield necessary and sufficient conditions for the application of a concept? Think of conceptual schemes as complex networks mapping out connections among concepts. Those connections include some which, given our current talk and thought, hold as a matter of what we mean by our words. Such connections may be a necessary or a sufficient condition, or both. Why think that the linguistic investigation of such a network will yield separately necessary and jointly sufficient conditions in a range of philosophically significant cases? Conceptual schemes evolve as people bend them to serve a variety of purposes. Why assume such a process yields connections so tidy that important parts of it can be characterized by sets of necessary and sufficient conditions? But even if it does not, seeking necessary and sufficient conditions can be a reasonable methodology. It can lead to a deeper, more thorough and illuminating description of how we think. One may draw precise lines where our conceptual scheme contains only suggestive brush strokes, but those pictures can provide an illuminating perspective not just on we do think but how we should. One should not ask more of Ordinary Language Philosophy than it can give. Careful attention to acceptable, deviant, and nonsensical uses can be a useful tool in generalizing from our ability to an illuminating account of the conditions for the application of a concept. Asking more of it can be problematic.

Grice did not confine himself to Ordinary Language Philosophy conceptual analysis. His work on meaning and implicature is a case in point. It involves ordinary language appeals like “We would not say that the speaker meant that so-and-so,” but it also introduces theoretical terms such as ‘implicature,’ appeals to a sense of ‘saying’ which Grice refers to as “a certain favoured, and maybe in some degree artificial sense” (Grice 1968, 225), and goes beyond the deliverances of ordinary language to develop a theory in which the distinction between saying and implicating plays a central explanatory role. When criticisms of Grice’s treatment of meaning and implicature fail to appreciate that the treatment is in significant part the proposal of an explanatory theory, they fail to aim at the right target. See, for example, (Hanfling 2000, Chapter 10). Another decidedly non-Ordinary Language Philosophy aspect of Grice’s work appeared in his years at Berkeley years when began formulating claims in one or another symbolic notation. (Grice 2001, Chapters III and IV) is an example, where he argues that practical necessities like “I must not torture” or “I must go to law school” are necessary because they are derivable from a given set of principles (“axioms” as it were). Grice develops a symbolic notation in which to express the principles and the derived statements. It is tempting to speculate that Grice’s turn to symbolic methods shows the influence of the Berkeley-Stanford-UCLA milieu of the late 1960s and 70s, but a cryptic remark of Grice’s suggests Quine may have been the cause. In “Vacuous Names,” his one published foray into formal logic, he remarks:

Of those who are approximately my contemporaries, Professor W. V. Quine is one of the very few to whom I feel I owe the deepest of professional debts, the debt which is owed to someone from whom one has learned something very important about how philosophy should be done, and who has, in consequence, helped to shape one’s own mode of thinking. (Grice 1969b, 118).

Grice never explained what the debt was, but a plausible speculation is that it was the vision that he could use symbolic notation to characterize the logical form of statements and then derive philosophical explanations from suitable principles.

9. Ethics

Grice uses this general account of reasoning to investigate moral reasoning and moral reasons. He emphasizes the connections between reasons, actions, and freedom. It is convenient to divide Grice’s approach into two stages (although he himself does not do so). The first stage argues that one must regard the exercise of rationality in the free adoption and pursuit of ends as an unrelativized good at which all persons should aim. The second stage examines the concepts of happiness and freedom to discover principles which persons—conceived of as adopting and pursuing ends—must adopt insofar as they are to qualify as rational.

The first stage. Why think that one must regard the exercise of rationality in the free adoption and pursuit of ends as an unrelativized good at which all persons should aim? To begin with, what does Grice mean by an “unrelativized good”? Grice grants that the concept of unrelativized value requires defense; after all, things have value only relative to ends and beneficiaries. So how is unrelativized value to be understood? Grice defines unrelativized value “in Aristotelian style [as] whatever would seem to possess such value in the eyes of a duly accredited judge; and a duly accredited judge might be identifiable as a good person operating in conditions of freedom.” The appeal to a duly accredited judge is necessary since what seems of value to a person may not of value if the person is biased, or has an impaired ability to reflect or reason. To appeal to a duly accredited judge is of course, still to talk about what is of value for and to persons. The point is, to avoid relativization to this or that kind of person or kind of end.) So, why would a duly accredited judge see value in the free rational adoption and pursuit of ends, where such value is not ascribed because of the contribution that activity makes to some other end? Grice’s views on commonsense psychology provide the answer. As noted earlier, Grice thinks that commonsense psychology exhibits two features: parts of it are self-justifying; and, it contains principles for evaluating thought and action, where some of those principles are self-justifying. When he turns to ethics, Grice adds that commonsense psychology represents us as exercising rationality in freely adopting and pursuing ends; moreover, this view of ourselves is self-justifying in the sense that we cannot coherently conceive of ourselves in any other way. Grice’s—very plausible—claim is that a “duly accredited judge” operating from within the theory of commonsense psychology would take the rational, free adoption and pursuit of ends as having unrelativized value. Hence, it does have such value.

The second stage: What principles must a free adopter and pursuer of ends embrace in order to qualify as rational? Grice addresses this question most fully in Aspects of Reason and The Conception of Value. The idea is that the combined requirements of rationality (outside ethics), freedom, and happiness impose substantive constraints on all persons. Grice develops this theme with great insight and subtlety; however, he did not complete the project, and the intricacies of his views are best left to the detail of his own works.

10. Conclusion

Grice’s work continues to exert considerable influence. One notable area is work on showing how human communication evolved from animal communication. The psychologist Michael Tomasello argues that Gricean cooperative communication emerged from natural gestures like pointing, which did not involve the intention that recognition of an intention be a reason for belief or action. Grice himself notes in “Reply to Richards” that his analysis of speaker meaning is “plainly too sophisticated to be found in a language destitute creature” (85). When Tomasello turns to human communication, however, he emphasizes higher order psychological states. He contends that “it is most precise to say not just that I want you to know that I want you to attend to something, but that I want us to know this together I want my communicative act to be a part of our perceptually copresent joint attention (I want it to be mutually manifest, in the terms of Sperber and Wilson 1986, or ‘wholly overt’)” (Tomasello 2008, 91). This is closely akin to Schiffer’s requirement of common knowledge. Investigations of the interactions between meaning and common knowledge promise a rich way forward.

The sophistication and inventiveness of Grice’s work is well-known. What is less well-known is its ambitious and systematic nature. Emphasizing this latter aspect has been one goal of this brief presentation of Grice’s work, work which weaves meaning, reasoning, psychology, ontology, and value into a complex, unified whole.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

Books By Grice

• 1989, Studies in the Way of Words (SWW), Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press; a collection including most of the important works published during his lifetime.
• 1991, The Conception of Value, New York: Oxford University Press; a posthumous publication of the John Locke Lectures, delivered in 1979.
• 2001, Aspects of Reason (ed. Richard Warner), Oxford: Oxford University Press; a posthumously published book exploring the nature of reasons and reasoning.

Selected Articles By Grice

• 1957, (with P. F. Strawson), ‘In Defence Of A Dogma’, Philosophical Review, 65: 141–58; reprinted in SWW.
• 1957, ‘Meaning’, The Philosophical Review, 66: 377–88; reprinted in SWW.
• 1961, ‘The Causal Theory of Perception’, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (Supplementary Volume), 35: 121–52; reprinted in SWW.
• 1968, ‘Utterer’s Meaning, Sentence Meaning, and Word-Meaning’, Foundations of Language, 4: 225–42; reprinted in SWW.
• 1969a, ‘Utterer’s Meaning and Intentions’, The Philosophical Review, 68: 147–77; reprinted in SWW.
• 1969b, ‘Vacuous Names’, Words and Objections, in Words and Objections D. Davidson and J. Hinitkka (eds.) Synthese, 118.
• 1971, ‘Intention and Uncertainty’, Proceedings of the British Academy, 57: 263–79.
• 1975, ‘Logic and Conversation’, in The Logic of Grammar, D. Davidson and G. Harman (eds.), Encino, CA: Dickenson, 64–75; reprinted in SWW.
• 1975b, ‘Method in Philosophical psychology (From the Banal to the Bizarre)’, Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association, 48: 23–53.
• 1978, ‘Further Notes on Logic and Conversation’, in Syntax and Semantics: Pragmatics, v 9, P. Cole (ed.), New York: Academic Press, 183–97; reprinted in SWW.
• 1981, ‘Presupposition and Conversational Implicature’, in Radical Pragmatics, P. Cole (ed.), New York: Academic Press, 183–97.
• 1982, ‘Meaning Revisited’, in Mutual Knowledge, N.V. Smith (ed.), New York: Academic Press, 223–43; reprinted in SWW.
• 1986, ‘Reply to Richards’, in Philosophical Grounds of Rationality: Intentions, Categories, Ends, R. Grandy and R. Warner. Smith (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.

Secondary Sources

Books On Grice

• Atlas, J. D., 2005, Logic, Logic, Meaning and Conversation: Semantical Underdeterminancy, Implicature, and their Interface, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Avramides, A., 1989, Meaning and Mind: An Examination of a Gricean Account of Language, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Bardzokas, V., 2010, Causality and Connectives: From Grice to Relevance, Amsterdam: Benjamins Publishing Co.
• Chapman, S., 2005, Paul Grice, Philosopher and Linguist, London: Palgrave Macmillan.
• Cosenza, G. (ed.), 2001, Paul Grice’s Heritage, Turnhout: Brepols.
• Davis, W. 1998, Implicature: Intention, Convention, and Principle in the Failure of Gricean Theory, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Grandy, R., and R. Warner, 1986, Philosophical Grounds of Rationality: Intentions, Categories, Ends, Oxford: Oxford University Press. (A festschrift celebrating Grice’s work, with a lengthy editorial introduction and a response by Grice.)
• Korta, K., and J. Perry, 2011, Critical Pragmatics: An inquiry into Reference and Communication, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge
• Lepore, E., and M. Stone, 2015, Imagination and Convention: Distinguishing Grammar and Inference in Language, Oxford University Press.
• Petrus, K., (ed.), 2010, Meaning and Analysis: New Essays on Grice, Hampshire, England: Palgrave Studies in Pragmatics, Language, and Cognition.
• Recanati, F., 2010, , Oxford University Press, Oxford.
• Tomasello, M., 2008, Origins of Human Communication, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.

Articles On Grice

• Bach, K., 1997 “The Semantics Pragmatics Distinction: What it is and Why it Matters”, in K. Turner (ed.), The Semantics-Pragmatics Interface From Different Points of View. Amsterdam: Elsevier, 65–84.
• Baker, J., 1989, “The metaphysical construction of value”, Journal of Philosophy, 10: 505–13.
• Davis, W. 2007, “Grice’s Meaning Project”, Journal of Pragmatics, 26: 41–58.
• Davies, M., 1996, “The Philosophy of Language”, in The Blackwells Companion to Philosophy, N. Bunin and E. Tsui-James (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell.
• Grandy, R. E., 1989, “On Grice on language”, Journal of Philosophy, 10: 514–25.
• Grim, P., 2011, “Simulating Grice: emergent pragmatics in spatialized game theory”, in Language, Games, and Evolution, edited by A. Benz, C. Ebert, G. Jager, and R. van Rooij, Berlin, Heidelberg: Springer Verlag.
• Hazlett, A., 2007, “Grice’s razor”, Metaphilosophy, 38: 669–690.
• Horn, L., 2006, “The Border Wars–A Neo-Gricean Perspective”, von Heusinger, K. and K. Turner (editors), Where Semantics Meets Pragmatics (Current Research in the Semantics/Pragmatics Interface: Volume 16), Amsterdam: Elsevier, 21–48.
• Jaszczolt, K., 2019, “Rethinking Being Gricean: New Challenges for Metapragmatics”, Journal of Pragmatics, 145: 15–24.
• Luhti, D., 2006, “How implicatures make Grice an unordinary ordinary language philosopher”, Pragmatics, 16: 247–274.
• Neale, S., 1992, “Paul Grice and the philosophy of language”, Linguistics and Philosophy, 15: 509–559.
• Potts, C., 2006, “Review: Paul Grice: Philosopher and Linguist”, Mind, 115: 743–747.
• Searle, J., 2007, “Grice on meaning: 50 years later”, Teorema, 26: 9–18.
• Soames, S., 2003, “Language use and the logic of conversation”, (Ch. 9 of Philosophical Analysis in the Twentieth Century (Volume 2: The Age of Meaning), Princeton: Princeton University Press 197–218.
• Stalnaker, R., 1989, “On Grandy on Grice”, Journal of Philosophy, 10: 525–8.
• Strawson, P. F., 1964, “Intention and convention in speech acts”, Philosophical Review, 73: 439–60.
• Thompson, R., 2007, “Still relevant: H. P. Grice’s legacy” in “Psycholinguists and the philosophy of language”, Teorema, 26: 77–109.
• –––, 2007, “Grades of Meaning,” Synthese, 161: 283–308.
• Warner, R., 2021, “Common-Knowledge-Based Pragmatics”, in Inquires in Philosophical Pragmatics. Theoretical Perspectives, Fabrizio Macagno and Alessandro Capone (eds.), Springer.
• –––, 2025, “Gricean Theories of Reference”, Annali di Ca Foscari. Serie Occidentale, 59: 173–188.
• Ziff, P., 1967, “On H. P. Grice’s Account of Meaning”, Analysis, 28: 1–8.

Books Developing a (more or less) Gricean account of meaning

• Bennett, J., 1976, Linguistic Behaviour, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Loar, B., 1981, Mind and Meaning, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Schiffer, S., 1972, Meaning, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Wilson, D., and Sperber, D., 2012, Meaning and Relevance, New York: Cambridge University Press.

Other relevant references

• Austin, J. L., 1979, Philosophical Papers, 3^rd edn., J.O. Urmson and G.J. Warnock (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Chomsky, N., 1998, On Language, New York: New Press.
• Berwick, R. and Chomsky, N., 2016, Why Only Us: Language and Evolution, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Harman, G., 1973, Thought, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Pinker, S., 2025, When Everyone Knows That Everyone Knows …: Common Knowledge and the Mysteries of Money, Power, and Everyday Life, New York: Scribner.
• Sloan, R. and Warner, R., 2021, The Privacy Fix: How To Preserve Privacy in the Onslaught of Surveillance, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

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