Biological Information

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Marc Artiga replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

The concept of information is widely used in the biological sciences. Informational concepts are central to molecular biology, where it is standard to talk about translation, transcription, proofreading, redundancy, DNA libraries, the genetic code, genetic editing, or the genetic program. Genes are also meant to carry information about our evolutionary past. Information is a key notion in cognitive science; cognitive systems are said to trade on information, which is connected to talk of mental representation, neural signals, neurotransmitters, and so forth. The same is true of animal communication, where signals are usually understood as information carriers; calls, colors, shapes, or scents carry information about predators, food, or identity. Hormones also work as signals and trigger signaling pathways within the cell. Changes in the transmission of information has also been a key topic in macroevolution. In biology, the centrality and influence of informational talk is hard to exaggerate.

This pervasive use of the notion of information raises a range of interesting questions. Do all these expressions refer to the same or to different entities? What is the nature of information? Can it be measured? Is informational talk purely metaphorical or should we take it at face value? Are informational concepts illuminating, or should they be dispensed with? Does information play a substantive explanatory role? What determines the informational content of a signal? Should we be realists about information? Can it be reduced to some other property? This entry will address some of these questions.

These issues have often been addressed in the context of specific debates, where many of the details are relevant to the different arguments and positions. Nonetheless, some recurring themes can also be identified. This entry begins with some general questions (§1); we will discuss correlational (§1.1) and teleological (§1.2) senses of information and we will briefly consider anti-realist and eliminativist challenges (§1.3). We will then move to two specific debates where information has played a central role: molecular biology (§2) and animal communication (§3).

• 1. The Concept of Information
  • 1.1 Correlational Information
  • 1.2 Teleological Information
  • 1.3 Anti-Realism and Eliminativism
• 2. Genetic Information
  • 2.1 Criticisms of Informational Models
  • 2.2 Informational Approaches in Genetics
• 3. Animal Communication
  • 3.1 Functional Reference
  • 3.2 Influence vs. Informational Approaches
  • 3.3 Information in Animal Communication Research
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Concept of Information

As with many other expressions that derive from ordinary language, the concept of information is employed in different ways in the biological sciences. Sometimes informational concepts are used for a purely external matter, i.e., in a sense that reveals our epistemic use rather than any property of the object. For instance, when differences in allele frequencies are said to carry information about the evolutionary past (e.g., to infer the phylogenetic distance between two species), it is not assumed that the cell or the organism uses or exploits this information; rather, the suggestion is that we can use allele frequencies to discover certain facts. It is an inferential rather than an explanatory use of information. Understood this way, genes carry information in the same way an unearthed bone carries information about an extinct species, tree rings carry information about the age of a tree and redshift carries information about the expanding universe.

Very often, however, informational talk ascribes some specific property to biological entities, which does not primarily capture an epistemic property of our practices. The claim that neural spikes carry information seems to attribute them some sort of aboutness; when molecular biologists assert that codons code for certain amino acids, they seem to be ascribing some kind of instructional content, which somehow tells the transcription and translation machineries how they should proceed. That alarm calls carry information about predators does not seem to depend on our epistemic practices. Prima facie, these uses attribute a specific objective property, rather than merely revealing something about what can learn from them. This is the sense of information on which most attention has been centered, and is the focus of this entry.

As a first approximation, information in this sense may be characterized as asymmetric, normative, and non-ubiquitous. Animal communication provides a clear example: information is asymmetric in the sense that, whereas a vervet monkey’s alarm carries information about an approaching snake, the snake itself does not carry information about the call. Information is also typically normative: it can be accurate/inaccurate, true/false, or satisfied/not satisfied. If no snake is actually approaching, the signal would be false or inaccurate. Finally, information is not ubiquitous in two respects: first, whereas some animal traits carry information, not all of them do; second, those that do only carry information about a restricted set of facts. Of course, this is just a baseline characterization suggested by biological practice. Whether this analysis is accurate or whether it should be expanded, reduced, or completely abandoned in general or in specific cases is one of the central issues at stake.

A significant amount of effort has been expended in developing a concept of information that accommodates these features and clarifies the use of informational concepts in biology. In this section we will consider a specific way of understanding this notion that derives from Shannon’s mathematical theory, as well as richer concepts inspired by this view. We will then move on to teleological approaches, which seek to overcome some of the difficulties of previous accounts, and we will finally consider some alternative views, which try to combine the insights of different approaches into a coherent whole.

1.1 Correlational Information

A first strategy to further characterize the use of information in the biological sciences appeals to Shannon’s (1948) mathematical theory of information. Shannon was primarily interested in a design problem, namely how to decide the optimal coding to minimize errors in communication. He sets out the problem very abstractly (Figure 1): given a particular state of the source, a sender transmits a message to a receiver through a channel, which might introduce some noise. The designer has to devise the optimal coding system that allows the receiver to correctly recover the state of the source with as little error as possible on average.

To address this problem, Shannon recovered and refined the concept of information, which other theorists such as Nyquist or Hartley had already used before: in Shannon’s characterization, the quantity of information at the source can be roughly understood as the amount of order (or, more precisely, its entropy). Intuitively, the amount of information reflects the uncertainty of the actual state of the source given all possible states in which it could be. Sources with many, equally likely states are associated with a high degree of uncertainty (information). From this idea, one can define the concept of mutual information: two event spaces carry mutual information iff the state of one of them alters the probability distribution of the other. In other words, mutual information can be understood as measuring to what extent knowing the actual state of one variable reduces the uncertainty about the other. The greater the mutual information, the more accurately the original message can be reconstructed. How much information exists between these systems depends on how much, on average, the probabilities are changed by the state of the system. Hence, mutual information captures the average amount of information being transmitted and is fully determined by the statistical association between them. Mathematically, mutual information is defined in terms of the joint probability distribution describing the state space. This is why Shannon’s concept of mutual information is sometimes called “correlational information” (note, however, that Shannon’s approach includes some measures, e.g., entropy or surprise, that are not about correlations).

Undoubtedly, genes, alarm signals, or neural spikes carry information in that sense. However, many doubt that this concept can fully capture the relevant property attributed in actual scientific practice. As we saw, a common way to characterize the concept of biological information suggests it as asymmetric, normative, and non-ubiquitous, while correlational (Shannon) information has none of these features. First, correlational information is symmetrical: if A carries information about B, then B carries information about A. If the states of two event spaces are statistically correlated, the correlation goes in both directions. Second, it is not normative, in the sense that it does not seem to have truth or accuracy conditions; the information A carries about B depends on the actual statistical correlation between them and there is no clear sense in which this correlation can be false or inaccurate. Third, information is also ubiquitous: on the usual interpretation of Figure 1, there is no restriction on the kind of entities that can play the role of source, channel, etc. Thus, almost any physical system carries information and, indeed, it carries a large amount of it. As a result, many think that the relevant concept of biological information cannot straightforwardly be understood in terms of Shannon’s approach. This is so much so that correlational information (understood à la Shannon) is standardly contrasted to semantic information.

Recently, however, different strategies have been employed to rescue some elements of Shannon’s theory of information and develop accounts inspired by these ideas. On the one hand, some authors have questioned the clear-cut distinction that has usually been assumed between Shannon and semantic information. Mann (2020), for instance, argues that Shannon’s approach already provides a theory of semantic information (see also Isaac 2019; Martínez 2019). Other researchers have developed correlational approaches that go beyond Shannon’s measure in different ways (Pocheville 2018; Scarantino 2015). Scarantino (2015), for instance, develops a probabilistic difference-maker account inspired by both Shannon information and Bayesian decision theory, which is based on which states have had their probabilities changed, how much the probabilities have changed and what are the posterior probabilities. Pocheville’s (2018) proposal combines Shannon mutual information between interventions and their effects, which captures causal specificity, and Kolmogorov complexity, which reflects the complexity of a sequence and the algorithmic mutual information between two sequences. In Pocheville’s account, the symmetry of mutual information is broken by appealing to interventions (see also Calcott et al. 2020).

An alternative (although, as we will see, related) approach studies information and signals by employing formal tools provided by evolutionary game theory (for an introduction, see Skyrms 2010; O’Connor 2020). For our purposes, the most relevant games are so-called “signaling games” (see Alexander 2002 [2021]). In a nutshell, these game-theoretic models typically include two (or more) players, some of whom play the role of “senders” and others the role of “receivers”. The world can be in different states, which the sender observes and sends a signal. The receiver observes the signal (it cannot observe the world directly) and performs an action. Finally, there is a payoff for the sender and for the receiver, which depends on which action is performed in a given world state. Since there are different signals to choose from, senders and receivers could follow different strategies to coordinate their actions.

These highly idealized models have been used to study many properties of signaling. For instance, it has been shown that in a game with two players, two world states, two signals, two actions, and common interest between players, signaling systems are not only Nash equilibria (a set of strategies where no individual can unilaterally deviate and improve its payoff), but constitute the only attractors, in the sense that any interacting players that start to play any other strategy will tend to approach one of these two equilibria (Huttegger 2007; Bruner et al. 2018). In short, this means that, in these models, communication necessarily evolves. Thus, these models show that the emergence of signaling does not presuppose intelligence either on the part of sender or receiver. Huttegger (2007) also argues that if world states differ in probability, then players might sometimes converge to a pooling equilibrium, where they always send the same signal (irrespective of the observed world state) and always perform the same action. One can also modify the game in different ways: changing the number of states, signals, or actions; considering continuous, rather than discrete, values (O’Connor 2014); adding more players (Skyrms 2009, 2010); considering scenarios of partial or complete conflict of interest (Martínez & Godfrey-Smith 2016) and so on. There is a growing body of literature on these models, which have been used to defend interesting claims in these and related areas.

These models also offer a new view of information. Skyrms (2010) provides a measure for the informational content of a signal, which is a vector specifying how much the signal changes the probability of world states (in this context, “changing probabilities” should not be understood as the signal causally affecting the world, but in technical sense of a difference in probability between the occurrence of the world state given the signal, as opposed to the same world state without the signal). Suppose the world could be in four equiprobable states: S1, S2, S3, and S4. If signal M is sent only in S1 and S3, M’s information content would be \(\langle 1, \infty, 1,-\infty\rangle\), because it increases the probability of S1 and S3 in 1 bit each (\(-\infty\) is just due to taking the logarithm). If instead M is sent only in S3, M’s information content would be \(\langle -\infty, -\infty, 2,-\infty\rangle\). Skyrms’ approach has been very influential and has generated a range of proposals along similar lines (e.g., Isaac 2019). Calcott, Pocheville, and Griffiths (2020) argue that Skryms’ approach fails to capture information flow, and develop an alternative account that interprets signaling networks as causal graphs, according to which information depends on how causally specific a signal is for an act. Shea, Godfrey-Smith, and Cao (2018) take a pluralist approach and define two notions of information: informational content, which captures the probability of world states given the signal, and functional content, which depends on how world states have played a role in the stabilization of the signal. In a sense, functional content can be understood as a way of modelizing a teleological theory of information (see below and Godfrey-Smith 2020).

Finally, some alternative proposals broadly inspired by Shannon’s approach analyze informational relations in terms of counterfactuals. Birch (2014) defines the propositional content of a signal as the information that it would carry in the nearest separating equilibrium, i.e., the nearest equilibrium in which there is a one-to-one mapping from world states into signals. Similarly, to accommodate cases of deception, Skryms and Barret (2019) suggest that a signal’s content is determined by the subgame in which sender and receiver have common interest. From a different perspective, Cohen and Meskin (2006) argue that x’s being F carries information about y’s being G if and only if the counterfactual conditional “if y were not G, then x would not have been F” is non-vacuously true (for a classic version of counterfactual theories of content, see Fodor 1987).

With respect to this wealth of different statistical concepts of information, one can take different attitudes. On the one hand, it could be argued that one of them is the right way to specify the nature of biological information. Alternatively, one could go pluralist and accept that different concepts are useful in different contexts or for different explanatory purposes (e.g., Shea, Godfrey-Smith, & Cao 2018). Yet a different option is to hold that, whereas some of these concepts might have some epistemic utility, none of them capture the nature of biological information. One way to motivate this view is to insist that none of these concepts capture a sense of information that is asymmetric, normative, and non-pervasive. Furthermore, as these approaches are defined over simplified models, they have the virtue of being very precise, making predictions and providing a measurable concept of information, but their connection with actual cases of communication becomes less direct and more questionable.

Be that as it may, two claims are hard to deny. First, the concept of correlational information, as well as the work on these models, has been extremely useful in understanding different aspects of biological information. Second, whatever one thinks of the nature of biological information, probabilistic relations are important for human and non-human animals, so understanding how we exploit it is an important research project (Millikan 2004; Stegmann 2015).

1.2 Teleological Information

The most prominent alternative framework for analyzing the concept of biological information that goes beyond correlational information appeals to the notion of biological function (Millikan 1984). The concept of function offers a promising starting point because it possesses the three features characterizing semantic information: on the one hand, it is normative; a trait’s function is an effect that the trait is supposed to have, and failure to carry it out entails the trait is malfunctioning or functioning wrongly. The idea, then, is that the distinction between truth/accuracy and falsity/inaccuracy could eventually be explained as some form of malfunction. Furthermore, functions typically are asymmetric: an essential function of blinking is spreading tears across the eye, but not vice versa. Finally, functions are mostly (perhaps exclusively) attributed to certain traits of living beings, and only some effects of each trait qualify as its functions, so they are not ubiquitous. So, one could seek to analyze carrying semantic information in terms of having a function (cf. Maynard-Smith 2000). Unfortunately, despite these virtues, this simple proposal is unlikely to succeed, since many functional traits fail to possess semantic information in any relevant sense of the term. Hearts are supposed to pump blood, but they don’t play an informational role. Thus, something else needs to be added.

One strategy resorts to senders and receivers. Interestingly, one of the original motivations for the sender-receiver framework comes from communication theory and, in particular, Shannon’s approach; a second classic source is Lewis’s (1969) account of conventions. In a nutshell, the key idea is that information emerges in the interaction between two (or more) agents or mechanisms: the sender perceives some aspect of the world and sends a signal, and the receiver acts onto the world on receiving it. The role of sender and receiver can be played by whole organisms, but also by parts of organisms or other mechanisms. In principle, senders and receivers could be defined in causal terms, so the analysis is not circular. The roles of “sender” and “receiver” are usually described at a very abstract level, which is of course useful if one is trying to find a shared structure between all informational systems (as, presumably, was Shannon’s original motivation).

An appeal to senders and receivers raises a whole range of interesting issues. Which kind of entities (other than organisms) can play the role of senders and receivers? Different answers to this question have been important, for instance, in the context of genetic information and, as we will see below, different views on the nature of senders and receivers lead to different views on genetic information (for a parallel discussion in neuroscience, see Cao 2012 and Artiga 2016). A different question concerns whether both senders and receivers are always required. Some authors develop their views purely in terms of senders (e.g., Neander 2017), whereas others exclusively appeal to receivers (Fresco, Ginsburg, & Jablonka 2020; Jablonka 2002; Stegmann 2009). A third issue is: what determines informational content? Some think content is primarily determined by past use by the receiver (Millikan 1984), while others embrace a producer-based approach (Neander 2017; Schulte 2018). Framing informational relations in terms of senders and receivers, however, is not devoid of risks: Godfrey-Smith (2014) warns of a tendency to force a sender-receiver interpretation onto any interaction that seems to involve informational relations.

In any case, despite the prominent role teleological theories play in the debate, this approach has been the target of significant objections. In general, teleological views of biological information inherit not only the virtues, but also the difficulties of teleological approaches in general (see entry: teleological notions in biology). Thus, problems related to the different (and incompatible) ways of analyzing the concept of function, as well as the classic problems, should also be taken into account in providing a fully satisfactory theory of biological information. Among others, this includes worries related to potential sources of functional indeterminacy, as well as the well-known Swampman problem: if a lightning bolt strikes a swamp and creates, by sheer luck, an exact, molecule-by-molecule duplicate of Donald Davidson, none of his states could carry information according to teleological theories, since they would lack the right kind of evolutionary function. Many regard this consequence as unpalatable.

Partly for these reasons, there is a growing tendency to provide hybrid accounts that combine functional elements with correlational information, as well as other resources. Bergstrom and Rosvall (2011) suggest that if we view Shannon information as a result of a decision process, rather than as a correlation measure (which, among other things, implies appealing to functions), then we can find some sort of asymmetry and avoid the objection of promiscuity. Lean (2014) argues Shannon’s approach needs to be supplemented with the distinction between carrying information and having the function to do so. In the context of cognitive science, Neander (2017) and Shea (2018) develop accounts that include functions, correlational information as well as other features such as a structural correspondence. Martínez (2019) supplements a teleological approach with various notions of communication theory, such as rate distortion functions (see also Mann 2020). Hybrid accounts are sometimes conceived as adding some elements to a purely correlational account, while at other times they aim to show that these seemingly new features were actually implicitly contained in a mathematical theory of information. In any case, hybrid accounts provide a rich avenue of future research.

1.3 Anti-Realism and Eliminativism

So far we have mostly focused on views that take informational talk at face value and seek to specify in more detail the nature and explanatory value of biological information. Some philosophers and biologists, however, have adopted an alternative perspective. We will briefly consider here criticisms along two dimensions: the realism/anti-realism divide and eliminativism. They roughly correspond to the following questions: Does “information” refer to a real property, which plays certain causal and explanatory roles, or is it merely a useful fiction? Should we keep and promote its use in the biological sciences, or should we rather discourage it?

First, it is important to distinguish the question of realism about information from the classic debate on realism about representations. Indeed, it is possible to be a realist in one debate and not in the other: for instance, informational eliminativists in the animal communication debate typically accept the existence of signals (e.g., Rendall, Owren, & Ryan 2009). Conversely, some critics of postulating mental representations embrace the concept of information (e.g., Chemero 2009). Although the two debates are obviously related, our question specifically concerns information and, in particular, semantic information (the existence of Shannon information is not generally put into question).

Most approaches we have discussed so far adopt a realist attitude, since they take semantic information to be a genuine property carried by some states, and which plays certain causal and explanatory roles. Indeed, most realists are also reductionists, in the sense that they hold semantic information can be explained in more fundamental terms (e.g., by appealing to correlations, functions, sender-receiver structures, and the like).

Nonetheless, other views have also been defended, although their prominence depends heavily on the area. Non-reductionist realism in the context of genetic information seems to be suggested, for instance, by Williams (1992: 10–13) and Dawkins (1995: 4), although these metaphysical views have rarely been defended in detail from a philosophical perspective. Likewise, views that one could (roughly) classify as instrumentalist have been defended in molecular biology (e.g., Sarkar 2000) as well as in neuroscience, where it is usually connected to instrumentalism about representations (Sprevak 2013; Cao 2022). Levy (2011) defends a fictionalist view of information in biology, according to which the concept of information is a liminal metaphor, i.e., “one that operates near the threshold of the noticeable”, but which nonetheless plays a genuine role in biological understanding.

Parallel to discussions about realism/anti-realism is the question of whether we should keep and promote their use in the biological sciences, or rather discourage it. One can typically find eliminativist positions in every debate related to the concept of information. As we will see, these positions have been defended in the context of genetic information (e.g., Griffiths 2001) or animal communication (Rendall et al. 2009), although they represent marginal positions in the field. In contrast, in cognitive science, eliminativism about semantic information has some support, and has led to an important and long-lasting debate (Chemero 2009; Hutto & Myin 2013, 2017).

As suggested above, many of the issues surveyed in this first section are developed in more detail in specific debates. Thus, to delve further into these issues and understand better how the concept of information plays out in different areas of biology, let us concentrate on two different areas: genetic information and animal communication.

2. Genetic Information

As suggested above, informational concepts play a prominent role in molecular biology, where it is standard to talk about translation, transcription, proofreading, redundancy, library, the genetic code, genetic editing, or the genetic program. Information has also been crucial in developing the “central dogma” of molecular biology and connects with highly disputed issues such as the challenges put forward by developmental systems theory, epigenetics, or the concept of innateness. Thus, it is one of the key areas where the debate on semantic information has flourished.

When addressing the question of genetic information, a first caveat is that the very notion of a gene is fraught with complexities (see Meunier 2022 [2023]). Whereas in classical genetics a gene is typically defined as a difference-maker for a phenotypic difference, a molecular gene is a strand of DNA (Falk 1986; Griffiths & Stotz 2013). Additionally, the function of DNA in general needs to be distinguished from the function of a particular section of DNA. Genes also play a variety of roles; while some of them code for proteins or amino acids, others play a regulatory role and, in this sense, might be more aptly described as readers, rather than mechanisms carrying information. Genes are sometimes said to be the messages, and other times the sources of information (Godfrey-Smith 1999). These metaphysical issues on the nature of genes may have important consequences for one’s interpretation of informational talk. Nonetheless, for simplicity, we will leave them aside as far as possible.

Now, why attribute biological information to genes in the first place? Genes play a crucial role in the development of organisms, as well as in the inheritance of characteristics between individuals. Let us first briefly describe the key aspects of the transcription and translation processes, which illustrate the central role of informational concepts and might help understand some of the details of the discussion. The process of gene expression includes various entities and steps: DNA is a macromolecule composed of four nucleobases (cytosine [C], guanine [G], adenine [A], and thymine [T]), a sugar and a phosphate group, structured in the form of a double helix. In the process called “transcription”, some DNA sequences are copied into “messenger RNA” or mRNA (with the exception that thymines, T, are replaced with uracils, U). Then, mRNA is changed in various ways (e.g., RNA splicing) and transported outside of the nucleus into the cytoplasm. Once mRNA reaches the ribosome, this macromolecule chains together amino acids, following the sequence in the mRNA, in a process labeled “translation”. These chained amino acids form the building blocks of protein molecules.

A central aspect in this process of manufacturing a protein is the existence of a so-called “genetic code”, which maps triplets of RNA sequences (codons) to amino acids (although some codons do not code for amino acids, but indicate start and stop functions). For instance, the RNA sequence CGT maps onto the amino acid arginine, and AGT maps onto serine. Deciphering the genetic code was a crucial step in the development of genetics and molecular biology. The genetic code is combinatorial, and it is often claimed to be (in a sense to be elucidated) arbitrary. This suggests that some steps in this process are analogous to symbolic phenomena. The code is also highly specific: each triplet codes for a specific amino acid, although different triplets can code for the same, as there are 64 possible combinations of triplets and only 20 amino acids (in this sense, the genetic code is said to be degenerate).

The attribution of information to genes is often connected to a more specific claim. According to the so-called “Central Dogma” of molecular biology, genetic information flows only in one direction, from DNA to RNA, to protein (see Šustar 2007). In its original formulation, from Crick (published in 1958):

The Central Dogma. This states that once “information” has passed into protein it cannot get out again. In more detail, the transfer of information from nucleic acid to nucleic acid, or from nucleic acid to protein may be possible, but transfer from protein to protein, or from protein to nucleic acid is impossible. Information means here the precise determination of sequence, either of bases in the nucleic acid or of amino acid residues in the protein. (1958: 153, emphasis in the original)

In turn, some appeal to this dogma to vindicate and explain one of the leading ideas of contemporary biological research, namely the idea that acquired characteristics cannot be inherited (Weismannism) (Maynard Smith 2000; Sarkar 1996). Thus, the use of informational notions in molecular biology has a variety of motivations, some of which lie at the core of one of the key assumptions in contemporary biology. As a result, the question of whether genes carry information is intermingled with the question of whether it plays some privileged evolutionary or developmental role.

For our purposes, it might be useful to distinguish two different claims. A first idea is that genes carry information. To defend this suggestion, one needs to show that some respectable notion of information can vindicate the appropriateness of expressions like “coding”, “genetic program”, “transcription”, “translation” , etc. Fulfilling this goal might also require identifying some causal or explanatory role for information to play.

A second and different claim that usually goes hand in hand with the previous, is that genes play some distinctive, special, or privileged explanatory role that distinguishes them from many other mechanisms involved in development or inheritance. Much of the interest in debating the question of genetic information derives precisely from this alleged privileged explanatory role. Biologist Maynard Smith (2000), for instance, defended both claims and boosted a renewed interest in this question (see Godfrey-Smith 2000a; Maynard Smith 2000; Sarkar 2000; Sterelny 2000). Note, however, that the two claims are independent: one could hold that genes play some unique explanatory role in development without relying on informational concepts (e.g., Godfrey-Smith 2000b; Austin 2015), or accept that genes carry information without assuming that this singles them out in any special way (e.g., Sarkar 2000).

2.1 Criticisms of Informational Models

Informational approaches have been criticized from different perspectives (e.g., Griesemer 2005). One line of criticism stresses that once genes are seen as informational, the other causal factors tend to be regarded as mere enabling conditions for the expression of this information. The information view strongly supports the idea that genes control and direct development, while other factors remain in the background. Indeed, informational models have been compared to preformatism (e.g., Oyama 1985; Moss 1992). In its classic form, preformatism holds that organisms develop from miniature forms of themselves, thus development is understood as growth. As a result, rather than explaining how organized and differentiated adults develop from less organized and differentiated cells, preformatism denies the phenomenon. Likewise, critics argue, informational models often suggest a similar picture of development: the supposition that a piece of DNA contains the instructions for building a hand does not actually explain how the hand develops, yet it fosters the false intuition that an explanation is being offered (Lehman 1970: 34). Moreover, critics continue, viewing genes as some sort of special or privileged causal factor has provided a basis for the classic distinction between “innate” and “acquired” characteristics, “nature” and “nurture”, and the like, which has had pernicious effects (Oyama 1985). Others have been more critical of the very idea of genetic information. Sarkar (1996), for example, draws on the development of molecular biology in the 60s and 70s to argue that “information” is a “metaphor that masquerades as a theoretical concept”, which provides a misleading picture of possible explanations in molecular biology (see also Griffiths 2001).

The criticisms of the movement known as developmental systems theory (DST) have been especially influential (Oyama 1985; Griffiths & Gray 1994; Griffiths & Knight 1998). DST theorists have advanced the so-called “parity thesis”, according to which

the roles played by the many causal factors that affect development do not fall neatly into two kinds, one exclusively played by DNA elements the other exclusively played by non-DNA elements. (Griffiths & Gray 2005: 420)

Although genes play an indispensable role in development, so do many other developmental mechanisms. For instance, many of the mechanisms composing the epigenetic inheritance system, such as the DNA methylation patterns, membranes, or organelles, produce resemblances between parents and offspring and work in parallel to nuclear and mitochondrial machinery. Thus, they argue genes are not privileged in any respect. Certainly, genes might sometimes have a reliable set of effects, given a specific set of environmental factors, but also environmental factors might have a reliable set of effects, given a specific set of genes. This view is heavily influenced by Lewontin’s (1974, 2002) criticism of the idea that we can normally distinguish the causal responsibility of genes from the contributions of environmental factors in the production of phenotypic outcomes.

The parity thesis has been the focus of much criticism. One response is to admit that genes are one set of causes among other equally necessary factors, while nonetheless identifying a set of features that make genes distinct or special in some respect. Sterelny, Smith, and Dickison (1996) argue that the informational role of genes is distinctive, but not unique; many other developmental mechanisms that possess functions (song learning, food preferences, centrioles,…) also carry information. Furthermore, some of them have been ignored due to an exclusive focus on DNA. Shea (2007, 2011) accepts Griffiths’ parity thesis, but doesn’t think that accepting that genes carry information implies that many developmental factors do, since only inheritance systems can carry semantic information as part of their function. Stegmann (2012) argues that the “parity thesis” can be defined in different ways; some of them are unproblematic, but also trivial (e.g., genes as well as environmental factors are on a par in the sense that they are both causes), while others are much more controversial. The challenge for those using the parity thesis is to come up with a plausible but interesting sense in which genes and other environmental factors are on a par. In more recent works, Paul Griffiths and Karola Stotz reject strong versions of the parity thesis and accept that nucleic acid plays a distinctive role as a protein template and that the heredity of nucleic acid was the key innovation that allows the transfer of causally specific developmental factors from one cell to another (Griffiths & Stotz 2013; Stotz & Griffiths 2017b).

2.2 Informational Approaches in Genetics

Partly in response to these criticisms, there have been various attempts to develop an account of genetic information that can clarify and underpin its theoretical role. On the one hand, although genes undoubtedly carry correlational information in Shannon’s sense, many hold that this notion is unsuited to vindicating a special explanatory role; among other things, as we saw, information in that sense is pervasive. Indeed, genes often correlate better, not with the designed effect, but with dysfunctional outcomes: acorn genomes, for instance, correlate better with rotting than with growing (Sterelny, Smith, & Dickison 1996; Griffiths & Gray 1994). To address this and other concerns, some recent proposals that rely on a correlational sense of information tend to focus on the specificity or causal profile of genetic material (Bourrat 2019; Calcott, Pocheville, & Griffiths 2020; Pocheville 2018). In recent work, Stotz and Griffiths argue that causal specificity is connected to a form of information. More precisely, drawing on previous work by Waters (2007) and Weber (2006), they hold that a causal relationship is informational when it is highly specific, and define this concept by appealing to Woodward’s interventionist approach to causation (Griffiths & Stotz 2013; Stotz & Griffiths 2017a). Stegmann (2014) adds that DNA is not only highly causally specific, but also an externally ordering process, i.e., an external process that controls every step in the process. According to him, this feature might account for its distinct explanatory role and ground its status as information carrier.

Alternatively, one could avoid these worries by embracing a teleological approach (Maynard Smith 2000). First, in contrast to correlations, functions are not ubiquitous (e.g., environmental features that are relevant for development, such as light or temperature, do not have functions). Secondly, functions need not be the most common effect, so even if an effect \(E_1\) is more frequent than an effect \(E_2\), this does not imply that \(E_1\) must qualify as its function. Nonetheless, as we saw, plenty of functional items do not carry information in the relevant sense, so functions cannot be the whole story (Shea 2007). To support the informational nature of a strand of DNA, which could eventually be used to vindicate a distinctive explanatory role, one has to develop a most elaborate account, which might include (but not be exhausted by) biological functions.

Jablonka’s (2002) proposal appeals to the function of the receiver or interpreter (see also Fresco, Ginsburg, & Jablonka 2020). According to her, an entity or process S carries information when a receiver has an evolved response towards S and variations in the form of S correspond to changes in the receiver. Thus, recipes, alarm calls, a sequence of DNA, the length of day, or the appearance of the sky carry information, as long as a functional receiver exists. In this sense, information is conferred by the interpreter (Jablonka 2002: 586). This is compatible with signals being a special sort of information-carrying system, in which an evolved sender also exists. In Jablonka’s account, however, despite the fact that genes carry information, they do not have a privileged (informational or explanatory) status.

Shea (2007) puts forward an alternative account. His proposal relies on his own infotel-semantic account, which appeals to sender-receiver systems and correlational information, although most of his insights could also be embraced by other teleological theorists. First, among traits with evolutionary functions, he focuses on inheritance systems, which are systems whose function is to produce heritable variation. DNA and its associated developmental machinery (cellular and environmental factors) qualify as an inheritance system in this sense, as it has the function of producing heritable phenotypes. In this framework, the developmental system plays the role of receiver, whereas DNA plays the role of an intermediate. An interesting feature of his approach is that it does not rely on any specific feature of DNA—e.g., on the specificity of coding or on its alleged arbitrariness.

Others have questioned the description of certain mechanisms as senders and receivers in molecular biology. Levy (2011), for example, argues there is no genuine sender for the alleged genetic information. Similarly, Godfrey-Smith (2014) argues that the genome involves a reader (the transcriptional and translational machinery within the cell), but no clear sender, so genes might work as “cues”, rather than as signals (on the cue/signal distinction, see §3). He also explores how senders and receivers can vary along the paradigmatic-marginal axis. In contrast, Calcott (2014) and Planer (2014) argue that genes play the roles of senders and receivers, so they are the mechanisms producing and reading information, rather than carrying it.

An additional property that is often mentioned to help characterize genetic information is arbitrariness (Godfrey-Smith 2000a; Maynard Smith 2000; Sarkar 2000; Sterelny 2000, Fox Keller 2009). This concept, which relates to Monod’s (1970) notion of gratuité, requires much more unpacking and remains highly controversial; in Godfrey-Smith’s terms (2000a: 205) it is a “useful if elusive concept in biology”. Maynard Smith (2000), for example, understands “arbitrariness” in semiotic terms, as lack of necessity between form (chemical composition) and meaning (genes being switched on and off); the clear analogy here is with linguistic meaning, which is usually said to be arbitrary in the sense that alternative sounds can represent any given content equally well. Thus, the idea is that many mappings between DNA bases and triplets would be possible, if the rest of the transcription and translation machinery were modified accordingly. This relates to Francis Crick’s famous suggestion that the structure of the genetic code is a “frozen accident”, one that was highly contingent when it first occurred, but very difficult to change afterwards. According to Maynard-Smith, the arbitrariness of the genetic code is one of the central features that justifies an attribution of genetic information and which singles it out a special sort of cause.

The concept of arbitrariness, however, is hard to make precise, and many argue that standard ways of understanding this concept fail to deliver a defining property of biological information (Stotz & Griffiths 2017a). One worry is that any relationship might look arbitrary if there are enough causal links (Godfrey-Smith 2000a). Stegmann (2004) develops an insightful criticism of some standard ways of capturing the arbitrariness of the genetic code and argues that most of them also apply to many other biochemical relations. Nonetheless, he defends the genetic code being arbitrary, in the sense that a codon requires certain chemical and structural properties to specify an amino acid, but these properties are not determined by some principle of chemistry. He also thinks this notion of arbitrariness does not imply that genes carry semantic information. Lean (2019) develops an account of arbitrariness in terms of what he calls molecular “adapters”, i.e., mechanisms that couple two properties that would be otherwise uncorrelated in such a way that they work as intermediaries, rather than as cooperating causes. Planer and Kalkman (2021) argue that there are two different concepts of arbitrariness that are usually run together, party because human language exemplifies both of them: one refers to the existence of alternative structures that might have been used instead of the actual signal and the other to the lack of resemblance between signal and content.

Three further distinctions are relevant in this debate. On the one hand, an important distinction concerns proximate versus ultimate information, depending on whether genetic information constitutively depends on evolutionary history or not. Teleological accounts typically assume the former, because they often embrace an etiological theory of function, according to which function depends on the effect being selected for (Millikan 1989; Neander 1991). Shea (2007) for instance, argues that genetic information contributes to a phylogenetic explanation of adaptive complexity, which differs from an ontogenetic one. In contrast, Griffiths (2016) argues that genetic information must contribute to explaining development, and ultimate information fails in this task: if two organisms contain the same allele, one deriving from an ancestor and the others appearing ex novo by mutation, both are in same position to explain development, but only the former can have information grounded in the evolutionary past (this is connected to the Swampman problem; see §1.2).

A second distinction concerns whether nucleic acids carry information about some immediate causal product of DNA, such as mRNA or proteins, or about phenotypes (understood as properties of the whole organism, such as size, behavioral patterns, or shape). For instance, according to some, genetic information concerns the production of amino acids or proteins (Godfrey-Smith 2004), whereas others hold that it is about phenotypes or environmental features (Shea 2007; Sterelny et al. 1996). Koiv (2020) defends the idea that some central claims of teleological theories are incompatible with genes carrying distal information about phenotypes. A related distinction concerns the kind of entity genes carry information about; Stegmann (2005), for instance, argues that genes carry information about the process of synthesis (rather than about its products), in the same way that a recipe for an apple pie carries information about how to bake the pie, rather than about the pie itself. He also suggests that the proximal product of DNA transcription is RNA, rather than amino acids or proteins, so if one really selects the proximal effect, not even proteins would be represented.

This point connects with an additional issue. Although so far we have been assuming that information is descriptive (i.e., it is supposed to tell how some part of the world is), information can also be directive, i.e., tell how one should act in the world. This is important, as many of those who accept that genes carry information assume it is some sort of instructive (i.e., directive) content; as Maynard-Smith (2000), suggests, “it is a recipe, not a blueprint”. One reason for thinking content is instructive is that proteins or phenotypes (the most plausible contents) are effects of DNA synthesis and that DNA specifies, in advance, the kind and order of operations that result in a particular product (Stegmann 2005). Furthermore, whereas it is clear which molecule or trait a gene contributes to the production of, it is much less clear which environmental feature it would descriptively represent. Godfrey-Smith (1999) suggests that the content is directive, because if there is some mismatch, the error lies in the interpreting mechanism, not in the genes (so it has a world-to-mind direction of fit). On Shea’s view, genes are pushmi-pullyu representations (see below), in the sense that they carry both indicative and directive content. A gene coding for thick hair, for instance, would have the content the environment is cold, grow thick hair.

In conclusion, nucleic acids uncontroversially carry correlational information, but according to many this fact is unable to support the special explanatory role that genes are supposed to play in inheritance and development. Whether one can characterize an alternative concept of information that is in position to underpin a special or privileged explanatory role remains contested. Relatedly, the result of this debate might have important consequences for closely connected concepts, such as the idea of a “genetic program” (see Moss 1992; Godfrey-Smith 2000b; Fox Keller 2001; Baetu 2012; Planer 2014).

3. Animal Communication

Non-human animal communication (“Animal communication”, for short) is a growing area of research. Communication has been established in many species, including frogs, ants, red deer, humpback whales, elephant seals, and songbirds and takes many forms, ranging from sounds and odors to behavioral patterns. Animal communication raises a whole range of complex and interesting issues, such as the nature of signals and meaning, the evolution of communication (including language), signal reliability, or the relationship between communication and cognition. In this section we will restrict our attention to those aspects that are most directly related to the notion of biological information.

In communication, information is usually attributed to signals, but again, the very notion of signal is somehow controversial. Signals, like alarm calls and mating displays, are often distinguished from cues, such as footprints. According to the most widely accepted definition provided by Maynard-Smith & Harper (2003: 3), a signal is

any act or structure which alters the behaviour of other organisms, which evolved because of that effect, and which is effective because the receiver's response has also evolved.

Interestingly, this definition does not mention the fact that they carry information, although Maynard-Smith & Harper (2003: 3) make clear that it

follows [from that definition] that the signal must carry information—about the state or future actions of the signaler, or about the external world — that is of interest to the receiver.

Others explicitly define signals in informational terms; for instance, Otte (1974: 385) suggests that signals are “behavioral, physiological, or morphological characteristics fashioned or maintained by natural selection because they convey information to other organisms”, and Bradbury and Vehrencamp (1998: 2) define communication as the “provision of information from a sender to a receiver.” In contrast, a cue is an act or structure used to gain information about the world, but which it did not evolve to convey. Both alarm calls and footprints might indicate the presence of a predator, but only the former has evolved to convey this information to a receiver.

The close connection between animal signals and biological information raises some important issues: How should “information” be understood? What is the content of this information? Is there some alternative framework for understanding communication that does not appeal to this concept? What is the connection between an informational perspective to communication and cognition?

3.1 Functional Reference

One of the first contemporary debates on animal communication took place in the 1970s and 80s and concerned whether animal signals can refer to objects and events in the external world, or whether they can only indicate internal states or behavioral propensities (see Smith 1977: 77). Signals that have the function of informing the receiver about world states, rather than about features of the sender, were labeled “functionally referential”, because their functional role was supposed to resemble words in human language (Hauser 1996: 509). Part of the motivation for this debate came from the widespread view that only humans can communicate about objects and events in the world (see Allen & Hauser 1993).

Interestingly, even proponents of functional reference accepted that signals also indicate or carry information about affective states, individual identity, or subsequent behavior (Seyfarth, Cheney, & Marler 1980; Macedonia & Evans 1993). This debate forced contenders to reflect on the nature of signals and information. In an influential paper, for instance, Macedonia and Evans (1993) defined referential signals in terms of two properties: all eliciting stimuli must belong to a common category (i.e., signal specificity or “production criterion”) and that the presence of the signal should be sufficient for producing the behavior in the absence of the eliciting stimulus (“perception criterion”). Eventually, empirical evidence and theoretical research leaned towards the view that regards signals as functionally referential and, as a result of this discussion, this position progressively became mainstream in ethology.

3.2 Influence vs. Informational Approaches

Nonetheless, informational approaches to communication came under attack from a different angle. As an extension of Dawkins’(1976) gene’s eye view developed in the Selfish Gene, Dawkins and Krebs (1978) proposed that signals should be seen as a mechanism by means of which an individual exploits another animal’s muscle power. On this view, signals work as a means to manipulate receivers, in the sense that the signal’s function is to lead receivers to behave in ways that benefit the sender, irrespective of whether it also benefits the receiver:

Communication is said to occur when an animal, the actor, does something which appears to be the result of selection to influence the sense organs of another animal, the reactor, so that the reactor’s behaviour changes to the advantage of the actor. (Dawkins & Krebs 1978: 283).

Their criticism contained two key ideas. First, whereas the classical etiological perspective assumed communication takes place between cooperating organisms, Dawkins and Krebs stressed the role of the sender’s interests, and understood communication as a struggle between an organism that seeks to influence and manipulate a receiver and the resistance of the latter. Secondly, they argued that only within a cooperative framework does it make sense to understand communication as information transfer, and therefore put forward a manipulationist paradigm, which eschews the notion of information.

Since Krebs and Dawkins developed their criticisms on the assumption that signals must presuppose cooperative agents, much research has focused on explaining the reliability of communication and disentangling the mechanisms underpinning its existence. Some mechanisms have been proposed, such as kin selection, reciprocity, or the famous handicap principle (Zahavi 1975), and so far all of them presuppose that, on average, the receiver is at least partly interested in engaging in communication (Wheeler et al. 2011). Thus, in that respect, available evidence seems to point in the direction of requiring at least partial common interest between sender and receiver (although see Martínez & Godfrey-Smith 2016).

In a subsequent paper, Krebs and Dawkins (1984) clarified (or partly modified) two important aspects. On the one hand, they admitted that cooperation might be more common than their previous paper suggested. If this is true, however, one wonders if describing communication as manipulation, in which there is a “manipulator” and a “victim” (which, in cooperative cases, plays the role of a “willing victim”) might be misleading in many cases. On the other hand, they do not seem to entirely reject an informational perspective, but rather to downplay its importance; they eventually express their view as the claim that information (understood not just as correlation, but as semantic information; Krebs & Dawkins 1984: 395) is less important or pertinent than manipulation, or influence of persuasion (indeed, in Dawkins 2003: 97–103, he praises certain informational models). These ideas have given rise to an interesting tradition that seeks to understand signals as states that have some influence on receivers, and according to which informational notions are inapt or, at least, much less central than usually thought.

More recently, work by biologists such as Rendall, Owren, and Ryan follows this skeptical look at informational approaches and has generated an interesting discussion (see, for instance, Rendall et al. 2009, and some responses: Font & Carazo 2010; Ruxton & Schaefer 2011; Scarantino 2010; Scott-Phillips 2010; Seyfarth, Cheney, Bergman, et al. 2010). First, they argue that very concept of “information” is often ill-defined. Second, they suggest that the exclusive focus on information (which, they argue, goes hand in hand with a focus on honest communication) has led researchers to overlook many aspects that influence signal design, such as perceptual biases (Owren, Rendall, & Ryan 2010). Frick, Bich, and Moreno (2019) have also developed an influence-based account based on the concept of organization, rather than evolution.

Supporters of this tradition sometimes object to informational approaches to communication on the grounds that they require senders and receivers to trade on mental representations, akin to those representations involved in human language exchange (Rendall & Owren 2013). Some have replied, however, that his objection is unfounded, since informational researchers neither implicitly nor explicitly assume that, say, bees, suricata, or black-capped chickadees trade on representations resembling human cognitive processes (Seyfarth, Cheney, Bergman, et al. 2010).

In response, those sympathetic to an informational perspective have argued that some aspects of research actually favor their approach. On the one hand, assuming that signals carry information has been a fruitful assumption for decades (Seyfarth, Cheney, Bergman, et al. 2010). Furthermore, it is in line with contemporary research on animal minds, which assumes that cognitive capacities such as learning or categorizing trade on information (Wheeler et al. 2011).

Despite the agonistic way in which this debate is usually framed, one might regard the two views as complementary, rather than conflicting (Ruxton & Schaefer 2011; Scarantino 2010; Stegmann 2013b; but see Kalkman 2019). Whereas the influence approach can be very useful to analyze many properties related to the form of the signal (i.e., detectability, its relationship to receiver biases, etc… ) and can provide an illuminating perspective when there is communication between organisms with a significant conflict of interest, the informational approach might illuminate other aspects, such as content, eliciting behavior, or the reliability and maintenance of communication. For instance, whereas the complexity and variability of mating songs in birds suggests that they probably carry information about the quality of the singer, an important function might also be precluding boredom and habituation (Searcy 1992; Rendall, Owren, & Ryan 2009). Each perspective might contribute to gaining insights into a different aspect of communication. In any case, this compromise sits uneasily with some of the claims of the contenders, so it remains to be seen whether this is ultimately a coherent, stable, and fruitful position.

3.3 Information in Animal Communication Research

As a matter of fact, nowadays most research on animal communication assumes an informational (rather than influence) approach, where signals can be functionally referential, which suggests a range of important questions about the nature of signals and content. Unfortunately, even though information is pervasively used, it is only rarely defined. What is the best interpretation and explanatory role of the concept of “information”, given current scientific practice?

Researchers often describe the concept of information as a “reduction of uncertainty”, which suggests a correlational concept of information (e.g., Seyfarth, Cheney, Bergman, et al. 2010). Some works even explicitly use Shannon’s theory of communication to analyze certain aspects of communication with some precision, such as channel capacity or the complexity of signal repertoire (Haldane & Spurway 1954; McCowan et al. 1999; Wilson 1962). Nonetheless, when scientists provide an explicit definition of communication, most of them resort to one of the standard definitions of signals (Maynard-Smith & Harper 2003; Searcy & Nowicki 2005), which define them in teleological terms (see above). In part, this is due to the ubiquity problem with correlational information described in section 1.1 (Kalkman 2019). Thus, one way to describe the situation is that most research actually assumes a teleological approach to the nature of signals and information, whereas some of the tools and explicit descriptions fit better a correlational concept of information. Pfeifer (2006) and Sarkar (2013) put forward some objections to the use of correlational information in animal communication studies. In response, Mann (2018) provides an interesting analysis and defense of the use of the mathematical theory of communication in this area. On the other hand, work on decision theory provides a quantitative measure of information that differs from Shannon’s informational approach, which is based on how signals change the prior probabilities of certain events (Kight et al. 2013). This approach has heavily influenced Skyrms (2010) and the subsequent literature relying on his work reviewed above (see also Scarantino 2015).

With respect to the standard, teleological approach to communication, such as Maynard-Smith and Harper’s (2003) widely used definition, controversial points remain. For instance, Scott-Phillips (2008) interprets Maynard-Smith and Harper’s analysis in terms of co-adaptation, which according to him is different and superior to an information-based approach. In turn, Scarantino (2013) argues that Scott-Phillips’ (and Maynard-Smith and Harper’s) proposal is too liberal unless one appeals to the concept of information, since it misclassifies some cases of coercion as signals. So he develops his Probabilistic Difference Maker Theory, which seeks to combine insights from Shannon communication theory and Bayesian decision theory, according to which the informational content of a signal is the combination of incremental and overall support for all states (Scarantino 2013, 2015). Whether this or similar approaches can solve the liberality problem, however, is controversial (Kalkman 2019; Artiga 2021).

Interestingly, whereas in molecular biology (as in neuroscience) the existence and nature of senders and receivers is fraught with difficulties, animal communication has a very natural interpretation: senders and receivers are organisms. Nonetheless, Stegmann (2009) defends a receiver-based teleological approach, according to which signal status and information entirely depends on the receiver (for a response, Artiga 2014). Another controversial issue concerns the cognitive complexity required by senders and receivers in pragmatic aspects of communication (Bar-On & Moore 2018).

The content of animal signals also remains a contested topic of research. An important question concerns whether the information carried by animal signals is descriptive or directive. Millikan (1995, 2004) famously argued that many signals in animal communication are what she called “Pushmi-pullyu” representations, i.e., signals that carry both descriptive and directive content at the same time. This has been a very influential concept, applied to many debates on representational content. On the other hand, an additional perspective that has been gaining prominence in recent years (and which has some connections with the classic debate on whether signals are functionally referential) suggests that signals also possess expressivist meaning (McAninch, Goodrich, & Allen 2009). These proposals are connected to a recent interest in pragmatic aspects of communication and the origins of human language (Bar-On 2018).

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• Godfrey-Smith, Peter and Kim Sterelny, “Biological Information”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2024 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2024/entries/information-biological/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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