Heidegger on Language

In Being and Time and works of that period, Heidegger argued that there is a fundamental, pre-linguistic level of significations which forms the foundation of language. “To significations”, Heidegger wrote, “words accrue” (SZ 161; see also GA20: 364). Thus, language was taken to be derivative of our pre-linguistic familiarity with the world. Paradoxically, however, Heidegger simultaneously held that discourse (Rede), in contrast to language (Sprache), is ontologically fundamental in articulating the significance of the world: “there is language only because there is discourse, not the other way around” (GA20: 366; see also SZ 161). But discourse seems to be a linguistic phenomenon of some sort or other—after all, ‘reden’ in colloquial German just means ‘to talk’ or ‘to speak’. In the years after the publication of Being and Time, Heidegger increasingly turned his attention to the interdependence of language, being, and thinking. By as early as 1932 he seemed to revise his view of the derivative status of language, holding that “where there is no language, there is no understanding of being” (GA35: 180). In his later work, language—and especially poetic language—became a central focus of Heidegger’s work.

• 1. Heidegger’s Expressive-Constitutivism
• 2. What is “language”?
• 3. Language as making manifest versus language as producing
• 4. Language “Speaks”
• 5. Poetic Language

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1. Heidegger’s Expressive-Constitutivism

In the 1920s, Heidegger claimed that words and language are founded on prelinguistic significations that “make[] up the structure of the world” (SZ 87). These pre-linguistic “primary meanings” are the relationships or involvements that entities have with us and other things in a practical situation (see, e.g., GA21: 26). For example, the meaning of a door when I am navigating through a building is: “for going in and out” (see GA21: 141). This meaning thus arises within our activity of comporting ourselves purposefully and understandingly in the world. Meaning (die Bedeutung) is dependent on an act of making sense (das Bedeuten), and “[t]he result of the act of making sense is in each case a meaning, not a so-called ‘word meaning’, but this primary meaning to which a word can then accrue” (GA21: 151 n. 6). “Discourse” (Rede) names the system of primary meanings that sustain us as we comport ourselves purposefully and understandingly in the world. Dasein “lives in” these meanings, and it is to them that “words accrue” (SZ 161).^[98]

In the years following the publication of Being and Time, however, Heidegger’s views on language apparently changed. In Being and Time, Heidegger had claimed that words and language are founded upon significations (see SZ 87). Next to this passage, Heidegger jotted in the margins of his personal copy of Being and Time: “Untrue. Language is not another story raised on top” (SZ 87). Along similar lines, Heidegger observed in his personal notes on Being and Time: “If anything, it is the other way around: language is the original and discourse is founded [on it]” (GA82: 89).

Some commentators see this as a sign that Heidegger realized that his earlier work had failed to appreciate the role that ordinary language plays in constituting our engagement with the world. Gadamer, for instance, claims that Heidegger came to see that “[a]ll thinking is confined to language, as a limit as well as a possibility” (Gadamer 1965 [1976: 126]).

Because Heidegger insists in his later essays that language plays a foundational role in opening up and manifesting the world, Charles Taylor places Heidegger in the “expressive-constitutive” tradition of Herder and Humboldt. Taylor distinguishes between “instrumental” or “enframing” theories of language on the one hand, and “expressive-constitutive” theories on the other. An enframing theory

attempts to understand language within the framework of a picture of human life, behavior, purposes, or mental functioning, which is itself described and defined without reference to language. (Taylor 2005: 433)

On the enframing model, then, the framework of meaning that orders human life “precedes, or at least can be characterized independently of language” (Taylor 2005: 433).

In his later work, Heidegger dismisses this kind of approach to language as one that treats words “like handles (Griffe) that grasp that which already is” (GA12: 161 / OWL 68). Instead, his is an expressive-constitutive theory, according to which “language enters into or makes possible a whole range of crucially human feelings, activities, relations”, and thus “bursts the framework of pre-linguistic life forms, and therefore renders any enframing account inadequate” (Taylor 2005: 437).

In broad outlines, Taylor is certainly correct that Heidegger in his later essays offers some variety or other of an expressive-constitutivist account of language. Heidegger holds, for instance, that “Language is that happening in which, each time, beings are first disclosed as beings” (GA5: 62). Or, he argues that the “essence of language” is “a world-forming power” that “first preforms the being of entities in advance and brings them into a structure” (GA38A: 168).

But to know precisely what this expressive-constitutivism amounts to, we need to resolve several questions.

First and foremost, what does ‘language’ or ‘the essence of language’ name in passages like those? After all, Heidegger warns us repeatedly that it would be a misunderstanding to import our ordinary, common-sense conceptions of language into his account. And he insists paradoxically that “the essence of language cannot be anything linguistic” (GA12: 108 / OWL 23–4; see also GA79: 170; GA100: 173; GA75: 272). To know what Heidegger’s account of language amounts to, we need to clarify what Heidegger takes language to be.

Next, what exactly does it mean to say that language “forms” or “discloses” the world? Does language “bring to light” and make manifest things that have a character that is in some way independent of language? Or is language a “bringing about” or producing? (see Taylor 2005: 446). Or is it something in between—is it a forming or shaping of something that exerts constraints on language?

And finally, how can we make sense of the claim that “it is language, not humans, that speaks”? (GA101: 123).

2. What is “language”?

In his earlier work, “language” names a totality of words or a totality of utterances - a systematic whole of signs that we can draw on in expressing ourselves linguistically (see GA36/37: 105ff). In his later work, by contrast, Heidegger uses “language” to refer to the background constitution of significance. In the later Heidegger, ‘language’ (‘Sprache’) replaces ‘discourse’ (‘Rede’) as Heidegger’s preferred translation of the Greek logos. But Heidegger (more or less) consistently understands logos in the Greek sense as a gathering of meaningful elements into a unified structure, a meaningful articulation of the world on the basis of which entities can be unconcealed and linguistic acts can be performed. This ‘language’ conditions the languages we speak, but it is not itself something linguistic. Thus, Wrathall for instance argues that the later Heidegger’s emphasis on language is, to a considerable degree, a terminological change, rather than a new substantive appreciation of the role played by ordinary language in disclosing the world (see Wrathall 2011: 130). Evidence for this can perhaps be seen in the fact that, as late as 1957, Heidegger still insisted that “discourse and discoursing … can never be determined by speaking and language” (GA79: 160).

In his later work on language, then, Heidegger consistently draws a distinction between, on the one hand, language in the ordinary or customary sense, and, on the other hand, what he calls “original language” or “the essence of language”:

What is language? …—Everyone knows that. To the question of what language is, there has long been a customary answer. Language is an expression of our inner experiences, ideas, opinions, wishes and statements in the form of sound and writing. And because it is such an expression, it serves to present what has been experienced, for communicating and understanding. This characterization of language, which even today, seen more or less clearly, underlies all thinking about it—this characterization is correct and yet it is deeply untrue because it only grasps of language that which is a consequence of its essence—but not the essence itself. (GA16: 329; emphasis supplied)

Language in the customary sense is taken as a tool or means for expression or communication, and it is understood to consist in “a stock of words and rules for combining them” (GA4: 39). But this ordinary language, Heidegger explains, “is merely a foreground aspect of language” (GA4: 39). At the same time, it is hard to see how originary language could function independently of ordinary language (see, e.g., Malpas 2012: 210–1).

There is thus an on-going debate whether Heidegger attributes to ordinary language an essential constitutive role in structuring our world, or not. Heideggerian pragmatists claim that, for Heidegger, it is our practical comportment that uncovers meanings, while ordinary language does not play a necessary role in structuring our engagement with the world. Opponents argue that our worlds are in fact thoroughly pervaded by talk; that “idle talk” (Gerede) is an existential feature in constituting the there; and that our practical coping is seamlessly integrated with talk, thus suggesting that coping itself has a conceptual structure (see, e.g., Golob 2014: 106). But the pragmatists, of course, do not deny that we talk constantly, or that learning a language is an important part of coming to share a particular understanding of the significance of things. The pragmatists’ point is rather that while the meaningful articulation of the world can and does involve linguistic acts, the linguistic articulation is grounded in and dependent on a kind of intelligibility that is neither produced by, nor expressible in, ordinary language (see, e.g., Dreyfus 2014: 123 ff.).

Some commentators take the later Heidegger’s claims about language to be claims about “particular natural languages” (see, e.g., Lafont 1994 [2000: 56]). Thus, when Heidegger (for instance) claims that “language is the house of being”, Lafont takes Heidegger as holding that “meaning depends … on the definite conceptualization available through the particular lexicon of a particular language” (Lafont 1994 [2000: 56 & 60]). On her interpretation of Heidegger, natural languages restrict not just what it is possible to say, but also what it is possible to experience and encounter. In a similar way, Hatab takes language in the later Heidegger to be

the language we learn as children and come to speak normally, our ‘mother tongue…. As such, language is not primarily an individual faculty but public communicative practice. (Hatab 2021: 232)

In the examples the later Heidegger offers of the languages he has in mind, however, he never identifies them with particular natural languages. For instance, Heidegger writes:

Some time ago I called language, clumsily enough, the house of being. If human beings, through their language, live as they are called upon by being, then we Europeans presumably live in a very different house than the East Asians do. (GA12: 85 / OWL 5)

Heidegger seems to think, then, that all Europeans inhabit the same “house” or “language”, as do all East Asians. This undermines the proposal that “language” is really to be identified with a particular ordinary, historically specific language like French or German or Japanese or Chinese or Korean. The same holds true of another key example: Heidegger holds that “around the globe”, all people “already speak the language of the inventory (Ge-Stell)” (GA80.2: 1223; see section 6.3). Whatever this language is, it is clearly not identical with any particular natural language.^[99]

In an attempt to preserve a connection between language in the ordinary sense and “originary language”, some scholars adopt a “hybrid” view. Golob, for instance, argues that “language” in the later Heidegger “refers to both” “language in the standard sense” and “something like a unifying gathering” (Golob 2014: 154 n. 137). The thought is that Heidegger should be taken, not as designating something other than ordinary languages with the world “language”, but rather as objecting to certain theoretical ways of modelling language. Similarly, Young offers a Wittgensteinian reading that treats “language” as a “social practice” that involves

a complex integration of words, things, moods, feelings, actions and commentaries on actions which constitutes, in Wittgenstein’s phrase, a “form of life”. (Young 2001: 35–6)

Other scholars, like Withy and Wrathall, approach the word “language” in the later Heidegger metonymically. That is, they take Heidegger not as predicating new properties of ordinary language, but rather as extending the use of the word ‘language’ to name something which is intimately connected with language in the ordinary sense. And what could be more intimately connected with ordinary language than the articulation into significations that is its enabling condition? “Language”, Heidegger explains, “is the revealing itself, and not primarily the subsequent expression of this revealing of things” (GA16: 330).

In these different interpretations of Heidegger’s account of language, what is ultimately at stake is the right way to hear claims like:

(1)

“Language is the house of being” (GA9: 333);

or

(2)

Language is “a world-forming power” (GA38A: 168).

If one takes ‘language’ in the later Heidegger to refer to language in the “standard sense”, then one ends up taking claims like these as saying something like:

(3)

That which we ordinarily refer to as ‘language’ is the house of being, and is a world-forming power.

Alternatively one can take Heidegger, not as predicating new properties of ordinary language, but rather as metonymically using the word ‘language’ to refer to something which is intimately connected with language in the ordinary sense. Thus, on the metonymic reading, Heidegger should be understood as saying something like:

(4)

That which houses being and forms worlds (whatever it is) is what we now will designate as language.

Withy puts this latter interpretation well:

If being a “house of being” … is what makes something a language, then the status is conferred not on what possesses a vocabulary and a grammar but on what pre-discloses the world and pre-discovers entities by harboring ontological commitments. (Withy 2021b: 138)

Human language speaks by “listening to”, “bringing itself into conformity with”, and “responding to” the originary language (see, e.g., GA7: 184 / PLT 213–4). The originary language, in turn,

is neither merely nor primarily the aural and written expression of what needs to be communicated. The conveying of overt and covert meanings is not what language, in the first instance, does. Rather, it brings beings as beings, for the first time, into the open. (GA5: 61 / P 45–6 / PLT 71)

This brings us to the second question outlined above—namely, how exactly should we understand the world-disclosive function of language.

3. Language as making manifest versus language as producing

On Taylor’s account, an expressive-constitutive approach to language holds that

language introduces new meanings in our world: the things which surround us become potential bearers of properties: they can have new emotional significance for us, e.g., as objects of admiration or indignation; our links with others can count for us in new ways, as “lovers”, “spouses”, or “fellow citizens”: and they can have strong value. But then this involves attributing a creative role to expression. Bringing things to speech can’t mean just making externally available what is already there. (Taylor 2005: 438)

As we have seen, Heidegger does indeed accord to the primordial language an expressive-constitutive function. But scholars disagree on how precisely to understand this disclosive function.

On a strong constructivist view of Heidegger, such as that advanced by Lafont, language functions as a prior constraint on what can be. According to Lafont, Heidegger takes language to be “the court of appeal that (as the ‘house of being’) judges beforehand what can be encountered within the world” (Lafont 1994 [2000: 7]). On her reading, Heidegger is committed to the view that the natural language we speak so thoroughly determines what we encounter that our understanding of the world “is itself not open to revision on the basis of intraworldly experience and therefore cannot be understood as codetermined by our processes of learning” (Lafont 1994 [2000: 7]). On such an extremist version of linguistic idealism, language itself not only decides which assertions are true, we also cannot even learn new words, or alter the meaning of existing words or phrases in response to our encounter with the world. We can only encounter what we can mean by using the words already included in our language.

Most scholars reject the attribution to Heidegger of such a linguistic idealism. Dahlstrom notes that language and the things we encounter in the world are “mutually determining” (Dahlstrom 2021: 35, quoting Froman 1982). This mutual determination, Dahlstrom argues, “thwarts any notion of linguistic idealism without denying the existentially constitutive force of language” (Dahlstrom 2021: 35–36). Hatab points out that, on Heidegger’s account,

we are unable to advance originary separations like subject and object or language and world, and that rules out any kind of idealism, linguistic or otherwise. (Hatab 2021: 234)

Taylor argues that language “creates the medium in which some hitherto hidden reality can be manifest” (Taylor 2005: 446). Malpas, echoing this view, holds that

the openness of beings that is granted through language is not a matter of language creating either an open domain for appearance or what comes to appearance within that domain…. There is thus no sense in Heidegger of any form of linguistic constructionism (or any form of social constructionism either). Language grants openness, and in so doing, language may also be said to be a form of freeing or clearing that allows beings to come forth in their being—that is, as the things they already are. (Malpas 2020: 18)

The scholarly consensus is, then, that Heidegger views language as world-forming rather than entity-producing:

the essence of languages comes into its essence wherever it happens as a world-forming power, i.e., where it pre-forms in advance the being of entities, and brings them into a structure. (GA38A: 168)

Language is the organization of significance-relations within which entities can manifest themselves, because it lays out and stabilizes certain ways of making sense of things. In doing so, it helps fix the essence of the entities that do appear. But it does not determine on its own what there is.

Heidegger describes this essential world-forming and entity-relating function of language as “gathering”, and argues that this insight into original language is preserved in the Greek word logos:

the original meaning of logos [is] legein: to read, to read together, to gather, to lay the one to the other and in this way to set the one into a relationship to the other, and thereby to posit this relationship itself. Logos: the connecting, the relationship…. Such a gathering, which now gathers up, makes accessible and holds ready the connections of what is connected…. This gathering is the structure that we call “language”. (GA33: 121)

4. Language “Speaks”

Heidegger famously insists that “it is the language that actually speaks” (GA80.2: 982; see also GA101: 123), while humans only speak in a derivative sense insofar as we “listen to” and “respond” or “co-respond” to the speaking of language:

If attention is fastened exclusively on human speech, if human speech is taken simply to be the voicing of the inner man, if speech so conceived is regarded as language itself, then the nature of language can never appear as anything but an expression and an activity of man. But human speech, as the speech of mortals, is not self-subsistent. The speech of mortals rests in its relation to the speaking of language. (GA12: 28 / 205–6)^[100]

Heidegger is, of course, aware that the ground-level structure of relations—i.e., language—is not something that can speak in the ordinary sense. Thus, when he insists that “language speaks”, Heidegger explains, “it cannot mean ‘speak’ in the sense of using speech organs” (GA79: 169). Instead, he appeals to the etymology of the German verb sagen (‘to say’) and the Greek verb legein to argue that “to say” actually means

to show, to point out, to let one see and let it be perceived. To say is the revealing-concealing showing and pointing out, the proferring in-such-and-such-a-definite-way. (GA79: 170–1; on the dubious nature of Heidegger’s etymology of logos and legein, see Petrovitz 2023)

So in claiming that language speaks, Heidegger means that things are shown to us or conjured up by a specific historical way of organizing and structuring the world into an order of significance. And we “speak” or express ourselves meaningfully by responding to the call of language—that is, by seeing and responding to the world’s way of letting things matter.

But Heidegger’s way of putting this thought invites the question: who or what is the ultimate source of the ‘speaking out’ or expressing of the meaningful order of the world? Taylor considers three possible interpretations.

First is the view that

each locutor, as he or she enters the conversation from infancy, finds their identity shaped by their relations within a pre-existing space of expression…. But as they become full members of the conversation, they can in turn contribute to shape it. (Taylor 2005: 447)

So no individual person is responsible for the expressive content of a language. But it need not entail that we are at the mercy of language. Thus, Withy argues that each of us, as we become full members of a linguistic community, contributes to shaping our “originary language” because “in all discoursing, and so all comporting, we mutually shape the shared world of mattering” (Withy 2021b: 143).

The second possibility, which Taylor argues is exemplified by Derrida, is that “the space of expression” is set up by a “non-agent” (Taylor 2005: 447) Intelligibility happens independently of us, without a reason or a purpose, and it is constantly in the process of undermining and reconfiguring itself. “It is a question”, Derrida writes, “of determining the possibility of meaning on the basis of a ‘formal’ organization which in itself has no meaning” (Derrida 1972 [1982: 134])

The third possibility, which Taylor himself advances, denies against the first that language as such has an ontic grounding. Against the second, Taylor argues that originary language has two goals or telē: first, language aims intrinsically to properly disclose the world. Language has as its purpose

that the features be correctly located, that the goods be fully acknowledged, that our emotions and relations be undistortedly discerned…. [T]his approach to language … makes of [Heidegger] an uncompromising realist. (Taylor 2005: 448)

The second telos of language is “to bring itself undistortedly to light” (Taylor 2005: 448).

Along similar lines, Young argues that language

is something we receive rather than create, something whose genesis lies in neither individual or collective human intention but in, rather, extraintentional reality. (Young 2001: 36)

But this thought—that language is produced by an ‘extraintentional reality’ must be combined with the later Heidegger’s historical and pluralist account of understandings of being. Each particular originary language helps structure an historical world:

As something that in each case is historical, language is nothing other than the happening of exposedness in entities as a whole, an exposedness that is delivered over to being…. Language is the center of the historical existence of a people, a center that forms and preserves the government of the world. (GA38A: 166–7)

This means that each historical world always already shows up for us as bearing meaning and mattering in particular ways, and as establishing a structure of relations in terms of which entities can be manifest. Consequently we are always “co-responding” to the originary language—all action and comportment is a response to the meaningful settings we find ourselves in.

But there are more and less responsive ways to co-respond to the originary language. Heidegger offers an illustrative list of ways that “the human being lives in language”:

by guarding it, but also exploiting it; by listening to it and to its expressed saying, or by merely spreading around what others have said; by gathering themselves into being in language, or by dispersing entities in mere chatter. (GA78: 96)

The most responsive and responsible way of inhabiting a language, Heidegger claims, is to live poetically:

the co-responding in which the human being authentically listens to the appeal of language is that saying which speaks in the element of poetry. (GA7: 184 / PLT 214)

5. Poetic Language

The emphasis on poetry in Heidegger’s later work has a methodological significance. Taking poetic speech, rather than predicative judgment, as the paradigmatic form of linguistic activity, he argues, positions us better to understand what an originary language is, as well as allowing us more clearly to discern the relationship between language, being, and human existence.

The essence of language does not show itself where it has been misused and flattened out, twisted and forced to be a means of communication and has degenerated into a mere external expression of a so-called interior. (GA38A: 168; see also GA13: 180)

Vandevelde links this emphasis on poetry to Heidegger’s effort

to provide thinking with a new ambit … away from thinking understood traditionally as an account given in terms of arguments and reasons…. Poetry names the very configuration of thinking, the fact that thinking itself is ‘made’ and produced, historically situated, thus not rigid and fixed in a logic or set of valid reasonings. It names the “poetic” aspect of thought or the fact that there is a “poetics of thinking”. (Vandevelde 2021: 582)

In a way that parallels exactly his distinction between the essence of language and language in the standard sense, Heidegger draws a distinction between “primary” poetry (aka “true poetry”^[101] or “poetry in the broad sense”) and “poetic speech” (aka “poetry in the narrower sense”; see, e.g., GA5: 60–61 / OTBT 45 / PLT 71).

5.1 Poetry in the Broad Sense

“Poetry in the broad sense” just is originary language: “poetry and language are not two different things; they are both the same basic structure of historical existence” (GA39: 68). But in describing the “basic structure of historical existence” as poetry, Heidegger is emphasizing a particular aspect of the originary language: “Poetry” in the broad sense, Heidegger explains, “is simply the singular coming about in the happening of language” (GA39: 67). One might say that poetry in the broad sense is an historical form of meaningful existence in its creative moment of emergence.

Language can only have begun in the human being’s advent into being. In this advent language was, as being becoming word, poetry. Language is the primal poetry, in which a people poetizes being. Conversely, great poetry, through which a people enters history, starts the formation of its language [in the ordinary sense]. (GA40: 180)

As Young puts it,

“language is poetry” means that language does not simply acknowledge world but rather “projects” it—analogous to the way in which a system of map-making “projects” its “world”. (Young 2001: 34–5)

In connecting poetry to the giving of form that allows a new world to emerge, Heidegger takes his lead from the Greek root of the word ‘poetry’—poiein or poiēsis. Poiein in an ontic sense means ‘to make’. But in an ontological sense, Heidegger argues, “poiein is the ‘bringing-forth’ of something into presence in the unconcealed” (GA50: 112). Primal poetry is an ontological poiein, a “founding beyng in advance—grounding it by shaping it in advance and, in the first naming and saying, lifting entities into salience” (GA16: 335). Primal poetry “invites things to matter to human being as things” (GA12: 19 / PLT 197). It does this by creating “words” or “names”.

A “word”, in Heidegger’s special sense,

is what first brings the particular entity as the entity that it is into this “is”, holds it therein, relates it, and, as it were, provides it the support with which to be a thing. Accordingly, we said, the word does not simply stand in a relation to the thing, but rather the word “is” itself what holds and relates the thing as thing; the word is as this relating: the relation itself. (GA12: 177 / OWL 82)

Here again, we see Heidegger’s relational ontology at work. To be is to stand at a kind of nexus of relationships. A word, in the originary or primal sense, is the nexus of significative relationships. Wrathall explains:

[Primal] words for Heidegger are not representations, and have neither a verbal nor a written form: they are “not palpable to the senses” (GA12: 181 / OWL 87). Indeed, Heidegger claims, the word, like being itself, “is not an entity” (GA12: 182 / OWL 87). Instead, he thinks of words as the relational structures that allow there to be entities in the first place: “the relation of the word to the thing … is not a relationship between the thing on one side and the word on the other. The word itself is the relation, which in each case keeps in itself the thing in such a way that it ‘is’ a thing” (GA12: 159 / OWL 66). (Wrathall 2011: 141)

Or, as Gadamer aptly puts it,

the primacy that language and understanding have in Heidegger’s thought indicates the priority of the “relation” over against its relational members. (Gadamer 1962 [1976: 50])

5.2 Poetry as an art form (Poetry in the “narrower sense”)

What we usually refer to as poetry (Dichtung)—linguistic works of art—Heidegger designates “poesy” (Poesie). “Poesy is poetry in the narrower sense”, he explains, while “Ur-poetry” or “poetry in the essential sense” is “that happening in which entities are first disclosed as entities for human beings” (see, e.g., GA5: 62 / OTBT 46 / PLT 72). “Poetry and ‘Poesy’”, Heidegger insists, “are not the same” (GA80.2: 643). Poesy, poetry in the normal or narrower sense is, however, a privileged form of art and a privileged form of speech, because it discloses to us the originary language in a way that draws us to it, and invites us to adapt ourselves to what is truly essential in our world. “Because poetic saying makes the being of entities appear within itself”, Heidegger claims, “everything said in a truly-saying song ‘is’ ‘more in being’, i.e.,… shining; more brilliant” (GA78: 96).

It is in the “shining” revelation of entities that we come to recognize the sacred and gift-like quality of the world we inhabit. When a thing is shining for someone, as Dreyfus and Kelly put it, it is an “examplar of the most excellent way of life in his or her domain” (Dreyfus & Kelly 2011: 83). Drawing on Hölderlin, Heidegger connects the poetic revelation of shining things to a festival or holiday. Young explains:

in the festive mode (mood) we stand not just in the ‘essence’ of things but also in the ‘wonder’ of the world’s worlding. We step into wonder and adoration of the things that there are, into gratitude for the fact that they are and that we are among them…. In the festive mood, [Heidegger] says, things possess a special ‘gleam’ (Glanz), a gleam which comes from ‘the lighting and shining of the essential’. In the festive mode, that is, things show up as belonging to a sacred order and since they themselves share in this sacredness, command of us love and respect. (Young 2001: 88, quoting GA52: 66)

Poesy or poetry in the narrow sense is, then, is a way of using language to bring us to recognize the “unsayable” background source of intelligibility that governs our world. It shows us what really matters to us, and what is ultimately at stake in our form of life. Moreover, it presents an ethos or form of life in such a way that it draws us to it, attunes us to it, and helps us connect to what truly matters in our world. But these are, according to Heidegger, precisely the characteristics of great works of art (see Thomson, “Heidegger’s Aesthetics”). Thus, in a typical instance of Heideggerian redefinition, he concludes that “all art is in essence poetry” (GA5: 60 / OTBT 45 / PLT 70).