Arguments for Incompatibilism

First published Tue Oct 14, 2003; substantive revision Mon Aug 22, 2022

We believe that we have free will and this belief is so firmly entrenched in our daily lives that it is almost impossible to take seriously the thought that it might be mistaken. We deliberate and make choices, for instance, and in so doing we assume that there is more than one choice we can make, more than one action we are able to perform. When we look back and regret a foolish choice, or blame ourselves for not doing something we should have done, we assume that we could have chosen and done otherwise. When we look forward and make plans for the future, we assume that we have at least some control over our actions and the course of our lives; we think it is at least sometimes up to us what we choose and try to do.

Determinism is a highly general claim about the universe: very roughly, that everything that happens, including everything you choose and do, is determined by facts about the past together with the laws. Determinism isn’t part of common sense, and it is not easy to take seriously the thought that it might, for all we know, be true. The incompatibilist believes that if determinism turned out to be true, our belief that we have free will would be false. The compatibilist denies that the truth of determinism would have this drastic consequence. According to the compatibilist, the truth of determinism is compatible with the truth of our belief that we have free will. The philosophical problem of free will and determinism is the problem of deciding who is right: the compatibilist or the incompatibilist.

Much of the philosophical interest in the free will/determinism problem is motivated by concerns about moral responsibility because, it is generally agreed, having free will is a necessary condition of being morally responsible. So if determinism precludes free will, it also precludes moral responsibility. But it’s important to distinguish questions about free will (whether we have it, what it amounts to, whether it is compatible with determinism, whether it is compatible with other things we believe true) from questions about moral responsibility. Someone might believe that we have free will and that free will is compatible with determinism while also believing, for other reasons, that no one is ever morally responsible. And someone might believe that we don’t have free will (because of determinism or something else) while also believing, against conventional wisdom, that we are nevertheless morally responsible. What one believes about determinism and moral responsibility will depend, in large part, on what one believes about various matters within the scope of ethics rather than metaphysics. Among other things, it will depend on what one takes moral responsibility to be (P. Strawson 1962; G. Strawson 1986, 1994; Scanlon 2008; Watson 1996, 2004; Wolf 1990). For these reasons it is important not to conflate the question of the compatibility of free will and determinism with the question of whether moral responsibility is compatible with determinism.

It must be acknowledged that a change in definitions has crept into the literature, and many contemporary theorists understand ‘compatibilism’ and ‘incompatibilism’ as claims about moral responsibility (or “moral freedom” or the freedom that “grounds” or “explains” “moral responsibility”) rather than claims about free will (Pereboom 1995, 2001, 2014. See Vihvelin 2011 for discussion). This entry will not follow that usage.

This encyclopedia entry is about the free will/determinism problem; more specifically, it is about arguments for the claim that free will is incompatible with determinism. Since so much of the contemporary free will literature is dominated by concerns about moral responsibility, some of the arguments considered will be arguments for the thesis that if determinism is true, we are never morally responsible because we never satisfy the “freedom requirement” for being morally responsible for our actions. But the focus, in this entry, will be on the question of whether free will (or acting with free will) is compatible with determinism.

1. Preliminaries

In the literature, “determinism” is sometimes used as an umbrella term for a variety of different claims which have traditionally been regarded as threats to free will. Given this usage, the thesis that we are calling “determinism” (nomological determinism, also sometimes called ‘causal determinism’) is just one of several different kinds of determinism, and the free will/determinism problem we will be discussing is one of a family of related problems. For instance, logical determinism is the thesis that the principle of bivalence holds for all propositions, including propositions about the future, and the problem of free will and logical determinism is the problem of deciding whether our belief that we have free will is compatible with the existence of truths about all our future actions. (It should be noted that on this point there is almost universal agreement among philosophers that the answer is “yes”.) For more on logical determinism, see the entry on fatalism; Taylor 1962; D. Lewis 1976; Merricks 2009; Fischer & Todd 2011; Van Cleve 2019; Vihvelin 2013 and 2020. Theological determinism is the thesis that God exists and has infallible knowledge of all true propositions including propositions about our future actions; the problem of free will and theological determinism is the problem of understanding how, if at all, we can have free will if God (who cannot be mistaken) knows what we are going to do. For more on theological determinism, see the entries on fatalism and divine foreknowledge and Fischer & Todd 2015.

In this entry, we will be restricting our attention to arguments for the incompatibility of free will and nomological determinism, but it is important to understand one preliminary point. Nomological and logical determinism are very different kinds of claims. Logical determinism is a claim about truth; nomological determinism is a claim about the natural laws. Logical determinism doesn’t say anything about causation or the laws; it simply says that, regardless of whether we ever come to know them or not, there are timelessly true propositions about the past, present, and future, including our future actions. Logical determinism doesn’t entail nomological determinism; it might be true even if nomological determinism is false. But nomological determinism says (roughly) that facts about the past together with facts about the laws determine all the facts about the future. So if nomological determinism is true, there are true propositions about all our future actions.

Why does this matter? For the following reason. A common first response to logical determinism is the fatalist’s response:

If there are truths about what I will do in the future, then I must do whatever I will do, and so I have no free will.

While this response has a powerful intuitive grip (as can be seen from much of the popular and even scientific discussion of time travel), it is generally agreed, by philosophers, that the fatalist is making a mistake. Different diagnoses have been given of the “fatalist fallacy” or other mistake in modal reasoning, but the basic point is simple. Truth is not the same as necessity; it isn’t the same as logical necessity, metaphysical necessity, or even the relative necessity of unavoidability or lack of ability or power. The existence of a detailed set of truths about my future actions is consistent with my ability to do things other than the things I actually do.

It is of course possible to agree that the existence of truths about all our future actions is compatible with free will while denying that the existence of nomologically determined truths about all our future actions is compatible with free will. But an argument is needed for this conclusion, an argument which doesn’t rely on fatalist reasoning or an appeal to fatalist intuitions.

For comparisons between arguments for incompatibilism and arguments for fatalism, see van Inwagen 1983, Mackie 2003, Perry 2004, and Vihvelin 2008 and 2013.

At a first approximation, nomological determinism (henceforth “determinism”), is a contingent and empirical claim about the laws of nature: that they are deterministic rather than probabilistic, and that they are all-encompassing rather than limited in scope. At a second approximation, laws are deterministic if they entail exceptionless regularities (e.g., that all \(F\)s are \(G\)s, that all \(ABCD\)s are \(E\)s) and laws are probabilistic if they say that \(F\)s have an objective chance \(N\) (less than 1) of being \(G\)s (note that so-called “statistical laws” need not be probabilistic laws; see Armstrong 1983, Loewer 1996a). The laws of nature are all-encompassing if deterministic or probabilistic laws apply to everything in the universe, without any exceptions. If, on the other hand, some individuals or some parts of some individuals (e.g., the nonphysical minds of human beings) or some of the behaviors of some of the individuals (e.g., the free actions of human beings) do not fall under either deterministic or probabilistic laws, then the laws are limited rather than all-encompassing.

For a more precise articulation of determinism, the contemporary literature offers us two main choices.

Determinism is standardly defined in terms of entailment, along these lines: A complete description of the state of the world at any time together with a complete specification of the laws entails a complete description of the state of the world at any other time. (Hoefer 2002, Mele 2009, Beebee 2013; see also van Inwagen 1983, Ginet 1990, and the Encyclopedia entry on causal determinism).

Alternatively, following D. Lewis 1973, we might understand determinism as the thesis that our world is governed by a set of natural laws which is such that any two possible worlds with our laws which are exactly alike at any time are also exactly alike at every other time (see also Earman 1986). This second definition of determinism is stronger than the first; if a possible world is deterministic according to the Lewis/Earman definition, it is deterministic according to the Entailment definition, but not vice versa.

Let’s call a possible world ‘deterministic’ iff the thesis of determinism is true at that world; ‘non-deterministic’ iff the thesis of determinism is false at that world. There are two very different ways in which a world might be non-deterministic. A world might be non-deterministic because at least some of its fundamental laws are probabilistic, or a world might be non-deterministic because it has no laws or because its laws are not all-encompassing. Let’s call worlds which are non-deterministic in only the first way ‘probabilistic worlds’ and let’s call worlds which are non-deterministic in the second way ‘lawless’ or ‘partly lawless’ worlds.

Determinism is a thesis about the statements or propositions that are the laws of our world; it says nothing about whether these statements or propositions are knowable by finite beings, let alone whether they could, even in principle, be used to predict all future events. (For more on the relation between determinism and predictability, see the Encyclopedia entry on Causal Determinism.)

Determinism, understood according to either of the two definitions above, is neutral with respect to different philosophical accounts of lawhood, ranging from the so-called “naïve regularity” account (Swartz 1986) to broadly Humean or “best system” accounts (D. Lewis 1973; Earman 1986; Loewer 1996a; Beebee 2000; Schaffer 2008) to various kinds of necessitarian accounts (Armstrong 1983; Carroll 2008). In the book that set the stage for much of the contemporary discussion of the free will/determinism problem, van Inwagen 1983 appealed only to two relatively uncontroversial assumptions about the laws of nature: that the propositions that are laws have this status independent of the history or present state of scientific knowledge and that the laws impose limits on our abilities. Most of the participants in the current debate agree, but there are dissenters who think that determinism must be defined in a metaphysically stronger way, as a kind of necessitation relation between particular events (Mumford & Anjum 2014). For critique, see Mackie 2014a and Franklin 2014.

Determinism (understood according to either of the two definitions above) is not a thesis about causation; it is not the thesis that causation is always a relation between events, and it is not the thesis that every event has a cause. If the fundamental laws turn out to be probabilistic rather than deterministic, this doesn’t mean that there is no causation; it just means that we have to revise our theories of causation to fit the facts. And this is what philosophers of causation have done; there are probabilistic versions of lawful entailment theories of causation, of counterfactual theories of causation, and so on, for all major theories of causation (see the entries on the metaphysics of causation and counterfactual theories of causation). It is now generally accepted that it might be true that every event has a cause even if determinism is false and thus some events lack sufficient causes.

More controversially, it might be true that every event has a cause even if our world is neither deterministic nor probabilistic. If there can be causes without laws (if a particular event, object, or person can be a cause, for instance, without instantiating a law), then it might be true, even at a lawless or partly lawless world, that every event has a cause (Anscombe 1981; van Inwagen 1983).

It’s less clear whether determinism entails the thesis that every event has a cause. Whether it does depends on what the correct theory of causation is; in particular, it depends on what the correct theory says about the relation between causation and law.

What is clear, however, is that we should not make the assumption, almost universally made in the older literature, that the thesis that every event has a cause is equivalent to the thesis of determinism. This is an important point, because some of the older arguments in the literature against incompatibilism assume that the two claims are equivalent (Hobart 1934).

In the older literature, it was assumed that determinism is the working hypothesis of science, and that to reject determinism is to be against science. This no longer seems plausible. Some people think that quantum physics has shown determinism to be false. This remains controversial (Albert 1992; Loewer 1996b; P. Lewis 2016), but it is now generally agreed that we can reject determinism without accepting the view that the behavior of human beings falls outside the scope of natural laws. If naturalism is the thesis that human behavior can be explained in the same kind of way—in terms of events, natural processes, and laws of nature—as everything else in the universe, then we can reject determinism without rejecting naturalism.

Note, finally, that determinism neither entails physicalism nor is entailed by it. There are possible worlds where determinism is true and physicalism false; e.g., worlds where minds are nonphysical things which nevertheless obey deterministic laws (van Inwagen 1998). And there are possible worlds (perhaps our own) where physicalism is true and determinism is false.

So much for determinism. What about free will? How should we understand the disagreement between the compatibilist and the incompatibilist?

There’s lots of room for argument about how, exactly, we should understand our commonsense beliefs about ourselves as persons with free will. (Are we born with free will? If not, when do we acquire it, and in virtue of what abilities or powers do we have it? What is the difference between acting intentionally and acting with free will?) Luckily we don’t have to answer these questions in order to say what is at issue between the compatibilist and the incompatibilist. Let’s define the free will thesis as the thesis that at least one non-godlike (human-like) creature has free will, leaving it open what that amounts to. The free will thesis is a minimal claim about free will; it would be true if one person in the universe acted with free will (acted freely, acted while possessing free will) on one occasion. We won’t assume that the free will thesis is true or even possibly true, but let a free will world be any possible world where the free will thesis is true. Since non-determinism is the negation of determinism, and since determinism is a contingent thesis, we can divide the set of possible worlds into two non-overlapping subsets: deterministic worlds and non-deterministic worlds.

Given this apparatus, we could define incompatibilism and compatibilism in the following way: incompatibilism is the thesis that no deterministic world is a free will world. (Equivalently, incompatibilism is the claim that necessarily, if determinism is true, then the free will thesis is false.) And we could define compatibilism as the denial of incompatibilism; that is, as the claim that some deterministic worlds are free will worlds. (Equivalently, compatibilism is the claim that possibly, determinism and the free will thesis are both true.)

This way of defining compatibilism is unproblematic. There are compatibilists who are agnostic about the truth or falsity of determinism, so a compatibilist need not be a soft determinist (someone who believes that it is in fact the case that determinism is true and we have free will). And a compatibilist might believe that we don’t have free will for reasons independent of determinism. But all compatibilists believe that it is at least possible that determinism is true and we have free will. So all compatibilists are committed to the claim that there are deterministic worlds that are free will worlds.

But this definition of incompatibilism has a surprising consequence. Suppose, as some philosophers have argued, that we lack free will because free will is conceptually or metaphysically impossible, at least for nongodlike creatures like us (Taylor 1962; G. Strawson 1986, 1994). If these philosophers are right, there are no free will worlds. And if there are no free will worlds, it follows that there are no deterministic free will worlds. So if free will is conceptually or metaphysically impossible, at least for creatures like us, it follows that incompatibilism (as we have just defined it) is true. But this doesn’t seem right. If it is conceptually or metaphysically impossible for us to have free will, then we lack free will regardless of whether determinism is true or false. And if that is so, then the incompatibilist cannot say the kind of things she has traditionally wanted to say: that the truth or falsity of determinism is relevant to the question of whether or not we have free will, that if determinism were true, then we would lack free will because determinism is true, and so on.

If we want to avoid this counter-intuitive result, there is a remedy. Instead of understanding compatibilism and incompatibilism as propositions that are contradictories, we can understand them as propositions that are contraries. That is, we can understand compatibilism and incompatibilism as claims that can’t both be true, but that can both be false. Compatibilism and incompatibilism are both false if a third claim, impossibilism, is true. Impossibilism is the thesis that free will is conceptually or metaphysically impossible for non-godlike creatures like us.

If we accept this three-fold classification, we can define our terms as follows: Impossibilism is the thesis that there are no free will worlds. Incompatibilism is the thesis that there are free will worlds but no deterministic world is a free will world. Compatibilism is the thesis that there are free will worlds and free will worlds include deterministic worlds. (For some objections to this three-fold classification see McKenna 2010 and Mickelson 2015a. For defense, see Vihvelin 2008 and 2013.)

The term ‘impossibilism’ is being coined; however, the position it describes is recognized in the literature under a variety of names: the “no free will either way” view, “non-realism”, “illusionism”, “pessimism”. Theorists who defend impossibilism include G. Strawson 1986 and 1994, and Smilansky 2000. Another kind of impossibilist is the fatalist (Taylor 1962).

In the older literature, there were just two kinds of incompatibilists—hard determinists and libertarians. A hard determinist is an incompatibilist who believes that determinism is in fact true (or, perhaps, that it is close enough to being true so far as we are concerned, in the ways relevant to free will) and because of this we lack free will (Holbach 1770; Wegner 2003). A libertarian is an incompatibilist who believes that we in fact have free will and this entails that determinism is false, in the right kind of way (van Inwagen 1983). Traditionally, libertarians have believed that “the right kind of way” requires that agents have a special and mysterious causal power not had by anything else in nature: a godlike power to be an uncaused cause of changes in the world (Chisholm 1964). Libertarians who hold this view are committed, it seems, to the claim that free will is possible only at worlds that are at least partly lawless, and that our world is such a world (but see O’Connor 2000, Clarke 2003 and Steward 2012). But in the contemporary literature there are incompatibilists who avoid such risky metaphysical claims by arguing that free will is possible at worlds where some of our actions have indeterministic event causes (Kane 1996, 1999, 2008, 2011a; Ekstrom 2000; Balaguer 2010; Franklin 2018) or that free will is possible at worlds where some of our actions are uncaused (Ginet 1990). Note that none of these three kinds of incompatibilists (agent-causation theorists, indeterministic event-causation theorists, non-causal theorists) need be libertarians. They may reserve judgment about the truth or falsity of determinism and therefore reserve judgment about whether or not we in fact have free will. They might also be hard determinists because they believe that determinism is in fact true. But what they do believe—what makes them incompatibilists—is that it is possible for us to have free will and that our having free will depends on a contingent fact about the laws that govern the universe: that they are indeterministic in the right kind of way. (See the entry on incompatibilist theories of free will).

Given these definitions and distinctions, we can now take the first step towards clarifying the disagreement between compatibilists and incompatibilists. Both sides agree that it is conceptually and metaphysically possible for us to have free will; their disagreement is about whether any of the possible worlds where we have free will are deterministic worlds. The compatibilist says ‘yes’; the incompatibilist says ‘no’. Arguments for incompatibilism must, then, be arguments for the claim that necessarily, if determinism is true, we lack the free will we might otherwise have.

2. Two Reasons for Thinking that Free Will is Incompatible with Determinism

A common first response to determinism is to think that it means that our choices make no difference to anything that happens because earlier causes have pre-determined or “fixed” our entire future (Nahmias 2011). It is easy to think that determinism implies that we have a destiny or fate that we cannot avoid, no matter what we choose or decide and no matter how hard we try.

Man, when running over, frequently without his own knowledge, frequently in spite of himself, the route which nature has marked out for him, resembles a swimmer who is obliged to follow the current that carries him along; he believes himself a free agent because he sometimes consents, sometimes does not consent, to glide with the stream, which, notwithstanding, always hurries him forward. (Holbach 1770 [2002]: 181; see also Wegner 2003)

It is widely agreed, by incompatibilists as well as compatibilists, that this is a mistake. Empirical discoveries about our brain and behavior might tell us that we don’t have as much conscious control as we think we have (Wegner 2003; Libet 1999). (For critique of arguments claiming that recent scientific research has shown that “conscious will is an illusion”, see Mele 2009, some of the essays in Sinnott-Armstrong & Nadel 2011, Mele 2015, and Roskies & Nahmias 2016.) And there are worries, arising from certain versions of physicalism, that our mental states don’t have the causal powers we think they have (Kim 1998). But these threats to free will have nothing to do with determinism. Determinism might imply that our choices and efforts have earlier sufficient causes; it does not imply that we don’t make choices or that our choices and efforts are causally impotent. Determinism is consistent with the fact that our deliberation, choices and efforts are part of the causal process whereby our bodies move and cause further effects in the world. And a cause is the kind of thing that “makes a difference” (Sartorio 2005, Menzies 2017, List 2019). If I raise my hand because I chose to do so, then it’s true, ceteris paribus, that if my choice had not occurred, my hand-raising would not have occurred.

Putting aside this worry, we may classify arguments for incompatibilism as falling into one of two main varieties:

  1. Arguments for the claim that determinism would make it impossible for us to cause and control our actions in the right kind of way.
  2. Arguments for the claim that determinism would deprive us of the power or ability to do or choose otherwise.

Arguments of the first kind focus on the notions of self, causation, and responsibility; the worry is that determinism rules out the kind of causation that we invoke when we attribute actions to persons (“It was Suzy who broke the vase”) and make judgments of moral responsibility (“It wasn’t her fault; Billy pushed her”). Someone who argues for incompatibilism in this way may concede that the truth of determinism is consistent with the causal efficacy of our deliberation, choices, and attempts to act. But, she insists, determinism implies that the only sense in which we are responsible for what we do is the sense in which a dog or young child is responsible. Moral responsibility requires something more than this, she believes. Moral responsibility requires autonomy or self-determination: that our actions are caused and controlled by, and only by, our selves. To use a slogan popular in the literature: We act freely and are morally responsible only if we are the ultimate source of our actions.

Each of us, when we act, is a prime mover unmoved. In doing what we do, we cause certain events to happen, and nothing—or no one—causes us to cause these events to happen. (Chisholm 1964: 32)

Free will…is the power of agents to be the ultimate creators or originators and sustainers of their own ends or purposes…when we trace the causal or explanatory chains of action back to their sources in the purposes of free agents, these causal chains must come to an end or terminate in the willings (choices, decisions, or efforts) of the agents, which cause or bring about their purposes. (Kane 1996: 4)

Arguments of the second kind focus on the notion of choice. To have a choice, it seems, is to have genuine options or alternatives—different ways in which we can act. The worry is that determinism entails that what we do is, always, the only thing we can do, and that because of this we never really have a choice about anything, as opposed to being under the (perhaps inescapable) illusion that we have a choice. Someone who argues for incompatibilism in this way may concede that the truth of determinism is consistent with our making choices, at least in the sense in which a dog or young child makes choices, and consistent also with our choices being causally effective. But, she insists, this is not enough for free will; we have free will only if we have a genuine choice about what actions we perform, and we have a genuine choice only if there is more than one action we are able to perform.

A person has free will if he is often in positions like these: he must now speak or be silent, and he can now speak and can now remain silent; he must attempt to rescue a drowning child or else go for help, and he is able to attempt to rescue the child and able to go for help; he must now resign his chairmanship or else lie to the members; and he has it within his power to resign and he has it within his power to lie. (van Inwagen 1983: 8)

van Inwagen is giving what he takes to be uncontroversial examples of persons who have free will; he isn’t saying that free will just is the ability to perform more than one overt action. Our choices include choices among purely mental actions (to pay attention to a lecture or to spend the time deciding what to cook for dinner) as well as choices about the actions we perform by moving our bodies. If the incompatibilist claims that determinism robs us of free will by robbing us of choice, this must be understood as the claim that determinism has the consequence that we are never able to do anything other than what we actually do, where “do” includes deciding, choosing, and other instances of mental agency as well as the things we do by moving our bodies.

We might question whether arguments based on self-determination and arguments based on choice are independent ways of arguing for incompatibilism for the following reason: I cause and control my actions in the self-determining way required for moral responsibility only if my actions are the product of my free will and my actions are the product of my free will only if I have the ability to do (choose to do, decide to do, intend to do, try to do) otherwise. If determinism has the consequence that I never have the ability to do otherwise, it also has the consequence that I never cause my actions in the self-determining way required for moral responsibility (Kane 1996).

At one time, this link between moral responsibility, self-determination, and the ability to do otherwise was common ground between compatibilists and incompatibilists. That is, everyone agreed that a person is morally responsible only if she has the right kind of control over what she does, and everyone assumed that a person has the right kind of control over something she does only if she is able to do (or at least decide, choose, intend, or try) otherwise. Given this assumption, anyone hoping to defend the claim that moral responsibility is compatible with determinism had to first show that the ability to do otherwise is compatible with determinism. During the heyday of ordinary language philosophy in the middle years of the last century, there was a further assumption: that the ability to do otherwise is compatible with determinism only if sentences like “\(S\) could have done \(X\)” (where \(X\) is something \(S\) did not do) were equivalent in meaning to counterfactual conditionals like “if \(S\) had chosen (or tried, wanted, preferred, etc.) to do \(X\), \(S\) would have done \(X\)”. This debate was crippled by the fact that it took place at a time when counterfactuals were still poorly understood, before the advent of the Lewis-Stalnaker possible worlds semantics (D. Lewis 1973). There were counterexamples to the analyses proposed, and there was a growing consensus that the prospects for a successful “Conditional Analysis” were dim (Austin 1956; Chisholm 1964; Lehrer 1968 and 1976). (For an argument that this pessimism was premature, see Vihvelin 2004 and 2013. For an argument that a compatibilist doesn’t need to defend a Conditional Analysis, see Lehrer 1976.)

It was against this background that Harry Frankfurt proposed his famous counterexample to the “Principle of Alternate Possibilities” (a person is morally responsible for what he has done only if he could have done otherwise). Frankfurt wanted to defend the claim that moral responsibility is compatible with determinism without having to defend the claim that the ability to do otherwise is compatible with determinism. His strategy took the form of an ingenious thought experiment that was supposed to show that no matter how you understand ability to do otherwise—whether you are a compatibilist or an incompatibilist—you should agree that the possession of this ability is not a necessary condition of being morally responsible (Frankfurt 1969).

There were two steps to the thought experiment. In the first step he invited you to imagine a person, Jones, who has free will, and who acts freely and who satisfies all the conditions you think necessary and sufficient for moral responsibility. You may imagine Jones in one of the scenarios van Inwagen describes, faced with a choice to speak or be silent, to try to rescue the child or go for help, to resign his chairmanship or to lie, and to imagine that Jones deliberates and decides, for his own reasons, in favor of one of his contemplated alternatives, and then successfully acts on his decision. In the second step you are invited to add to the story the existence of a powerful being, Black, who takes a great interest in what Jones does, including how he deliberates and decides. You may fill in the details however you like, but you must imagine that Black has the power to interfere with Jones in a way that ensures that Jones does exactly what Black wants him to do. And you must also imagine that Black is paying very close attention and is prepared to intervene instantly, should it be necessary, to stop Jones from doing something Black doesn’t want him to do. But, as it turns out, it wasn’t necessary. By lucky co-incidence, Jones did exactly what Black wanted him to do. (He even deliberated and decided the way Black wanted him to deliberate and decide.) So Black remained on the sidelines and only watched.

Because Black never laid a finger on Jones, or interfered in any way, it seems that Jones is as morally responsible in the second step of the story as he is in the first step. But it also seems that the existence of the powerful Black suffices to make it the case that Jones is unable to do otherwise (or, as Frankfurt put it, that he lacks “alternate possibilities”.)

Frankfurt’s story has strong intuitive force, and many were convinced that it shows that we were mistaken when we thought that a person has the right kind of control over what she does—the kind of control that is necessary for moral responsibility—only if she is able to do otherwise. These philosophers, who later became known as “Source” compatibilists or “semi-compatibilists”, took the moral to be that it is not relevant, so far as moral responsibility is concerned, whether determinism has the consequence that we don’t have the free will we think we have, that we never have any genuine choices, that we are never able to do otherwise. They said that what matters, so far as moral responsibility is concerned, is only what happens in the “actual sequence” (Fischer 1994; Fischer & Ravizza 1998; Sartorio 2016).

But a little reflection should make us wonder whether facts about the “actual sequence” can come apart from facts about free will in the way envisaged by Frankfurt. How can it be true that Black succeeds, not just in limiting the range of Jones’ alternative courses of action, but in making it the case that Jones has no alternatives? How can Black, sitting on the sidelines, deprive Jones of the ability to deliberate, decide, or try otherwise?

We can easily grant that Black has the power to directly manipulate Jones’ body so Jones loses the ability to move his body in any way other than the ways that Black wants. We might even grant that Black has the power to directly manipulate Jones’ mind/brain, so Jones loses the ability to “move” his mind in any way other than the ways that Black wants. But Black never exercises his power. There is a difference between the existence of a power and the exercise of a power. It is a modal fallacy to reason from “Black has the power to bring it about that Jones lacks the ability to do otherwise” to “Jones lacks the ability to do otherwise”. The truth about Jones is not that Black robs him of the ability to do otherwise; it is the more complicated truth that Black puts him at constant risk of losing the ability to do otherwise. Jones’ free will and his moral responsibility are dependent on the luck of his deliberations and intentions co-coinciding with those of Black (Vihvelin 2013; for some other criticisms of Frankfurt’s argument see Lamb 1993, Alvarez 2009, and Steward 2009).

Frankfurt’s argument has been enormously influential, though perhaps not in the way he intended. His thought experiment was a failure; while most compatibilists were convinced, most incompatibilists were not. (Compatibilists who were not convinced include Smith 1997, 2004; Campbell 2005; Fara 2008; Vihvelin 2000 and 2013.) These incompatibilists insisted, though not for the reason given above, that Black does not succeed in robbing Jones of all his freedom; there is something that remains up to Jones (Widerker 1995; Ginet 1996; Kane 1996). This response, famously dubbed the “flickers of freedom” reply, was criticized by defenders of Frankfurt’s argument on the ground that the “alternative possibilities” retained by Jones are not sufficiently “robust” (Fischer 1994, 2003; Fischer & Ravizza 1998). The critics of the argument rejected this charge, arguing that Jones retains a morally relevant ability to do otherwise, thus resurrecting the very debate that Frankfurt had hoped to undermine. Other defenders of Frankfurt’s argument told more complicated stories and argued that, even if Frankfurt’s story does not succeed, these new stories show that a person may be morally responsible for her action despite lacking any ability to do otherwise (Mele & Robb 1998; Pereboom 2003). More than fifty years after the publication of Frankfurt’s article, the debate continues. For a sample of some of this vast literature, see Widerker & McKenna 2003.

Frankfurt’s aim was to make it easier to defend the claim that moral responsibility is compatible with determinism and there is a case to be made that he was successful or, at least, successful against the “Source” incompatibilists who were convinced by his argument (Fischer 2003, Sartorio 2016). But there has been a cost. Our interest in free will is not limited to our interest in moral responsibility. Compatibilism has historically been charged with being “a wretched subterfuge” and a “quagmire of evasion”. Determinism seems prima facie incompatible with genuine choice and the ability to do otherwise, and while there was a time when the philosophical consensus was that the incompatibilist is guilty of some simple confusion or mistake akin to the fatalist’s mistake, this is no longer the case, thanks to the Consequence argument (to be discussed later). The influence of Frankfurt’s argument (and his other essays, especially Frankfurt 1971) has been so great that most compatibilists have turned their attention away from the free will/determinism problem and focused exclusively on problems about moral responsibility (and related topics, like blame, desert, and punishment). The term ‘compatibilism’ is now often used to refer to a thesis about moral responsibility—that the freedom sufficient for moral responsibility is compatible with determinism (Pereboom 1995), that the existence of actions free in the sense required for moral responsibility is compatible with determinism (Markosian 1999), that the unique ability of persons to exercise control in the manner necessary for moral responsibility is compatible with determinism (McKenna 2004b [2015]). The literature on the traditional problem of free will and determinism is dominated by incompatibilists. There is a growing consensus that the incompatibilist is right: if our universe is a deterministic one, we never have the ability to choose and do anything other than what we actually do.

Before we ask whether this pessimism about the compatibility of free will with determinism is warranted, we should pause to ask whether there really is a substantive disagreement between compatibilists and incompatibilists. When an incompatibilist says that determinism would rob us of the free will we think we have, including genuine choices and the ability to do otherwise, and when the compatibilist denies this, are they asserting and denying the same proposition? Or is the incompatibilist asserting one thing while the compatibilist is denying something else?

Some of the things said in the literature suggest that there is no substantive debate. For instance, some philosophers contrast a “strong incompatibilist ability” with a “weak compatibilist ability” (or “libertarian free will” with “compatibilist free will”) and write in a way that suggests that they think that the only substantive question about free will is whether it is or entails the “strong” incompatibilist ability to do otherwise (since the “weak” compatibilist ability to do otherwise is, by definition, compatible with determinism). And one leading semantic proposal might seem to support the claim that there is no real dispute. According to the Lewis/Kratzer, proposal ‘can’ (and other modal words, including ‘is able’, ‘has the power’, ‘is free to’) means ‘compossible with relevant facts F’, and the relevant facts are determined by the context together with the intentions of the speaker (D. Lewis 1976, Kratzer 1977). For a different kind of contextualist proposal see Hawthorne 2001; for criticism, see Feldman 2004. Whittle 2021 is a book-length defense of a contextualist account of freedom and responsibility.

So, for instance, it might be true, given one context, that I can speak Finnish (I’m a native Estonian speaker, so it wouldn’t take that long for me to learn Finnish) and false, given another context (don’t take me to Finland as your interpreter). There is no contradiction in saying that I both can and can’t speak Finnish, so long as we understand that what we are saying is that my speaking Finnish is compossible with one set of facts (my ability to easily learn the language) and not compossible with another, more inclusive set of facts (my current inability to speak it). Given this understanding of ‘can, it might seem that there is no genuine disagreement between the compatibilist and the incompatibilist. When the compatibilist asserts that deterministic agents are often able to do otherwise, she has in mind contexts (the contexts of ordinary speakers, in daily life) in which the relevant facts \(F\) are restricted to some relatively local facts about the agent and her surroundings. When the incompatibilist denies that any deterministic agent is ever able to do otherwise, she has in mind contexts (the contexts of philosophers discussing the free will/determinism problem) in which the relevant facts include all the facts about the laws and the past. So the proposition denied by the incompatibilist is not the proposition asserted by the compatibilist.

The leading contemporary incompatibilist, van Inwagen, rejects any suggestion that the compatibilist and the incompatibilist have a merely verbal disagreement, either because they are using different senses of ‘can’ (‘ability’, ‘power’, “free will” etc.) or because they are focusing on different contexts of utterance. The debate, he says, is about whether determinism has the consequence that no one is ever able to do otherwise (equivalently, that no one ever has it in their power to do otherwise) given what ordinary speakers mean, in the contexts in which they use these words. The contexts to which he is referring are the contexts of deliberation and choice in which we consider our options, while believing that we are able to pursue each of them. When a compatibilist asserts, and an incompatibilist denies, that a person at a deterministic world is sometimes able to do otherwise, they mean exactly the same thing by ‘is able to’; they mean what ordinary English speakers mean (in these contexts). The proposition asserted by the compatibilist is the proposition denied by the incompatibilist. Citing David Lewis as his example of a compatibilist opponent, van Inwagen says that he and Lewis cannot both be right. One of them is wrong, but neither is muddled or making a simple mistake (van Inwagen 2008).

In what follows, we will assume that the debate about free will (including, but not necessarily limited to, genuine choice and the ability to do otherwise) and determinism is a substantive debate, and not one that can be dissolved by appeal to different senses or contexts of utterance. We will now turn to the arguments.

3. Arguments based on Intuition

Some arguments for incompatibilism don’t fall into either of the two varieties described above—arguments that determinism is incompatible with ultimate sourcehood and arguments that determinism is incompatible with choice and the ability to do otherwise. These are arguments that appeal primarily to our intuitions. There are many variations on this way of arguing for incompatibilism, but the basic structure of the argument is usually something like this:

If determinism is true, we are like: billiard balls, windup toys, playthings of external forces, puppets, robots, victims of a nefarious neurosurgeon who controls us by directly manipulating the brain states that are the immediate causes of our actions. Billiard balls (windup toys, etc.) have no free will. So if determinism is true, we don’t have free will.

Most of these intuition-based arguments are not very good. Even if determinism entails that there is something we have in common with things which lack free will, it doesn’t follow that there are no relevant differences. Billiard balls, toys, puppets, and simple robots lack minds, and having a mind is a necessary condition of having free will. And determinism doesn’t have the consequence that all our actions are caused by irresistible desires that are, like the neurosurgeon’s direct manipulations, imposed on us by external forces outside our control. (For criticism of “intuition pumps”, see Dennett 1984. For discussion of cases involving more subtle kinds of manipulation, see Section 3.2.)

With this caveat in mind, let’s take a closer look at the two most influential intuition-based arguments.

3.1 No Forking Paths Argument

The No Forking Paths argument (van Inwagen 1983; Fischer 1994; Ekstrom 2000) begins by appealing to the idea that whenever we make a choice we are doing (or think we are doing) something like what a traveler does when faced with a choice between different roads. The only roads the traveler is able to choose are roads which are a continuation of the road she is already on. By analogy, the only choices we are able to make are choices which are a continuation of the actual past and consistent with the laws of nature. If determinism is false, then making choices really is like this: one “road” (the past) behind us, two or more different “roads” (future actions consistent with the laws) in front of us. But if determinism is true, then our journey through life is like traveling (in one direction only) on a road which has no branches. There are other roads, leading to other destinations; if we could get to one of these other roads, we could reach a different destination. But we can’t get to any of these other roads from the road we are actually on. So if determinism is true, our actual future is our only possible future; we are never able to choose or do anything other than what we actually do. (See also Flint 1987 and Warfield 2003 for discussion of a related argument that appeals to the metaphor of our freedom to “add” to the list of truths about the world.)

This is intuitively powerful, since it’s natural to think of our future as being “open” in the branching way suggested by the road analogy and to associate this kind of branching structure with freedom of choice. But several crucial assumptions have been smuggled into this picture: assumptions about time and causation and assumptions about possibility. The assumptions about time and causation needed to make the analogy work include the following: that we “move” through time in something like the way that we move down a road, that our “movement” is necessarily in one direction only, from past to future, that the past is necessarily “fixed” or beyond our control in some way that the future is not. These assumptions are all controversial; on some theories of time and causation (the four-dimensionalist theory of time, a theory of causation that permits time travel and backwards causation), they are all false (D. Lewis 1976; Horwich 1987; Sider 2001; Hoefer 2003).

The assumption about possibility is that possible worlds are concrete spatio-temporal things (in the way that roads are) and that worlds can overlap (literally share a common part) in the way that roads can overlap. But most possible worlds theorists reject the first assumption and nearly everyone rejects the second assumption (D. Lewis 1986).

Determinism (without these additional assumptions) does not have the consequence that our “journey” through life is like moving down a road; the contrast between non-determinism and determinism is not the contrast between traveling on a branching road and traveling on a road with no branches.

As an argument for incompatibilism, the appeal to the metaphor of the branching roads (“the garden of forking paths”) fails. If we strip away the metaphors, the main premise of the argument turns into the claim that we have genuine choices between alternative course of action only if our choosing and doing otherwise is compossible with the actual past and the actual laws. But this claim is none other than a statement of what the incompatibilist believes and the compatibilist denies.

If the intuitions to which the No Forking Paths argument appeals nevertheless continue to engage us, it is because we think that our range of possible choices is constrained by two factors: the laws and the past. We can’t change or break the laws; we can’t causally affect the past. (Even if backwards causation is logically possible, it is not within our power.) These beliefs—about the laws and the past—are the basis of the most influential contemporary argument for incompatibilism: the Consequence argument. More of this later.

3.2 Manipulation and Design Arguments

We turn now to a family of arguments that work by appealing to our intuitive response to cases involving two persons, whom we will call “Victim” and “Producer”. Producer designs or manipulates Victim (in some of the stories, in the way the maker of a robot designs his robot or a god creates a human being; in other stories, by employing techniques of behavioral engineering or neural manipulation). Producer’s purpose is to ensure either that Victim performs a specific action (Mele 1995, 2006, 2019; Rosen 2002; Pereboom 1995, 2001, 2008, 2014) or that he will have the kind of psychology and motivational structure which will ensure or make probable that he performs certain kinds of actions and leads a certain kind of life. (See Kane 1996 for discussion of Huxley’s Brave New World and Skinner’s Walden Two.)

We are supposed to agree that Victim is not morally responsible because he acts unfreely and that he acts unfreely because of Producer’s role in the causation of his actions. Victim performs the actions he performs because that’s what he was designed or more directly manipulated to do, and it was Producer who made him be that way or do those things.

The argument then goes as follows:

  1. Victim doesn’t act freely and, for that reason, is not morally responsible for what he does.
  2. If determinism is true, there is no relevant difference between Victim and any normal case of apparently free and morally responsible action.
  3. Therefore, if determinism is true no one ever acts freely or is morally responsible for what he does.

We are supposed to accept premise 1 on the grounds of our intuitive response to the story about Victim. The argument for premise 2 is that if determinism is true, then we are like Victim with respect to the fact that we are merely the proximate causes of our actions. We do what we do because of the way we are (our psyche or “design” together with the total mix of our thoughts, desires, and other psychological states at the time of action) and the causes of these psychological characteristics ultimately come from outside us, from forces and factors beyond our control. The only difference between us (in this imagined scenario in which determinism is true) and Victim is that our psychological features are not the causal upshot of the work of a single Producer who had a specific plan for us. But this fact about the remote causes of our actions—that they are caused by a variety of natural causes rather than the intentional acts of a single agent—is not relevant to questions about our freedom and responsibility. Or so it is argued, by the advocates of Manipulation arguments.

Manipulation arguments may be seen as the Source incompatibilist’s response to Frankfurt’s thought experiment. Frankfurt was trying to show that determinism isn’t as bad as we might think. In his story, Black was a stand-in for determinism, and Frankfurt was trying to convince us that the facts about Black are consistent with the facts, as we know them, about how we actually deliberate, decide, and act, and these facts are the only facts that matter, so far as moral responsibility is concerned. So even if Jones lacks the ability to do otherwise, he is still morally responsible. The Manipulation argument says, in effect:

Frankfurt’s thought experiment is faulty. Determinism isn’t a powerful agent, standing by, in the background, like Black. Determinism is part of the “actual sequence”. Let me tell you a story to make this clear…

And then Producer is introduced, and we are told that he has a plan concerning the action or actions of another person, Victim, the power to enforce his plan, and moreover, unlike Black, he does enforce it.

It would be a mistake, however, to think that manipulation of one person by another automatically undermines freedom. In real life, we know that we may be manipulated by others to do things we would not have done, but for their arguments or other ways of persuading us to change our minds. Absent further reasons, we don’t think that this kind of manipulation robs us of free will or the ability to act freely in the way required for moral responsibility. We think that we could have resisted the argument (or the sales pitch or the subtle pressures exerted by our manipulative friend or colleague) and we might blame ourselves later for not doing so.

The question, then, is whether there is a case that can serve the purposes of a manipulation argument: a case where Victim lacks the freedom that is a necessary condition of moral responsibility while not being different, in any relevant way, from a normal agent in normal circumstances at a deterministic world (that is, from someone who we think acts freely and is morally responsible for what she does).

There are cases and cases, and many of the ones in the literature are under-described. The first three Plums of Pereboom 2001 are an example. Depending on how the details are spelled out, our verdict about Plum might be that he is unfree and not morally responsible because he is different, in relevant ways that don’t require the falsity of determinism, from a normal agent in normal circumstances (Fischer 2004; Mickelson 2010; Sripada 2012). Alternatively, the story might be fleshed out in a way that supports the judgment that Plum is not different, in any relevant way, from a normal agent (deterministic or indeterministic) in normal circumstances. But this leaves it open to the compatibilist to take the hard-line reply (McKenna 2004a, 2008; Jeppsson 2020) that since the normal deterministic agent is morally responsible, so is Plum. Opinions vary as to whether the intuitive cost of the hard-line reply is too great (Pereboom 2008; McKenna 2014).

Consider, next, cases of the Brave New World variety—cases where children are subjected to intensive behavioral engineering from birth, in a way intended to make them accept their assigned roles in a rigidly hierarchical society. Everything depends on the details, but it is surely not implausible to think that the subjects of some Brave New World cases lack a morally significant freedom because their cognitive, evaluational, and volitional capacities have been stunted or impaired in certain ways:

they are incapable of effectively envisaging or seeing the significance of certain alternatives, of reflecting on themselves and on the origins of their motivations. (Watson 1987)

Wolf 1990 argues, on the basis of similar cases, that the ability that grounds our freedom and responsibility is the unimpaired capacity to choose and act in accordance with “the True and the Good” (see also Nelkin 2011). But determinism doesn’t have the consequence that everyone’s cognitive, evaluational and volitional capacities are impaired in these sorts of ways.

There are cases where Victim is under the direct control of Producer in a way that makes it true that Victim is not morally responsible for what she does because she no longer has the kind of causal control that is a necessary condition acting freely. Producer might, for instance, directly manipulate Victim’s limbs so that Victim finds her body moving, puppetlike, in ways she does not intend. Or Producer might directly manipulate the brain states that are the neural realizers of Victim’s first order desires so Victim is, like Frankfurt’s unwilling addict, acting intentionally but “against her will” (Frankfurt 1971). But determinism doesn’t have the consequence that we never act intentionally and it doesn’t have the consequence that we always act contrary to our second order volitions or that we are always subject to psychological compulsions, addictive or “irresistible” desires, phobias, and other pathological aversions.

Defenders of Manipulation arguments claim, however, that the argument works even if these kinds of cases are set aside. They say that the intuitive force of the argument depends only on the fact that deterministically caused actions are ultimately caused, as are Victim’s, by factors and forces outside the agent’s control. They say that the argument succeeds even in cases where Producer designs a Victim with unimpaired capacities and a normal psychology, perhaps the kind we’d like our children to have, perhaps a rationally egoistic psychology of a kind we would prefer our children not to have. They also say that the argument succeeds even when Producer is such a sophisticated designer of Victim that Victim has a past history that satisfies the requirements of those compatibilist accounts of free agency that include a historical condition. (For a helpful account of the difference between historical and nonhistorical compatibilist accounts in the context of Manipulation arguments, see McKenna 2004a. For argument that the best explanation for our belief that manipulated agents act unfreely is the belief that these agents don’t have it in their power to do otherwise, see Berofsky 2012. For argument that Manipulation arguments fail given a Strawsonian account of responsibility, see Latham and Tierney 2022.)

The best example of this kind of case is Mele’s Ernie. Ernie was created as a zygote \(Z\) in Mary by goddess Diana because Diana wanted a certain event to take place 30 years later, and she was able to use her knowledge of the deterministic laws and the state of the entire universe to deduce that placing a zygote with precisely \(Z\)’s constitution in Mary would produce a normal (or better than normal: ideally self-controlled, rational, etc.) adult who would, 30 years later, judge, on the basis of rational deliberation, that it is best to do \(A\) and who would \(A\) on the basis of her judgment, thereby bringing about \(E\) (Mele 2006, 2019).

To many people, it seems intuitively clear that Ernie acts unfreely and is for that reason not morally responsible for what he does. But if that’s right, it looks like this version of the Manipulation argument succeeds. For consider this: Ernie has an atom-for-atom duplicate, Bert, a normal guy in every way, exactly like Ernie (ideally self-controlled, rational, etc.) except for the fact that he was not created by a goddess. Bert finds himself in circumstances exactly like the ones Ernie is in, and Bert also judges, on the basis of rational deliberation, that it is best to do \(A\), and he also acts on the basis of his judgment, thereby bringing about \(E\). There appears to be no relevant difference between Ernie and Bert. Therefore, Bert also acts unfreely and is also not morally responsible for what he does. But Bert (like Ernie) is normal in every way, and we can also stipulate that he (like Ernie) satisfies all plausible compatibilist conditions (historical as well as nonhistorical) for being a free and morally responsible agent. If Bert acts unfreely, so does every deterministic agent on every occasion. Therefore the kind of freedom necessary for moral responsibility is incompatible with determinism.

Mele claims that the case of Ernie is an improvement on earlier Manipulation cases in two ways. First, it is a case where it is clear that the causes of Ernie’s action are deterministic rather than the kinds of causes that might be found at a non-deterministic world. Second, it is a case where it is clear that there is no relevant difference between Ernie and any case of apparently free and responsible action at a deterministic world.

Deery and Nahmias 2017 appeal to interventionist theories of causation to argue that Mele is wrong about the second claim. Tierney and Glick 2020 criticise Deery and Nahmias. (See also Herdova 2020.)

Suppose, however, that there is no relevant difference between Ernie and Bert. It does not follow that the argument succeeds. If there really is no freedom-relevant difference between Bert and Ernie, why should we reason from the unfreedom of Ernie to the unfreedom of Bert rather than the other way around, from the freedom of Bert to the freedom of Ernie?

After all, our grounds for saying that there is no relevant difference between the two is that the historical facts about Ernie’s creation (that he was created by a goddess, with the powers of a Laplacian predictor, with certain intentions, and so on) are not relevant to the question of whether Ernie acts freely or unfreely 30 years later. If they are not relevant, they don’t provide us with reasons for thinking that Ernie is unfree. By contrast, we do have reasons for thinking that Bert acts freely and is morally responsible for what he does; he satisfies the ordinary conditions we use in real life, as well as all the conditions of the best compatibilist accounts on offer. If we started out with reasons for thinking Bert free and responsible (either because we are already compatibilists or because we have never thought about determinism), the Zygote argument hasn’t given us any reason to change our minds. (For further elaboration on this critique, including some helpful counter-thought experiments, see Fischer 2011, 2021; Kearns 2012.)

A defender of the Zygote argument might respond by claiming that the intuitions that favor the unfreedom and lack of responsibility of Ernie are stronger than the intuitions that favor the freedom and responsibility of Bert. But this is problematic. Intuitions are not always evidentially trustworthy and there are, as we have already noted, reasons for being wary of our intuitive response to descriptions of deterministic worlds: we have a natural tendency to confuse “it will be” with “it must be”. There are further reasons for not giving evidential credence to our intuitions about Ernie’s unfreedom: he was created by a goddess, with the kind of foreknowledge that no human being could have, for the express purpose of performing a certain action 30 years later. Perhaps our intuitions are explained (though not justified) by the belief that being created in this way robs Ernie of the freedom required for responsibility. The first premise of the Zygote argument must be defended by something more than appeal to intuition.

(For some recent empirical work on intuitions about free will, determinism, and moral responsibility, see Nahmias, Morris, Nadelhoffer, and Turner 2006, Nahmias 2011 and Murray & Nahmias 2014. For a critique of the use of intuitions in Manipulation arguments, see Vihvelin 2013 and Spitzley 2015.)

Defenders of the Zygote argument don’t dispute these points. The Manipulation argument works only if the second premise is true, and the second premise says that there is no relevant difference between Victim (in this case, Ernie) and any normal deterministic case of apparently free and responsible action (in this case, Bert). Ernie differs from Bert with respect to certain historical facts about his creation: the fact that he was created by a goddess with foreknowledge, and intentions about his future. So none of these facts can be counted relevant, even if they affect our intuitions. But one historical fact is relevant, according to the defender of the argument: the fact that the deterministic causes of Ernie’s action trace back thirty years to conditions outside his control. The claim, then, is that Ernie acts unfreely and without responsibility because determinism is true. But this claim was supposed to be the conclusion of the argument, not the premise.

There is one remaining possibility. Perhaps our intuitions are best explained by our belief that Ernie doesn’t have it in his power to do anything other than act according to Diana’s plan. (We think it unfair to blame someone who wasn’t able to avoid doing what he did.) If that’s the case, then the back story of Ernie’s creation functions as a way of making vivid one of the possible ways that an otherwise normal agent at a deterministic world might have got to be the way that he is at a certain moment in his life. Should we reason from our belief that Ernie isn’t, on that occasion, able to do otherwise to the belief that Bert and every normal deterministic agent also lacks this ability, or should we reason in the opposite direction, from Bert’s ability to do otherwise to Ernie’s? This requires further discussion, which we will take up in the section on the Consequence argument. (See also Mickelson 2015b and Huoranskzi 2021.)

4. Sourcehood Arguments

What has this boy to do with it? He was not his own father; he was not his own mother; he was not his own grandparents. All of this was handed to him. He did not surround himself with governesses and wealth. He did not make himself. And yet he is to be compelled to pay (Darrow 1924: 65).

Let’s turn now to arguments for incompatibilism based on the idea that a free and responsible action is an action that is caused and controlled by its agent in a special “the buck stops here” way, a way that is incompatible with deterministic event-causation.

The most popular instance of this kind of argument is an argument that we will call “the desperate defense attorney’s argument” (Darrow 1924). The defense attorney’s argument is simple:

  1. My client is responsible for his crime only if he “made himself”—that is, only if he caused himself to be the kind of person he is.
  2. My client did not make himself.
  3. Therefore my client is not responsible for his crime.

The defense attorney is trying to persuade the jurors that his client is not responsible for his action, but not for any of the standard excusing conditions—insanity, accident, mistaken belief, duress, mental handicap, and so on. Nor does he claim that there is anything that distinguishes his client from any of the rest of us. His argument is that his client is not responsible because he did not make himself. But none of us has made ourselves (at least not from scratch)—we are all the products of heredity and environment. So if we accept the defense attorney’s argument, it appears that we are committed to the conclusion that no one is ever responsible for anything.

It’s not clear that this is an argument for incompatibilism. It’s an argument for incompatibilism only if it’s an argument for hard determinism—that is, if it’s an argument for the thesis that determinism is true and because of this we are never responsible for anything. Let’s take a closer look.

What’s the argument for premise (2)? After all, we do make our selves, at least in the garden-variety way in which we make other things: we plant gardens, cook dinners, build boats, write books and, over the course of our lives, re-invent, re-create, and otherwise “make something of ourselves”. Of course we don’t do any of these things “from scratch”, without help from anyone or anything else, but it’s impossible (or at least impossible for human beings) to make anything from scratch. The truth or falsity of determinism has no bearing on this point.

(See G. Strawson 1986 and 1994 for an argument for the impossibility of “true responsibility” that is a more sophisticated version of the defense attorney’s argument. See also Smilansky 2000. See Mele 1995 and Clarke 2005 for a critique of Strawson’s argument.)

If we pressed our defense attorney (or brought in a philosopher to help him out), we might get the following reply: The kind of garden-variety self-making possible at a deterministic world is not good enough for the kind of moral responsibility required for deserved blame and punishment. Granted, we can never have complete control over the actions we perform because of our choices (Nagel 1979), and this limits the control we have over our self-making. But we are morally responsible for our actions only if we have at least some control over our self-making, and we have control over our self-making only if we have control over the choices that are the causes of the actions whereby we make our selves. And we have control over these choices only if we cause our choices and no one and nothing causes us to make them (Chisholm 1964).

The defense attorney (or philosopher) is defending premise (2) by arguing for a certain interpretation of premise (1)—that our responsibility for our actions requires that we have “made ourselves” in the sense that, over the course of our lives, we have frequently been the first cause of the choices that result in actions and thus eventually (albeit often in ways we can neither predict nor control) to changes in our selves. In arguing this way, he has shifted the focus of the argument from the obviously impossible demand that the freedom required for moral responsibility requires entirely self-made selves to the intuitively appealing and at least not obviously impossible demand that the freedom required for moral responsibility requires what Robert Kane has called “ultimate responsibility” (that we are the ultimate sources or first causes of at least some of our choices—those choices that are the causes of “self-forming actions”). (See Kane 1996, 1999, 2008, 2011a. See also Chisholm 1964; Clarke 1993, 1996, 2003; O’Connor 1995a, 2000, 2011; Pereboom 2001, 2009b, 2014; Steward 2012).

This brings us to the philosopher’s version of the defense attorney’s argument. (For variations on this kind of argument, see Kane 1996, 1999, 2008, 2011a and Pereboom 2001, 2005, 2014.)

  1. We act freely (in the way necessary for moral responsibility) only if we are the ultimate sources (originators, first causes) of at least some of our choices.
  2. If determinism is true, then everything we do is ultimately caused by events and circumstances outside our control.
  3. If everything we do is ultimately caused by events and circumstances outside our control, then we are not the ultimate sources (originators, first causes) of any of our choices.
  4. Therefore, if determinism is true, we are not the ultimate sources of any of our choices.
  5. Therefore, if determinism is true, we never act freely and we are never morally responsible.

Premise (2) follows from the definition of determinism (at least given two widely accepted assumptions: that there is causation in a deterministic universe and that causation is a transitive relation). (For some doubts about the latter assumption, see Hall 2000.) Premise (3) is clearly true. So if we want to reject the conclusion, we must reject Premise (1).

Compatibilists have argued against (1) in two different ways. On the positive side, they have argued that we can give a satisfactory account of the (admittedly elusive) notion of self-determination without insisting that self-determination requires us to be the first causes of our choices (Frankfurt 1971, 1988; Watson 1975, 1987, 2004; Dennett 1984; Wolf 1990; Fischer 1994; Fischer & Ravizza 1998; Bok 1998; Nelkin 2011; Sartorio 2016). On the negative side, compatibilists have challenged (1) by arguing that it is of no help to the incompatibilist: if we accept (1), we are committed to the conclusion that free will and moral responsibility are impossible, regardless of whether determinism is true or false.

The challenge to (1) takes the form of a dilemma: Either determinism is true or it’s not. If determinism is true, then my choices are ultimately caused by events and conditions outside my control, so I am not their first cause and therefore, if we accept (1), I am neither free nor responsible. If determinism is false, then something that happens inside me (something that I call “my choice” or “my decision”) might be the first event in a causal chain leading to a sequence of body movements that I call “my action”. But since this event has no sufficient cause, whether or not it happens is not under my control any more than the spinning of a roulette wheel inside my brain is under my control. Therefore, if determinism is false, I am not the first cause or ultimate source of my choices and, if we accept (1), I am neither free nor responsible (Ayer 1954; Wolf 1990).

In order to defend (1) against the “determined or random” dilemma, above, the incompatibilist has to offer a positive account of the puzzling claim that persons are the first causes of their choices. The traditional incompatibilist answer is that this claim must be taken literally, at face value. We—agents, persons, enduring things—are causes with a very special property: we initiate causal chains, but nothing and no one causes us to do this. Like God, we are uncaused causers, or first movers. If Joe deliberately throws a rock, which breaks a window, then the window’s breaking (an event) was caused by Joe’s throwing the rock (another event), which was caused by Joe’s choice (another event). But Joe’s choice was not caused by any further event, not even the event of Joe’s thinking it might be fun to throw the rock; it was caused by Joe himself. And since Joe is not an event, he is not the kind of thing which can be caused. (Or so it is argued, by agent-causalists. See Chisholm 1964; O’Connor 1995a, 2000, 2011; Pereboom 2001.)

Many philosophers think that agent-causation is either incoherent or impossible, due to considerations about causation. What sense does it make to say that a person, as opposed to a change in a person, or the state of a person at a time, is a cause? (Bok 1998). (See also Clarke 2003 for a detailed and sympathetic examination of the metaphysics of agent-causation, which ends with the conclusion that there are, on balance, reasons to think that agent-causation is impossible.)

Others (van Inwagen 2000; Mele 2006) have argued that even if agent-causation is possible, it would not solve the problem of transforming an undetermined event into one which is in our control in the way that our free choices must be. And others have argued that if agent-causation is possible, it is possible at deterministic as well as non-deterministic worlds (Markosian 1999; Nelkin 2011; Franklin 2016).

Some incompatibilists have responded to the “determined or random” dilemma in a different way: by appealing to the idea of probabilistic causation (Kane 1996, 1999, 2008, 2011a). If our choices are events which have probabilistic causes (e.g., our beliefs, desires, and other reasons for acting), then it no longer seems plausible to say that we have no control over them. We make choices for reasons, and our reasons cause our choices, albeit indeterministically. Kane’s reply may go some way towards avoiding the second (no control) horn of the dilemma. But it doesn’t avoid the first horn. If our choices are caused by our reasons, then our choices are not the first causes of our actions. And our reasons are presumably caused, either deterministically or probabilistically, so they are not the first causes of our actions either. But then our actions are ultimately caused by earlier events over which we have no control and we are not the ultimate sources of our actions.

5. Choice and the Consequence Argument

We think that we make choices, and we think that our choices typically make a difference to our future. We think that there is a point to deliberation: how we deliberate—what reasons we consider—makes a difference to what we choose and thus to what we do. We also think that when we deliberate there really is more than one choice we are able to make, more than one action we are able to perform, and more than one future which is, at least partly, in our power to bring about.

Our beliefs about our powers with respect to the future contrast sharply with our beliefs about our lack of power with respect to the past. We don’t think we have any choice about the past. We don’t deliberate about the past; we think it irrational to do anything aimed at trying to change or affect the past (“You had your chance; you blew it. It’s too late now to do anything about it”). Our beliefs about our options, opportunities, alternatives, possibilities, abilities, powers, and so on, are all future-directed. We may summarize this contrast by saying that we think that the future is “open” in some sense that contrasts with the non-openness or “fixity” of the past.

Although we don’t think we (now) have a choice about the past, we have beliefs about what was possible for us in the past. When called upon to defend what we did, or when we blame or reproach ourselves, or simply wonder whether we did the right thing (or the sensible thing, the rational thing, and so on), we evaluate our action by comparing it to what we believe were our other possible actions, at that time. We blame, criticize, reproach, regret, and so on, only insofar as we believe we had alternatives. And if we later discover that we were mistaken in believing that some action \(X\) was among our alternatives, we think it is irrational to criticize or regret our failure to do \(X\).

Is determinism compatible with the truth of these beliefs? In particular, is it compatible with the belief that we are often able to choose and do more than one action?

Incompatibilists have traditionally said “No”. And it’s not hard to see why. If we think of ‘can’ in the “open future” way suggested by the commonsense view, then it’s tempting to think that the past is necessary in some absolute sense. And it’s natural to think that we are able to do otherwise only if we can do otherwise given this “fixed” past; that is, only if our doing otherwise is a possible continuation of the actual past. If we follow this train of thought, we will conclude that we are able to do otherwise only if our doing otherwise is a possible continuation of the past consistent with the laws. But if determinism is true, there is only one possible continuation of the past consistent with the laws. And thus we get the incompatibilist conclusion. If determinism is true, our actual future is our only possible future. What we actually do is the only thing we are able to do.

But this argument is too quick. It rests on assumptions about the nature of time which are arguably at odds with what physics tells us. (Hoefer 2003 [2016], Ismael 2016.) There is an alternative explanation for our beliefs about the “open” future as opposed to the “fixed” past—the direction of causation. Causes are always earlier than their effects. Our deliberation causes our choices, which cause our actions. But not the other way around. Our choices cause future events; they never cause past events. Why causation works this way is a deep and difficult question, but the leading view, among philosophers of science, is that the temporal asymmetry of causation is a fundamental but contingent fact about our universe. If things were different enough—if we could travel backwards in time—then we would sometimes have an ability that we don’t actually have—the ability to causally affect past persons and things (Horwich 1987; D. Lewis 1976). If this is right, then we don’t need to suppose that the past is metaphysically or absolutely necessary in order to explain the fixed past/open future contrast. The past could have been different. But, given the way things actually are, there is nothing that we are able to do that would causally affect the past.

This alternative explanation of our commonsense belief about the contrast between fixed past and open future allows the compatibilist to say the kind of things that compatibilists have traditionally wanted to say: The ‘can’ of our freedom of will and freedom of action is the ‘can’ of causal and counterfactual dependence. Our future is open because it depends, causally and counterfactually, on our choices, which in turn depend, causally and counterfactually, on our deliberation and on the reasons we take ourselves to have. (At least in the normal case, where there is neither external constraint nor internal compulsion or other pathology.) If our reasons were different (in some appropriate way), we would choose otherwise, and if we chose otherwise, we would do otherwise. And our reasons can be different, at least in the sense that we, unlike simpler creatures and young children, have the ability to critically evaluate our reasons (beliefs, desires, values, principles, and so on) and that we have, and at least sometimes exercise, the ability to change our reasons (Bok 1998; Dennett 1984; Fischer 1994; Fischer & Ravizza 1998; Frankfurt 1971, 1988; Lehrer 1976, 1980, 2004; Watson 1975, 1987, 2004; Wolf 1990; Smith 1997, 2004; Pettit & Smith 1996; Nelkin 2011; Vihvelin 2004, 2013). All this is compatible with determinism. So the truth of determinism is compatible with the truth of our commonsense belief that we really do have a choice about the future, that we really can choose and do other than what we actually do.

Incompatibilists think that this, and any compatibilist account of the ‘can’ of freedom of choice, is, and must be, mistaken. The Consequence Argument (Ginet 1966, 1983, 1990; van Inwagen 1975, 1983, 2000; Wiggins 1973; Lamb 1977) is widely regarded as the best argument for this conclusion. In the remainder of this section we will take a closer look at van Inwagen’s version of this important and influential argument.

In An Essay on Free Will (1983), van Inwagen presents three formal arguments which, he says, are intended as three versions of the same basic argument, which he characterized as follows:

If determinism is true, then our acts are the consequence of laws of nature and events in the remote past. But it’s not up to us what went on before we were born, and neither is it up to us what the laws of nature are. Therefore, the consequences of these things (including our present acts) are not up to us. (1983: 56)

We will begin by looking at the third version of the argument (the Rule Beta argument). The Rule Beta argument uses a modal sentential operator which van Inwagen defines as follows: ‘\(\mathbf{N}p\)’ abbreviates ‘\(p\) and no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether \(p\)’. Van Inwagen tells us that the logic of ‘\(\mathbf{N}\)’ includes these two inference rules, where \(\Box p\) asserts that it is logically necessity that \(p\):

Alpha: From \(\Box p\), we may infer \(\mathbf{N}p\).

Beta: From \(\mathbf{N}p\) and \(\mathbf{N}(p \supset q)\), we may infer \(\mathbf{N}q\).

In the argument below, ‘\(L\)’ is an abbreviation for a sentence expressing a conjunction of all the laws of nature; ‘\(H\)’ is a sentence expressing a true proposition about the total state of the world at some time in the distant past before any agents existed; ‘\(\Box\)’ is ‘it is logically necessary that’; ‘\(\supset\)’ is the material conditional, and ‘\(P\)’ is a dummy for which we may substitute any sentence which expresses a true proposition.

The argument is a conditional proof: Assume determinism and show that it follows that no one has, or ever had, a choice about any true proposition, including propositions about the apparently free actions of human beings.

1. \(\Box((H \amp L) \supset P)\) definition of determinism
2. \(\Box(H \supset(L \supset P)\) from 1, by modal and sentential logic
3. \(\mathbf{N}(H \supset(L \supset P))\) from 2, by rule Alpha
4. \(\mathbf{N}H\) premise, fixity of past
5. \(\mathbf{N}(L \supset P)\) from 3, 4, by rule Beta
6. \(\mathbf{N}L\) premise, fixity of laws
7. \(\mathbf{N}P\) from 5, 6, by rule Beta

Premises (1) and (2) follow from determinism. (3) follows from (2), by application of rule Alpha. Rule Alpha seems uncontroversial. (But see Spencer 2017).

Premises 4 and 6 also look uncontroversial. \(N\) necessity isn’t logical or metaphysical necessity. We can insist that the laws and the distant past could, in the broadly logical sense, have been different, so neither \(\Box H\) nor \(\Box L\) are true. But it still seems undeniably true that we have no choice about whether the laws and the distant past are the way they are; there is nothing that we are able to do that would make it the case that either the laws or the distant past are different from the way they actually are.

Rule Beta is the key to the argument. It’s what makes the difference between this version of the Consequence Argument and an argument widely agreed to be fallacious.

\(\Box(P \supset Q)\)
\(P\)
Therefore, \(\Box Q\)

An example of this invalid inference is an argument sometimes called “the fatalist fallacy”:

\(\Box\)(it’s true that it will rain tomorrow \(\supset\) it will rain tomorrow)
It’s true that it will rain tomorrow
Therefore, \(\Box\)(it will rain tomorrow)

Another example:

\(\Box((H \amp L) \supset P)\)
\(H \amp L\)
Therefore, \(\Box P\)

On the other hand, the following is a valid inference:

\(\Box P\)
\(\Box(P \supset Q)\)
Therefore, \(\Box Q\)

The necessity expressed by the ‘no choice about’ operator is not logical or metaphysical necessity. But it might nevertheless be similar enough for Beta to be a valid rule of inference. Or so argued van Inwagen, and gave examples:

\(\mathbf{N}\)(The sun explodes in the year 2000)
\(\mathbf{N}\)(The sun explodes in the year 2000 \(\supset\) All life on earth ends in the year 2000)
Therefore, \(\mathbf{N}\)(All life on earth ends in the year 2000)

An early response to the Consequence argument was to argue that Beta is invalid because a compatibilist account of the ability to do otherwise is correct (Gallois 1977; Foley 1979; Slote 1982; Flint 1987). For instance, if “\(S\) is able to do \(X\)” means “if \(S\) tried to do \(X\), \(S\) would do \(X\)”, then the premises of the argument are true (since even if \(S\) tried to change the laws or the past, she would not succeed), but the conclusion is false (since determinism is consistent with the truth of counterfactuals like “if \(S\) tried to raise her hand, she would”).

Incompatibilists were unmoved by this response, saying, in effect, that the validity of Beta is more plausible than the truth of any compatibilist account of ability to do otherwise. They pointed out that there was no agreement, even among compatibilists, about how such an account should go, and that the simplest accounts (so-called “Conditional Analyses”, originally proposed by Hume) had been rejected, even by compatibilists.

(For criticism of Simple Conditional Analyses, see Austin 1956; Chisholm 1964; Lehrer 1968, 1976; van Inwagen 1983. For defense of a compatibilist account of ability to do otherwise, see Moore 1912; Hobart 1934; Kapitan 1991, 1996, 2011; Lehrer 1980, 2004; Bok 1998; Smith 1997, 2004; Campbell 2005; Perry 2004, 2008, 2010; Vihvelin 2004, 2013; Fara 2008; Schlosser 2017; Menzies 2017; List 2019.)

More recently, van Inwagen has conceded that Beta is invalid (van Inwagen 2000). McKay and Johnson (1996) showed that Beta entails Agglomeration:

\(\mathbf{N}p\)
\(\mathbf{N}q\)
Therefore, \(\mathbf{N}(p \amp q)\)

Agglomeration is uncontroversially invalid. To see this, let ‘\(p\)’ abbreviate ‘The coin does not land heads’, let ‘q’ abbreviate ‘The coin does not land tails’, and suppose that it’s a fair coin which isn’t tossed but someone could have tossed it (McKay and Johnson 1996).

(For counterexamples to Beta, see Widerker 1987, Huemer 2000, and Carlson 2000.)

Van Inwagen proposed to repair the Consequence argument by replacing ‘\(\mathbf{N}\)’ with ‘\(\mathbf{N}\)*’, where ‘\(\mathbf{N}*p\)’ says “\(p\) and no one can, or ever could, do anything such that if she did it, \(p\) might be false”. Agglomeration is valid for ‘\(\mathbf{N}\)*’, and thus this particular objection to the validity of Beta does not apply.

It has also been suggested (Finch & Warfield 1998) that the Consequence argument can be repaired by keeping ‘\(\mathbf{N}\)’ and replacing Beta with Beta 2:

Beta 2: From \(\mathbf{N}p\) and \(\Box(p \supset q)\), we may infer \(\mathbf{N}q\)

This would yield the following argument:

\(\mathbf{N}(L \amp H)\) fixity of laws and past
\(\Box((L \amp H) \supset P)\) determinism
NP from 1, 2 by Beta 2

Other ways of repairing the argument have been proposed by O’Connor 1993 and Huemer 2000.

So it still looks as though the compatibilist is in trouble. For it seems plausible to suppose that there is nothing that we are able to do that might make it the case that either \(H\) or \(L\) is false. And it seems plausible to suppose that we have no choice about whether \((H \amp L)\). We need to dig deeper to criticize the argument.

David Lewis tells us to think of the argument as a reductio (Lewis 1981). A compatibilist is someone who claims that the truth of determinism is compatible with the existence of the kinds of abilities that we assume we have in typical choice situations. Let’s call these ‘ordinary abilities’. The Consequence argument, as Lewis articulates it, says that if we assume that a deterministic agent has ordinary abilities, we are forced to credit her with incredible abilities as well.

Here, with some modifications, is Lewis’s statement of the argument:

Pretend that determinism is true, and that I did not raise my hand (at that department meeting, to vote on that proposal) but had the ability to do so. If I had exercised my ability—if I had raised my hand—then either the remote past or the laws of physics would have been different (would have to have been different). But if that’s so, then I have at least one of two incredible abilities—the ability to change the remote past or the ability to change the laws. But to suppose that I have either of these abilities is absurd. So we must reject the claim that I had the ability to raise my hand.

This counterfactual version of the Consequence argument nicely highlights a point that the rule Beta version glosses over. The argument relies on a claim about counterfactuals. The argument says that if determinism is true, then at least one of these counterfactuals is true:

Different Past: If I had raised my hand, the remote past would have been different.

Different Laws: If I had raised my hand, the laws would have been different.

Both these counterfactuals strike many people as incredible. But there is a reason for that—we are not used to thinking in terms of determinism and we are not accustomed to counterfactual speculation about what would have been the case, beforehand, if anything at a deterministic world had happened in any way other than the way it actually happened.

On the other hand, we are good at evaluating counterfactuals, or at least some counterfactuals, and we are especially good at evaluating those counterfactuals that we entertain in contexts of choice, when we ask questions about the causal upshots of our contemplated actions. (What would happen if… I struck this match, put my finger in the fire, threw this rock at that window, raised my hand?) And when we contemplate our options, we take for granted the existence of many facts—including facts about the laws and the past.

In other words, when we evaluate counterfactuals in real life, we do so by considering imaginary situations which are very like the situation we are actually in, and we do not suppose that there are any gratuitous departures from actuality. And to suppose a difference in the past or the laws seems like a gratuitous difference.

So it is no surprise that when our attention is directed to Different Past and Different Laws, these counterfactuals strike us as incredible, or at least odd. But that doesn’t mean that they are false, and if determinism is true, then either Different Past or Different Laws is true.

So the first point is that we all need a theory of counterfactuals, and if determinism is true, the true counterfactuals will include either Different Past or Different Laws.

The second point is that the details of the correct compatibilist solution to the free will/determinism problem will turn on the details of the correct theory of counterfactuals.

(For similar criticisms of the Consequence argument, see Fischer 1983, 1988; Horgan 1985; Watson 1987; Vihvelin 1988, 2008, 2013; Rummens 2021.)

If Lewis’s theory of counterfactuals (D. Lewis 1973, 1979) is correct, or even more or less correct (Schaffer 2004), then the relevant counterfactuals about the past and laws, at a deterministic world, are:

Almost the Same Past: If I had raised my hand, the past would have been exactly the same until a time shortly before the time of my decision to raise my hand.

Slightly Different Laws: If I had raised my hand, the laws would have been ever so slightly different in a way that permitted a divergence from the lawful course of actual history shortly before the time of my decision to raise my hand.

On the other hand, if Lewis’s theory is wrong, and counterfactuals are always evaluated by holding the laws constant, then the relevant counterfactuals, at a deterministic world, are:

Same Laws: If I had raised my hand, the laws would still have been exactly the same.

Different Past: If I had raised my hand, past history would have been at least somewhat different all the way back to the Big Bang.

(For critique of Lewis’s theory, and defense of a theory of counterfactuals that holds the laws fixed, see Bennett 1984; Dorr 2016; Vihvelin 2017b.)

We’ve got to choose. We all need a theory of counterfactuals, and our theory should provide the correct verdicts for the uncontroversially true counterfactuals at deterministic as well as indeterministic worlds. Our choice is limited to a theory that accepts Different Laws or Different Past. Which theory we choose has nothing to do with the free will/determinism problem and everything with how we evaluate counterfactuals.

We can now explain the essence of Lewis’s reply to the counterfactual version of the Consequence argument in a way that doesn’t require you to accept Lewis’s theory of counterfactuals.

The argument trades on an equivocation between two counterfactuals.

(C1)
If I had raised my hand, the laws (or the past) would have been different.
(C2)
If I had raised my hand, I would thereby have caused the laws (or the past) to be different.

There is a corresponding equivocation between two ability claims:

(A1)
I had the ability to do something (raise my hand) such that if I had exercised my ability, the laws (or the past) would have been different.
(A2)
I had the ability to do something (raise my hand) such that if I had exercised my ability, I would thereby have caused the laws (or the past) to be different.

The problem with the argument, says Lewis, is that it equivocates between these two ability claims. To count as a reductio against the compatibilist, the argument must establish that the compatibilist is committed to (A2). But the compatibilist is committed only to (C1) and thus only to (A1). The compatibilist is committed only to saying that if determinism is true, we have abilities we would exercise only if the past (or the laws) had been different in the appropriate ways. And while this may sound odd, it is no more incredible than the claim that the successful exercise of our abilities depends, not only on us, but also on the co-operation of things not in our control: the good or bad luck of our immediate surroundings. Since we are neither superheroes nor gods, we are always in this position, regardless of the truth or falsity of determinism.

The Consequence Argument was intended as an argument from premises that we must all accept—premises about our lack of control over the past and the laws—to the conclusion that if determinism is true, we don’t have the free will common sense says we have. The counterfactual version of the argument claims that if we attribute ordinary abilities to deterministic agents, we are forced to credit them with incredible past or law-changing abilities as well. But no such incredible conclusion follows. All that follows is something that we must accept anyway, as the price of our non-godlike nature: that the exercise of our abilities always depends, in part, on circumstances outside our control. (See also Fischer 1983, 1988, 1994; Watson 1987; Nelkin 2001; Vihvelin 2008, 2011, 2013, 2017; Kapitan 1991, 2011; Carlson 2000.)

If the aim of the Consequence argument was to show that no compatibilist account of ‘could have done otherwise’ can succeed, then Lewis is surely right; the reductio fails. The distinction between (A1) and (A2) permits the compatibilist to avoid making incredible claims about the powers of free determined agents. On the other hand, the incompatibilist surely has a point when she complains that it is difficult to believe that anyone has the ability described by (A1). We believe that our powers as agents are constrained by the past and by the laws. One way to understand this belief is compatible with determinism: we lack causal power over the past and the laws. But it’s natural to understand the constraint in a different, simpler way: we are able to do only those things which are such that our doing of them does not counterfactually require a difference in either the past or the laws. And this leads more or less directly to the incompatibilist conclusion that if determinism is true, then we are never able to do otherwise.

This brings us back to our starting point. Our common sense web of beliefs about ourselves as deliberators, choosers, and agents includes the belief that the future is open in some sense that the past is not. It also includes the belief that our abilities and powers are constrained by the laws. One way of understanding these beliefs leads to incompatibilism; another way does not. Which one is right?

The Consequence argument is an attempt to provide an argument in defense of the incompatibilist’s way of understanding these common sense beliefs. Even if it fails as a reductio, it has been successful in other ways. It has made it clear that the free will/determinism problem is a metaphysical problem and that the underlying issues concern questions about our abilities and powers, as well as more general questions about the nature of causation, counterfactuals, and laws of nature. Can the abilities or powers of choosers and agents be understood as a kind of natural capacity or disposition? Is there a viable incompatibilist alternative? How should we understand counterfactuals about the alternative actions and choices of agents at deterministic worlds? Is the compatibilist proposal about the way in which the laws and past constrain us defensible? Are incompatibilists committed to the defense of a particular view about the nature of laws of nature? Are they committed to the rejection of a Humean view, for instance?

Insofar as the Consequence argument has pointed us in the direction of these deep and difficult underlying metaphysical questions, it represents a significant step forward in the discussion of one of the most intractable problems of philosophy. (For discussion of some of these issues, see D. Lewis 1979; Dennett 1984, 2003; Hoefer 2002; Berofsky 2003, 2012; Beebee & Mele 2002; Beebee 2000; Schaffer 2004, 2008; Vihvelin 1990, 2004, 2013, 2017; Perry 2004, 2008, 2010; van Inwagen 2004a; Fara 2008; Holton 2009; Wilson 2014; Clarke 2015; Ismael 2016; van Inwagen 2017; Spencer 2017; Franklin 2018; List 2019, Esfeld 2021; Loew and Huttemann 2022)

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