Molecular Genetics

The term molecular genetics sometimes refers to (1) a fundamental theory alleging that genes direct all life processes through the production of proteins and RNAs (ribonucleic acids), sometimes to (2) a more modest, basic theory about the replication and expression of DNA (deoxyribonucleic acid), and sometimes to (3) an investigative approach applied throughout biomedical science that is based on investigative strategies grounded in the basic theory about genes. This entry briefly summarizes the basic knowledge of molecular genetics and surveys philosophical research on the subject, considering all three senses of the term. The focus is on the traditional issue of theoretical reduction as an account of the molecularization of genetics as well as on more recent work that attends to investigative rather than theoretical and explanatory reasoning.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Basic Theory
  • 2.1 The basic theory of classical genetics
  • 2.2 Molecular-level answers to questions left behind by classical genetics
• 3. Theoretical Reduction and the Molecularization of Genetics
  • 3.1 Schaffner’s thesis that classical genetics is being theoretically reduced
  • 3.2 The Anti-reductionist consensus about genetics
  • 3.3 Challenges to the anti-reductionist consensus
  • 3.4 Moving beyond theoretical reduction and layer-cake antireductionism
• 4. Molecular Genetics as an Investigative Practice
  • 4.1 Shifting philosophical attention from theoretical and explanatory to investigative reasoning
  • 4.2 The collinearity of genetic maps and DNA molecules as an investigative bridge principle
  • 4.3 Is there a coherent molecular gene concept?
  • 4.4 Pragmatic accounts of the molecular gene concept
• 5. The Quest for a Fundamental Theory
  • 5.1 Distinguishing between basic and fundamental theories
  • 5.2 The tenability of the fundamental theory
  • 5.3 Developmentalist alternatives
  • 5.4 The limits of generalization
• 6. Conclusion
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction

The term molecular genetics is now redundant because contemporary genetics is thoroughly molecular. Genetics is not made up of two sciences, one molecular and one non-molecular. Nevertheless, practicing biologists still use the term. When they do use it, they are typically referring to a set of laboratory techniques aimed at identifying and/or manipulating DNA segments involved in the synthesis of important biological molecules. Scientists often talk and write about the application of these techniques across a broad swath of biomedical sciences. For them, molecular genetics is an investigative approach that involves the application of laboratory methods and research strategies. This approach presupposes basic knowledge about the replication of DNA and the expression and regulation of genes at the molecular level.

Philosophical interest in molecular genetics, however, has centered, not on investigative approaches or laboratory methods, but on theory. Early philosophical research concerned the basic theory about the make-up, expression, and regulation of genes. Most attention centered on the issue of theoretical reductionism. The motivating question concerned whether classical genetics, the science based on experimentally studying inheritance patterns in naturally occurring genetic variants of various plant and animal species, was being reduced to molecular genetics. With the rise of developmental genetics and developmental biology, philosophical attention has subsequently shifted towards critiquing a fundamental theory associated with contemporary genetics. The fundamental theory concerns not just the make-up, replication, expression, and regulation of genes, but also the overall role of genes within the organism. According to the fundamental theory, genes and DNA direct all life processes by providing the information that specifies the development and functioning of organisms. However, in contrast to the basic theory, this gene-centric fundamental theory is detached from experimental practice, still lacks a rigorous formulation and may be more of an ideology than a scientific theory, even though some practicing life science researchers endorse some version of it, at least when communicating with non-experts.

This article begins by providing a quick review of the basic theories associated with classical and molecular genetics (Section 2). Since the molecular basic theory incorporates ideas from the Morgan school of classical genetics, it is useful to sketch its development from Morgan’s genetics. In the third section, we review the debate about whether molecular genetics reduced classical genetics in a similar way like statistical mechanics is thought to have reduced classical thermodynamics. In the fourth section, we discuss some philosophical work on molecular genetics that has shifted attention away from theories to scientific practice, including debates about the molecular gene concept. Finally, in the fourth section, we contrast the basic theory of molecular genetics with what is usually thought to be the fundamental theory and briefly review arguments concerning its tenability. Some short explorations about the possibility of any adequate fundamental theory, developmentalist alternatives as well as the limits of gene-centric biology conclude this article.

2. Basic Theory

2.1 The basic theory of classical genetics

The basic theory associated with classical genetics provided explanations of the transmission of traits from parents to offspring. Most of it has been worked out by Thomas Hunt Morgan and his coworkers between 1910 and about 1930, using the fruit fly Drosophila melanogaster as an experimental organism (Kohler 1994). We will illustrate the classical mode of explanatory reasoning with a simple historical example involving the fruit fly Drosophila melanogaster. It is worth emphasizing that the mode of reasoning illustrated by this historical example is still an important mode of reasoning in genetics today, including what is sometimes called molecular genetics.

Genes of Drosophila come in pairs, located in corresponding positions on the four pairs of chromosomes contained within each cell of the fly. The eye-color mutant known as purple is associated with a gene located on chromosome II. Two copies of this gene, existing either in mutated or normal wild-type form, are located at the same locus (corresponding position) in the two second-chromosomes. Explanations of the transmission of traits relate the presence of alternative genes (genotype) to the presence of alternative observable traits (phenotype). Sometimes this is done in terms of dominant/recessive relations. Purple eye-color, for example, is recessive to the wild-type character (red eye-color). This means that flies with two copies of the purple allele (the mutant form of the gene, which is designated pr) have purple eyes, but heterozygotes, flies with one copy of the purple allele and one copy of the wild-type allele (designated +), have normal wild-type eyes (as do flies with two copies of the wild-type allele).

To see how the classical theory explains trait transmission, consider a cross of red-eyed females with purple-eyed males that was carried out by Morgan’s collaborators. The offspring all had red eyes. So the trait of red eyes was passed from the females to all their offspring even though the offspring’s male parents had purple eyes. The classical explanation of this inheritance pattern proceeds, as do all classical explanations of inheritance patterns, in two stages.

The first stage accounts for the transmission of genes and goes as follows (Figure 1): each offspring received one copy of chromosome II from each parent. The maternally derived chromosomes must have contained the wild-type allele (since both second-chromosomes of every female parent used in the experiment contained the wild-type allele—this was known on the basis of previous experiments). The paternally derived chromosomes must have contained the purple allele (since both second-chromosomes of every male parent contained the purple allele—this was inferred from the knowledge that purple is recessive to red eye-color). Hence, all offspring were heterozygous (pr / +). Having explained the genetic makeup of the progeny by tracing the transmission of genes from parents to offspring, we can proceed to the second stage of the explanation: drawing an inference about phenotypic appearances. Since all offspring were heterozygous (pr / +), and since purple is recessive to wild-type, all offspring had red eye-color (the wild-type character). See Figure 1.

Notice that the reasoning here does not depend on identifying the material make-up, mode of action, or general function of the underlying gene. It depends only on the ideas that copies of the gene are distributed from generation to generation and that the difference in the gene (i.e., the difference between pr and +), whatever this difference is, causes the phenotypic difference. The idea that the gene is the difference maker needs to be qualified: differences in the gene cause phenotypic differences in particular genetic and environmental contexts. This idea is so crucial and so often overlooked that it merits articulation as a principle (Waters 1994):

Difference principle: differences in a classical gene cause uniform phenotypic differences in particular genetic and environmental contexts.

It is also worth noting that the difference principle provides a means to explain the transmission of phenotypic characteristics from one generation to the next without explaining how these characteristics are produced in the process of an organism’s development. This effectively enabled classical geneticists to develop a science of heredity without answering questions about development, what genes are, how genes are replicated, what genes do, or how differences in genes bring about differences in phenotypic traits.

2.2 Molecular-level answers to questions left behind by classical genetics

Research in molecular biology and genetics has yielded answers to the basic questions left unanswered by classical genetics about the make-up of genes, the mechanism of gene replication, what genes do, and the way that gene differences bring about phenotypic differences. These answers are couched in terms of molecular-level phenomena, and they provide much of the basic theory associated with molecular genetics.

What is a gene? This question is dealt with at further length in Section 4.3 of this article, but a quick answer suffices for present purposes: genes are linear sequences of nucleotides in DNA molecules. Of course, not every string of nucleotides in DNA is a gene; segments of DNA are identified as genes according to what they do (see below).

How are genes replicated? The idea that genes are segments in a DNA double helix provides a straightforward answer to this question. As Watson and Crick (1953) wrote at the end of their famous paper announcing the structure of DNA: “It has not escaped our notice that the specific pairing we have postulated immediately suggests a possible copying mechanism for the genetic material”. What they meant was that genes could be faithfully replicated when the paired chains of a DNA double helix unwind, and new chains are formed alongside the separating strands by the pairing of complementary nucleotide bases. The “specific pairing” refers to the fact that the contours of possible hydrogen bonds of the nucleotide base Adenine (A) match those of Thymine (T) and those of Guanine (G) match those of Cytosine (C). Thus, the enzymes that replicate DNA will usually insert an A opposite a T and vice versa, or a G opposite a C, respectively. (Errors sometimes occur, which is one of several molecular causes of mutations.) When the process is complete, two copies of the original double helix have been formed and hence the genes in the original DNA molecule have been effectively replicated.

What do genes do? Roughly speaking, genes serve as templates in the synthesis of RNA molecules. The result is that the linear sequence of nucleotides in a newly synthesized RNA molecule corresponds to the linear sequence of nucleotides in the DNA segment used as the template. Different RNA molecules play different functional roles in the cell, and many RNA molecules play the role of template in the synthesis of polypeptide molecules. Newly synthesized polypeptides are linear sequences of amino acids that constitute proteins and proteins play a wide variety of functional roles in the cell and organism (and environment). The ability of a polypeptide to function in specific ways depends on the linear sequence of amino acids of which it is formed. And this linear sequence corresponds to the linear sequence of triplets of nucleotides in RNA (codons), which in turn corresponds to the linear sequence of nucleotides in segments of DNA, and this latter segment is the gene for that polypeptide.

How do differences in genes bring about differences in phenotypic traits? The modest answer given above to the question ‘What do genes do?’ provides the basis for explaining how differences in genes can bring about differences in phenotypic traits. A difference in the nucleotide sequence of a gene will result in the difference in the nucleotide sequence of RNA molecules, which in turn can under some conditions result in a difference in the amino acid sequence of a polypeptide. Differences in the linear sequences of amino acids in polypeptides (and in the linear sequences of nucleotides in functional RNA molecules) can affect the roles they play in the cell and organism, sometimes having an effect that is observable as a phenotypic difference. The mutations (differences in genes) identified by the Morgan group (e.g., the purple mutation affecting eye color) have been routinely identified as differences in nucleotide sequences in DNA. Differences in DNA sequences (in so-called cis-regulatory regions) can also affect the phenotype by altering the regulation of gene expression without affecting any protein sequences. But it should be noted that the basic theory of molecular genetics does not contain any generalizations about how differences in protein sequence or in the regulatory regions of genes translate into trait differences, as this depends on developmental processes as well as on the environment (see Section 5.4).

3. Theoretical Reduction and the Molecularization of Genetics

The debate we are about to review in this section was formative for the entire discipline of philosophy of biology. Kenneth Schaffner’s (1967) article on antireductionism and molecular biology appeared in the prestigious scientific journal Science, showing that the issue was of wide interest at that time. This is a time which saw the “cracking” of the genetic code (i.e., the unraveling of how DNA sequence maps to amino acid sequence in proteins) and many other advancements that sparked new hope of a complete reduction of biology to physics and chemistry. David Hull’s book Philosophy of Biological Science (1974), which contains a nuanced discussion of this issue, appeared in the same book series as Carl Hempel’s Philosophy of Natural Science (1966) and is comparable to the latter in analytic and argumentative rigor. More than any other publication, Hull’s book was widely seen as the coming of age of the philosophy of biology as a self-standing discipline in a field that had been dominated by the philosophy of physics.

Heirs to the Vienna Circle and its “unity of science” program, philosophers of science like Carl Hempel or Ernest Nagel have been intrigued by ideals of reductionism and the grand scheme that all science will one day be unified by being theoretically reduced to a universal science of fundamental physics. Philosophical reductionists believe that scientific knowledge progresses when higher-level sciences (e.g., chemistry) are reduced to lower-level sciences (e.g., physics). The so-called received view of scientific knowledge, codified in Nagel (1961) and Hempel (1966), promoted reductionism as a central ideal for science, and confidently asserted that much progress had been made in the reduction of chemistry to physics. Nagel constructed a formal model of reduction and applied it to illuminate how the science of thermodynamics, which was couched in terms of higher-level concepts such as pressure and temperature, was allegedly reduced to statistical mechanics, couched in terms of the lower-level concepts of Newtonian dynamics such as force and mean kinetic energy. In 1969, Schaffner claimed that the same kind of advance was now taking place in genetics, and that the science of classical genetics was being reduced to an emerging science of “molecular genetics.” Schaffner’s claim, however, was quickly challenged by Hull. Other philosophers of biology developed Hull’s anti-reductionist arguments and a near consensus developed that classical genetics was not and would not be reduced to molecular genetics. Although the philosophical case for anti-reductionism has been challenged, many philosophers still assume that the anti-reductionist account of genetics provides an exemplar for anti-reductionist analyses of other sciences.

3.1 Schaffner’s thesis that classical genetics is being theoretically reduced

Reductionism has many meanings. For example, the phrase genetic reductionism concerns the idea that all biological phenomena are caused by genes, and hence presupposes an ontological sense of reductionism according to which one kind of micro-entity (in this case, gene) exclusively causes a variety of higher-level phenomena (in this case, biological features, cultural phenomena, and so forth). But this is not the meaning of reductionism at issue in the philosophical literature about the reduction of classical genetics. This literature is more concerned with epistemology than metaphysics. The concept of reductionism at issue is Nagel’s concept of theoretical reduction. (See Sarkar 1992 and Schaffner 1993 for discussions of alternative conceptions of reduction.) According to Nagel’s concept, the reduction of one science to another science entails the reduction of the central theory of one science to the central theory of the other. Nagel believed that this kind of theoretical reduction led to progressive changes in scientific knowledge. He formulated two formal requirements for theoretical reductions.

Nagel’s first formal requirements was that the “laws” of the reduced theory must be derivable from the laws and associated coordinating definitions of the reducing theory. This deducibility requirement was intended to capture the idea that the explanatory principles (or laws) of the reducing theory ought to explain the explanatory principles (or laws) of the reduced theory. Nagel’s second formal requirement, the connectability requirement, was that all essential terms of the reduced theory must either be contained within or be appropriately connected to the terms of the reducing theory by way of additional assumptions. The connectability requirement is presupposed by the derivability requirement, but making it explicit helps emphasize an important task and potential stumbling block for carrying out theoretical reduction.

Schaffner (1969) modified Nagel’s model by incorporating the idea that what the reducing theory actually derives (and hence explains) is a corrected version of the reduced theory, not the original theory. He argued that this revised model better captured reductions in the physical sciences. He claimed his revised model could also be used to show how a corrected version of classical genetics was being reduced to a new theory of physicochemical science called molecular genetics. Hull (1974) countered that classical genetics was not being reduced, at least not according to the model of reduction being applied by Schaffner. Hull argued that genetics did not exemplify Nagelian reduction because the fundamental terms of classical genetics could not be suitably connected to expressions couched in terms of DNA.

3.2 The Anti-reductionist consensus about genetics

Most philosophers writing on genetics and reductionism have argued that molecular genetics has not and will not reduce classical genetics (e.g., see Wimsatt 1976a, Darden and Maull 1977, Kitcher 1984, Rosenberg 1985 and 1994, Dupré 1993, and Burian 1996). Two objections to Schaffner’s reductionist thesis have been most persuasive: the unconnectability objection and the gory details objection. The unconnectability objection claims that the terminology of classical genetics cannot be redefined at the molecular level in terms of DNA. This objection effectively claims that Nagel’s second formal requirement, the connectability requirement, cannot be satisfied. The gory details objection alleges that molecular genetics cannot and will not explain classical genetics or better explain the phenomena that are already explained by the classical theory. This objection relates to Nagel’s first formal requirement, the derivability requirement. But the gory details objection goes philosophically deeper because it implies that even if the explanatory principles of classical genetics could be derived from the explanatory principles of molecular genetics, the derivations would not be explanatory.

The most rigorous formulation of the unconnectability objection can be found in the early writings of Rosenberg who once contended that there is an unbridgeable conceptual gap between the classical and molecular theories of genetics (1985, 1994). In support of this contention, Rosenberg argued that relations between the gene concept of classical genetics and the concepts of molecular genetics are hopelessly complicated “many-many” relations that will forever frustrate any attempt to systematically connect the two theories. Rosenberg began his analysis by pointing out that in classical genetics, genes are identified by way of their phenotypic effects. Classical geneticists identified the gene for purple eye-color, for example, by carrying out carefully orchestrated breeding experiments and following the distribution of eye-color phenotypes in successive generations of a laboratory population. The reason classical genetics will never be reduced to a molecular-level science, according to Rosenberg (1985), is that there is no manageable connection between the concept of a Mendelian phenotype and that of a molecular gene:

The pathway to red eye pigment production begins at many distinct molecular genes and proceeds through several alternative branched pathways. … The pathway from the [molecular] genes also contains redundant, ambiguous, and interdependent paths. If we give a biochemical characterization of the gene for red eye color either by appeal to the parts of its pathway of synthesis, or by appeal to the segments of DNA that it begins with, our molecular description of this gene will be too intricate to be of any practical explanatory upshot. (Rosenberg 1985, p. 101)

Rosenberg concluded that since the relation between molecular genes and Mendelian phenotypes is exceedingly complex, the connection between any molecular concept and the Mendelian gene concept must also be exceedingly complex, thereby blocking any systematic, reductive explanation of classical genetics in terms of molecular-level theory.

The gory details objection can be traced back to the writings of Putnam (1965) and Fodor (1968) who argued against reductionism of the mental on the basis that psychological functons are multiply-realized. This objection against reductionism was further developed in the context of genetics, most thoroughly by Kitcher (e.g., see Kitcher 1984, 1999, 2001). Following Hull, Kitcher assumes that classical genetics is transmission genetics. The classical theory, according to Kitcher, explains the transmission of phenotypic traits, not the development of phenotypic traits in individual organisms. And transmission phenomena, on Kitcher’s account, are best explained at the level of cytology: “The distribution of genes to gametes is to be explained, not by rehearsing the gory details of the reshuffling of the molecules, but through the observation that chromosomes are aligned in pairs just prior to the meiotic division, and that one chromosome from each matched pair is transmitted to each gamete.” (Kitcher 1984, p. 370). Kitcher suggests that the pairing and separation of chromosomes belong to a natural kind of pair separation processes which are heterogeneous from the molecular perspective because different kinds of forces are responsible for bringing together and pulling apart different paired entities. The separation of paired entities, he claims, “may occur because of the action of electromagnetic forces or even nuclear forces; but it is easy to think of examples in which the separation is effected by the action of gravity.” (Kitcher 1984, p. 350)

The image of genetics that emerges from the anti-reductionist literature is of a two-tiered science composed of two discreet theoretical discourses, one grounded in principles about entities at the cytological level (such as chromosomes) and the other grounded in principles about entities at the molecular level (such as nucleotide sequences in DNA). Anti-reductionists believe some phenomena, including transmission of genes, are best explained by a theory grounded at the cytological level and other phenomena, including the expression of genes, are best explained by a theory grounded at the molecular level. Although Kitcher argues that classical genetics provides the best explanation in an objective sense, some anti-reductionists (e.g., Rosenberg 1985, 1994) believe that the obstacles to reduction are merely practical. Rosenberg (1985, 1994) appealed to the concept of supervenience to argue that in principle, molecular genetics would provide the best explanations. But he argued that in practice, classical genetics provides the “best” explanation of transmission phenomena, in the sense that this is the best explanation available to creatures with our cognitive limitations. Subsequently, however, Rosenberg changed his position on this issue, largely on the grounds that that technological advances in information storage and processing “may substantially enhance our capacity to understand macromolecular processes and their combinations” (Rosenberg 2006, p. 14).

Despite philosophically significant differences in their views about the ultimate basis of the irreducibility of classical genetics, the image of biological knowledge that emerges from the antireductionists’ writings is similar. The biological world consists of different domains of phenomena and each domain is best explained at a particular level of theoretical discourse. Hence, the ideal structure for biology is akin to a layer-cake, with tiers of theories, each of which provides the best possible account of its domain of phenomena. Biological sciences such as classical genetics that are couched in terms of higher levels of organization should persist, secure from the reductive grasp of molecular science, because their central theories (or patterns of reasoning) explain domains of phenomena that are best explained at levels higher than the molecular level.

3.3 Challenges to the anti-reductionist consensus

The anti-reductionist consensus has not gone unchallenged (see Sarkar 1989, 1992 and 1998, Schaffner 1993, and Waters 1990 and 2000). According to critics, the chief objections supporting the consensus are mistaken. The unconnectability objection rests on the assumption that classical genetics took the relationships between genes and phenotypic traits to be simple one-to-one relationships. But classical geneticists knew better. Consider what Sturtevant, one of Morgan’s star students and collaborators, had to say about genes and eye color:

The difference between normal red eyes and colorless (white) ones in Drosophila is due to a difference in a single gene. Yet red is a very complex color, requiring the interaction of at least five (and probably of very many more) different genes for its production. And these genes are quite independent, each chromosome bearing some of them. Moreover, eye-color is indirectly dependent upon a large number of other genes such as those on which the life of the fly depends. We can then, in no sense identify a given gene with the red color of the eye, even though there is a single gene differentiating it from the colorless eye. So it is for all characters … . (Emphasis added, quoted from Carlson 1988, p. 69)

This quotation suggests that the relationship between gene and eye-color in classical genetics exhibited the same complexity that Rosenberg discussed at the molecular level (compare this quotation to the passage from Rosenberg 1985 quoted in section 3.2). According to this critique of the unconnectability objection, it is not the case that genotype-phenotype relationships appear simple and uniform at the level of classical genetics and complicated and dis-unified at the molecular level. The situation appears similarly complex at both levels of analysis (Waters 1990).

Classical genetics nevertheless finds a simple way to explain transmission phenomena by appealing to the difference principle, according to which particular differences in particular genes cause particular differences in phenotypic traits in particular contexts (see section 2.1). Sturtevant alludes to this principle in the first sentence of the quotation above and again in the emphasized clause. So the question arises, can this relationship be captured at the molecular level? And the answer is yes. The differences used by classical geneticists to explain inheritance patterns have been routinely identified at the molecular level by contemporary geneticists.

According to this critique, the gory details objection also fails. This objection claims that biologists cannot improve upon the classical explanations of transmission phenomena by citing molecular details. The cytological level allegedly provides the best level of explanation because explanations at this level uniformly account for a wide range of cases that would look heterogeneous from a molecular perspective. Consider Kitcher’s formulation of this objection. Kitcher believes that to explain is to unify (1989). It follows that the best explanation of a class of phenomena is the explanation that accounts for the class in a uniform way. Kitcher claims meiosis exemplifies this kind of situation. The uniformity of pair-separation processes is evident at the cytological level, but is lost in the gory details at the molecular level where the process “may occur because of the action of electromagnetic forces or even of nuclear forces …” (Kitcher 1984, p. 350). But it is unclear what Kitcher could have in mind. The molecular mechanisms underlying the pairing and separation of chromosomes are remarkably uniform in creatures ranging from yeast to human beings; it is not the case that some involve electromagnetic forces and others involve nuclear forces. Kitcher’s claim that “it is easy to think of examples in which the separation is effected by the action of gravity” has no basis in what molecular biologists have learned about the pairing and separation of chromosomes.

Meiosis is an unpromising candidate to illustrate the idea that what appears uniform at the level of classical genetics turns out to be heterogeneous at the molecular level. But this idea is illustrated by other genetic phenomena. Consider the phenomenon of genetic dominance. In classical genetics, all examples of complete dominance are treated alike for the purposes of explaining transmission phenomena. But contemporary genetics reveals that there are several very different mechanisms underlying different instances of dominance. According to Kitcher’s unificationist theory of scientific explanation, the classical account of dominance provides an objectively better basis for explaining transmission phenomena because it provides a more unified organization of the phenomena. But this would imply that the shallow explanations of classical genetics are objectively preferable to the deeper explanations provided by the molecular theory (Waters 1990).

3.4 Moving beyond theoretical reduction and layer-cake antireductionism

Although Nagel’s concept of theoretical reduction marks a common starting point for discussions about the apparent reduction of classical genetics, much of the literature on reduction is aimed at seeking a better understanding of the nature of reduction by seeking to replace Nagel’s concept with a more illuminating one. This is true of the anti-reductionists, who seek to clarify why molecular genetics cannot reduce classical genetics, as well as those who have been more sympathetic to reductionism. Hence, there are two levels of discourse in the literature examining the question of whether molecular genetics is reducing classical genetics. One level concerns what is happening in the science of genetics. The other concerns more abstract issues about the nature of (epistemological) reduction.

The abstract level of discourse began with Schaffner’s idea that what is reduced is not the original theory, but rather a corrected version of the original theory. Wimsatt (1976a) offers a more ambitious modification. He rejects the assumption that scientific theories are sets of law-like statements and that explanations are arguments in which the phenomena to-be-explained are derived from laws. Instead of relying on these assumptions, Wimsatt uses Salmon’s account of explanation (Salmon 1971) to examine claims that molecular genetics offered reductive explanations. Kitcher (1984) also rejects the account of theorizing underlying Nagel’s concept of reduction. He constructs a new concept of reductive explanation based on his own idea of what effectively constitutes a scientific theory and his unificationist account of scientific explanation (1989). Likewise, Sarkar (1998) rejects the account of theories and explanation presupposed in Nagel’s concept of reduction. In fact, he explicitly avoids relying on any particular account of scientific theories or theoretical explanation. Instead, he assumes that reductive explanations are explanations without specifying what an explanation is, and then seeks to identify the features that set reductive explanations apart from other explanations.

Wimsatt, Kitcher, and Sarkar seek to replace Nagel’s conception of reduction with a conception that does not assume that scientic explanation involves subsumption under universal laws. Weber (2005), however, seeks to replace Nagel’s conception with one that retains the idea that reductive explanation involves subsumption under laws of the reducing science. What Weber rejects is the idea that reductionism in biology involves explaining higher-level biological laws. He argues that, with some rare exceptions, biological sciences don’t have laws. He contends that reductionism in biology involves explaining biological phenomena directly in terms of physical laws. Hence, he rejects the “layer-cake” conception of reduction implicit in Nagel’s account.

The literature about reduction and molecular genetics has influenced philosophers’ thinking about reduction in other sciences. For example, Kitcher’s concept of reduction, which he uses to explain why molecular genetics cannot reduce classical genetics, has subsequently been employed by Hardcastle (1992) in her examination of the relationship between psychology and neuroscience. On the other side, Sober develops and extends the criticism of Kitcher’s gory details objection (section 3.3) by re-examining the arguments of Putnam (1975) and Fodor (1968, 1975) on multiple-realizability.

Sober (1999) argues that higher-level sciences can describe patterns invisible at lower level, and hence might offer more general explanations. But he insists that description should not be confused with explanation. He maintains that although physics might not be able to describe all the patterns, it can nevertheless explain any singular occurrence that a higher-level science can explain. Higher-level sciences might provide more “general” explanations, but physics provides “deeper” ones. He suggests that which explanation is better is in the eye of the beholder. He concludes that

[…] reductionists might want to demure on this question of better and worse, and try to build on the bare proposition that physics in principle can explain wny singular occurrence that a higher-level science is able to explain. […] For reductionists, the interesting feature of physical explanations of social, psychological, and biological phenomena is that they use the same basic theoretical machinery that is used to explain phenomena that are nonsocial, nonpsychological, and nonbiological. (Sober 1999, pp. 560–1)

The discussion has gone full circle. The multiple-realizability argument being criticized by Sober was based on abstract considerations in the context of philosophy of mind. Philosophers of biology drew on this literature to construct the gory details objection against the idea that molecular genetics is reducing classical genetics. Other philosophers argued that this objection did not stand up to a careful analysis of the concrete situation in genetics. Sober (1999) has developed lessons from the discussion about genetics to critique the original anti-realizability argument and draw general conclusions about reductionism. Polger and Shapiro (2016) attempt to debunk the standard cases of multiple realizability. Ross (2020) argues that multiple realizability is often a feature of certain higher-level causes of high explanatory relevance.

Wimsatt’s writings on reduction (1976a, 1976b, and 2007) emphasize the fruitfulness of attempting to achieve a reduction, even when a reduction is not achieved. He argues, for instance, that efforts to discover the molecular make-ups of entities identified at higher levels is often fruitful, even when identities between levels cannot be found. In addition, Wimsatt points out that the “costs” of working out reductive explanations of the many particulars already explained at a higher level are relevant to the question of why there is not a full-scale replacement of higher level explanations with lower level ones. Perhaps the fact that molecular genetics has not replaced classical genetics can be explained on the basis of high costs rather than lack of epistemic merit.

While Schaffner still maintains that molecular genetics can in principle reduce classical genetics, he has conceded that attempts to carry out the reduction would be “peripheral” to the advance of molecular genetics. One might respond, along the lines of Hull (1974), that the success of molecular genetics seems to be reductive in some important sense. Hence, the failure to illuminate this success in terms of reduction reveals a conceptual deficiency. That is, one might argue that Schaffner’s peripherality thesis indicates that his conception of reduction is not the epistemically relevant one because it cannot illuminate the fruitfulness of reductive inquiry in molecular genetics.

In fact, a general shortcoming in the debate about the reduction of classical genetics is that it concerns only a fragment of scientific reasoning. It is based almost exclusively on an analysis of explanatory or theoretical reasoning and largely ignores investigative reasoning. The philosophical literature on the alleged reduction of classical genetics focuses on how geneticists explain or try to explain phenomena, not how they manipulate or investigate phenomena. This is even true of Wimsatt’s (1976a) account of heuristics, which stress heuristics for explanation.

Vance (1996) offers a more thorough shift in attention from theory to investigative practice. He asserts that there is only one contemporary science of genetics and describes how investigative methods of classical genetics are an essential part of the methodology of what is called molecular genetics. He concludes that reductionism fails because contemporary genetics still depends on methods of classical genetics involving breeding experiments. Vance’s picture of genetics is compelling. The laboratory methods of classical genetics do indeed persist, even as they are greatly extended, augmented, and often replaced by techniques involving direct intervention on DNA. But Vance’s picture does not match the anti-reductionist image of a two-tiered science and the contention that classical genetics will remain aloof from the reductive grasp of molecular biology.

A different image emerges from viewing genetics as an investigative science involving an interplay of methodological and explanatory reasoning (Waters 2008). This image is not of a two-tiered science, one (classical genetics) aimed at investigating and explaining transmission phenomena and another (molecular genetics) aimed at investigating and explaining developmental phenomena. Instead, there is one science that retains much of the investigative and explanatory reasoning of classical genetics by re-conceptualizing its theoretical basis in molecular terms and by retooling its basic investigative approach by integrating methodologies of classical genetics with physically-based methods of biochemistry and new methods based on recombinant DNA and RNA interference technologies.

In recent years, the exclusive focus on theories that characterized the reduction debate about classical and molecular genetics is no longer dominant in the philosophy of biology, which also took some of the impetus away from the reduction debate. In addition to the shift from theory to investigative practices (see next section), another reason may have been the advent of the “New Mechanist” movement which sees biology as being concerned with describing multi-level mechanisms (Craver 2007).

4. Molecular Genetics as an Investigative Practice

4.1 Shifting philosophical attention from theoretical and explanatory to investigative reasoning

Philosophers initially assumed that classical genetics provides mainly explanations of hereditary patterns by the cytological mechanism of meiosis. While this was an early accomplishment of classical genetics, research at the Morgan lab was quickly reorganized towards mapping the vast number of mutations that kept being discovered at an almost daily basis (Kohler 1994). Furthermore, the genetic approach became a tool for studying various biological phenomena including mutagenesis, development, behavior, evolution, and more. By isolating and characterizing thousands of mutants and studying their effects, the classical fly geneticists also gained theoretical knowledge. Importantly, this knowledge extended well beyond the narrow domain of explaining phenotypic patterns of inheritance. As Waters (2004) argues, this knowledge was not structured by a theory but by what he calls patterns of investigative reasoning. This reasoning enabled geneticists to identify alleles responsible for mutant phenotypes, locate them on the chromosomes, study their phenotypic effects in various genetic environments, etc. (an approach sometimes called “forward genetics”). Classic philosophers of science had been used to looking at fundamental physical theories such as general relativity theory or quantum theory which are able to explain any phenomenon in their domain. By contrast, the basic theory of classical genetics is much more narrow in scope; by itself, it can only explain a few inheritance patterns. But by virtue of providing the core for investigative reasoning approaches, it is much more broadly applicable. However, its role is not to provide explanations itself (by entailment), but in creating new knowledge that it is in no way entailed by any core principles.

Much of Waters’s (2004) account of classical genetics can be applied to molecular genetics, only that the basic theory is more detailed and makes reference to molecules. Furthermore, the molecular genetic approach is even more powerful in creating knowledge about a broad range of biological phenomena. Molecular genetics is in many ways continuous with classical genetics, but it was initially largely developed by using microorganisms, in particular the bacterium Escherichia coli and some of its bacteriophages, a kind of virus that infects bacteria. These organisms are very different from a genetic point of view. They reproduce asexually, however, some bacteria including E. coli also occasionally engage in the exchange of genetic material though establishing physical contact of cells or conjugation. No new cells are created in conjugation, but cells that receive DNA from a donor cell are genetically transformed. Thus, parts of its genome can be present in two copies, which is genetically equivalent to the diploid state in eukaryotes (“higher” organisms like protozoans, plants, fungi and animals). In this condition, a processus that is analogous to recombination or crossing-over in sexually reproducing diploid organism may occur. In this process, genes that were initially on separate chromosomes may end up on the same chromosome or vice versa. The frequency by which this occurs is roughly proportional to their physical distance. By this technique, Morgan and his coworkers had established detailed genetic maps of Drosophila chromosomes. Microbial geneticists such as François Jacob, Elie Wollmann or Seymour Benzer were able to do something similar in E. coli and bacteriophage in the 1950s. These developments were pivotal for the transition from classical to molecular genetics (Judson 1979).

Another crucial discovery were the restriction enzymes which allowed molecular geneticists to cut and splice DNA molecules at will and reintroduce them into living cells, allowing molecular geneticists to perform site-directed mutagenesis or “reverse genetics”. This led to the advent of recombinant DNA technology and gene sequencing in the 1970s, which completed the transformation from classical to molecular genetics. Thus, genetics has gradually moved from crossing fruit flies to manipulating DNA molecules.

4.2 The collinearity of genetic maps and DNA molecules as an investigative bridge principle

The success of molecular genetics is essentially due to the fact that it was able to harness the investigative approach of classical genetics by retooling it in order to study molecules. But how was this possible? A crucial step was the realization that the original genetic map can be seen as a linear representation of the chromosome and of the genomic DNA molecule. Thus, it became possible to use the techniques of classical genetics to manipulate and hence to study specific DNA regions. For example, around 1955 Seymour Benzer used classical genetic mapping on the bacteriophage T4 (which can also be present in a cell in multiple copies and hence show recombination) to identify two functional regions or “cistrons” on the phage DNA (Benzer 1955), regions that were later shown to encode two polypeptides. To give another example, in 1959 Arthur Pardee, François Jacob and Jacques Monod used classical genetic mapping in their groundbreaking work on gene regulation in the E. coli lac operon, which controls the synthesis of a number of enzymes needed to take up and metabolize the sugar lactose (Pardee et al. 1959). Finally, in 1964 Charles Yanofsky and Co-workers demonstrated the collinearity of fine-structure maps of the E.coli tryptophane A gene, needed to synthetize the amino acid tryptophane, and the amino acid sequence of its encoded protein tryptophane synthase (Yanofsky et al. 1964). This was an important puzzle piece in the emergence of the basic theory of molecular genetics, according to which DNA sequences determine the amino acid sequences of proteins.

The collinearity of genetic maps and DNA was thus an enabling condition for the success of molecular genetics (Weber 1998). It should be noted that it is not a theoretical postulate, nor a part of a mechanism, nor is it a bridge principle in Nagel’s classic sense, connecting theoretical terms from two distinct scientific theories. It is rather a principle that allowed geneticists to extend the investigative approach of classical genetics to molecular entities. We might call it an investigative bridge principle. Its role is not to derive the laws of a theory to be reduced, as in Nagel’s account of reduction, but to design experiments and interpret their results.

4.3 Is there a coherent molecular gene concept?

Most authors involved in the reduction debate reviewed in Section 3 assumed that there are two well-defined concepts of the gene, the classical and the molecular gene concept. The debate was mainly about their relation and the implications for theory reduction. This changed in the wake of genomics and the explosion of new information about the complexities of gene structure and regulation. Some biologists and philosophers began to doubt if there really is a coherent molecular gene concept.

While the classical gene concept implied nothing about chemical constitution, it is a hallmark of molecular genetics that genes came to be conceived as DNA sequences. Historically, this transition involved several steps, one of which being the recognition of the collinearity of genetic maps and DNA molecules mentioned in the previous section. There was also substantial continuity at the level of experimental practice. Some of the first eukaryotic molecular genes were identified as chromosomal locations that had previously been mapped by classical techniques (Weber 2005). Weber (2023) argues that the classical gene concept was an operational concept that was used for experimentally identifying molecular genes. Thus, both classical and molecular concepts of the gene continue to coexist in contemporary biology. The extent in which they are co-extensive has been debated (Weber 2005, Brigandt 2010, Baetu 2010).

While the rediscovery of genes at the molecular level is widely seen as one of the great success stories of 20^th Century science, some philosophers and a few biologists have argued that genes cannot be conceived at the molecular level. Of course, they do not deny that molecular geneticists use the term gene, but many philosophers believe gene is a dummy term, a placeholder for many different concepts. Different responses to gene skepticism illustrate a variety of philosophical aims and approaches. One kind of response is to analyze explanations closely tied to experimental practice (rather than sweeping generalizations of a fundamental theory) in order to determine whether there are uniform patterns of reasoning about genes that could (a) be codified into clear concepts, and/or (b) used to establish the reference of the term. A second approach is to propose new gene concepts that will better serve the expressed aims of practicing biologists. A third kind of response is to embrace the (allegedly) necessary vagueness of the gene concept(s) and to examine why use of the term gene is so useful. A fourth kind of response is to implement survey analysis, rather than conduct traditional methods of philosophical analysis (Stotz et al. 2004). We will focus here on the first three responses.

Gene skeptics claim that there is no coherence to the way gene is used at the molecular level and that this term does not designate a natural kind; rather, gene is allegedly used to pick out many different kinds of units in DNA. DNA consists of “coding” regions that are transcribed into RNA, different kinds of regulatory regions, and in higher organisms, a number of regions whose functions are less clear and perhaps in cases non-existent. Skepticism about genes is based in part on the idea that the term is sometimes applied to only parts of a coding region, sometimes to an entire coding region, sometimes to parts of a coding region and to regions that regulate that coding region, and sometimes to an entire coding region and regulatory regions affecting or potentially affecting the transcription of the coding region. Skeptics (e.g., Burian 1986, Portin 1993, and Kitcher 1992) have concluded, as Kitcher succinctly puts it: “a gene is whatever a competent biologist chooses to call a gene” (Kitcher 1992, p. 131).

Biological textbooks contain definitions of the term “gene” and it is instructive to consider one in order to show that the conceptual situation is indeed unsettling. The most prevalent contemporary definition is that a gene is the fundamental unit that codes for a polypeptide. One problem with this definition is that it excludes many segments that are typically referred to as genes. Some DNA segments code for functional RNA molecules that are never translated into polypeptides. Such RNA molecules include transfer RNA, ribosomal RNA, and RNA molecules that play regulatory and catalytic roles. Hence, this definition is too narrow.

Another problem with this common definition is that it is based on an overly simplistic account of DNA expression. According to this simple account, a gene is a sequence of nucleotides in DNA that is transcribed into a sequence of nucleotides making up a messenger RNA molecule that is in turn translated into sequence of amino acids that forms a polypeptide. (Biologists talk as if genes “produce the polypeptide molecules” or “provide the information for the polypeptide”.) The real situation of DNA expression, however, is often far more complex. For example, in plants and animals, many mRNA molecules are processed before they are translated into polypeptides. In these cases, portions of the RNA molecule, called introns, are snipped out and the remaining segments, called exons, are spliced together before the RNA molecule leaves the cellular nucleus. Sometimes biologists call the entire DNA region, that is the region that corresponds to both introns and exons, the gene. Other times, they call only the portions of the DNA segment corresponding to the exons the gene. (This means that some DNA segments that geneticists call genes are not continuous segments of DNA; they are collections of discontinuous exons. Geneticists call these split genes.)

Further complications arise because the splicing of exons in some cases is executed differentially in different tissue types and at different developmental stages. (This means that there are overlapping genes.) The problem with the common definition that genes are DNA segments that “code for polypeptides” is that the notion of “coding for a polypeptide” is ambiguous when it comes to actual complications of DNA expression. Gene skeptics argue that it is hopelessly ambiguous (Burian 1986, Fogle 1990 and 2000, Kitcher 1992, and Portin 1993).

Clearly, this definition, which is the most common and prominent textbook definition, is too narrow to be applied to the range of segments that geneticists commonly call genes and too ambiguous to provide a single, precise partition of DNA into separate genes. Textbooks include many definitions of the gene. In fact, philosophers have often been frustrated by the tendency of biologists to define and use the term gene in a number of contradictory ways in one and the same textbook. After subjecting the alternative definitions to philosophical scrutiny, gene skeptics have concluded that the problem isn’t simply a lack of analytical rigor. The problem is that there simply is no such thing as a gene at the molecular level. That is, there is no single, uniform, and unambiguous way to divide a DNA molecule into different genes. Gene skeptics have often argued that biologists should couch their science in terms of DNA segments such exon, intron, promotor region, and so on, and dispense with the term gene altogether (most forcefully argued by Fogle 2000).

In a somewhat similar vein, albeit without Fogle’s eliminative push, Griffiths and Stotz (2006) have suggested that in the postgenomic era, genes should be thought of as “things an organism can do with its genome”, thus emphasizing the flexibility in the ways in which a cell can use various resources including DNA sequences to piece together numerous different gene products.

An analysis of gene concepts in practice (Waters 1994, 2000, 2018) can be used to show, against gene skepticism and in spite of flexibility, that biologists do have a coherent, precise, and uniform way to conceive of genes at the molecular level. The molecular gene concept stems from the idea that genes are units in DNA that function to determine linear sequences in molecules synthesized via DNA expression. Perhaps the reason gene skeptics overlooked the molecular gene concept is that they were searching for the wrong kind of concept. The concept is not a purely physicochemical concept, and it does not provide a single partition of DNA into separate genes. Instead, it is a functional concept that provides a uniform way to think about genes that can be applied to pick out different DNA segments in different investigative or explanatory contexts.

The basic molecular concept, according to this analysis, is the concept of a gene for a linear sequence in a product of DNA expression:

A gene g for linear sequence l in product p synthesized in cellular context c is a potentially replicating nucleotide sequence, n, usually contained in DNA, that determines the linear sequence l in product p at some stage of DNA expression. (Waters 2000)

The concept of the molecular gene can be presented as a 4-tuple: ⟨n, l, p, c⟩. This analysis shows how geneticists can consistently include introns as part of a gene in one epistemic context and not in another. If the context involves identifying a gene for a primary, preprocessed RNA molecule, then the gene includes the introns as well as the exons. If the context involves identifying the gene for the resulting polypeptide, then the gene includes only the exons. Hence, in the case of DNA expression that eventually leads to the synthesis of a given polypeptide, geneticists might talk as if “the” gene included the intron (in which case they would be referring to the gene for the primary, preprocessed RNA) and yet also talk as if “the” gene excluded the introns (in which case they would be referring to the gene for the mature RNA or polypeptide). Application of the molecular gene concept is not ambiguous; in fact, it is remarkably precise provided one specifies the values for the variables in the expression “gene for linear sequence l in product p synthesized in cellular context c.”

Gene skeptics have suggested that there is a lack of coherence in gene talk because biologists often talk as if genes code for polypeptides, but then turn around and talk about genes for RNA molecules that are not translated into polypeptides (including genes for RNA [tRNA], ribosomal RNA [rRNA], and interference RNA [iRNA]). This account shows that conceiving of genes for rRNA involves the same idea as conceiving of genes for polypeptides. In both cases, the gene is the segment of DNA, split or not, that determines the linear sequence in the molecule of interest.

Neumann-Held (2001) proposed an alternative way to think about genes in the context of developmental genetics. She says that in this context, interest in genes is largely focused on the regulated expression of polypeptides. She notes that textbook definitions of gene often acknowledge this interest and quotes the following definition from a scientific textbook:

A combination of DNA segments that together constitute an expressible unit, expression leading the formation of one or more specific functional gene products that may lead to either RNA molecules or polypeptides. The segments of a gene include (1) the transcribed unit … and any regulatory segments included in the transcription unit, and (2) the regulatory sequences that flank the transcription unit and are required for specific expression. (Singer and Berg 1991, p. 41, cited in Neumann-Held 2001)

This definition emphasizes that regulatory sequences as well as coding regions are required for “specific expression.” Only a small proportion of coding sequences are transcribed in a given cell at a particular time, and whether a particular sequence is transcribed depends in part on regulatory regions external to the coding region.

Neumann-Held points out that if the aim is to specify what is necessary for regulated synthesis of polypeptides, then one must include even more than what is located in the DNA. This follows from the fact that processes such as differential splicing (and RNA editing processes such as methylation that I have not discussed in this article) involve entities outside of DNA such as splicing agents. She suggests that it is appropriate, at least in the context of developmental genetics, to reconceive genes as processes. She proposes the following process molecular gene concept.

“Gene” is the process (i.e., the course of events) that binds together DNA and all other relevant non-DNA entities in the production of a particular polypeptide. The term gene in this sense stands for processes which are specified by (1) the specific interactions between specific DNA segments and specific non-DNA located entities, (2) specific processing mechanisms of resulting mRNA’s in interactions with additional non-DNA located entities. (Neumann-Held 2001, p. 74)

Neumann-Held argues that this conception provides the clearest basis for understanding how DNA sequences are “used in the processes of polypeptide production.” She points out that the process molecular gene concept allows for the inclusion of coding sequences in DNA, regulatory sequences in DNA and also entities not located in DNA, all of which are causally involved in the production of polypeptides. Neumann-Held’s concept excludes transcription processes and coding regions of DNA that lead to functional RNA molecules that are not translated into polypeptides. Hence, according to her account, there are not process molecular genes for tRNA (transfer RNA), rRNA (ribosomal RNA) or snRNA (small nuclear RNA). This feature of Neumann-Held’s definition does not match the textbook definition that she quotes to motivate her account (presented above). Furthermore, the exclusion of these coding regions does not track with recent discoveries about the important functions played by non-coding RNA molecules such as snRNAs. Her definition could easily be revised to accommodate these regions and processes. In any case, Neumann-Held believes using this concept in developmental genetics, rather than DNA-centered gene concepts, will help avoid the view that “genes are the most important explanatory factors in biology because of their unique causal powers” (Neumann-Held 2001, p. 80).

With somewhat similar intentions, Baetu (2011) has defended a syntax-based conception. On his view, genes are defined by certain sets of conserved DNA sequences (not necessarily contiguous), that control transcription (RNA synthesis) and translation (protein synthesis). He also likens them to “subroutines” in computer programs that are run each time a transcription even occurs. Genes may overlap, such that each possible transcript that can be made corresponds to a different gene.

4.4 Pragmatic accounts of the molecular gene concept

Keller’s (2000) account of the history of twentieth century genetics seems to reinforce gene skepticism. For example, she argues that the question about what genes are for has become increasingly difficult to answer (Keller 2000). By the end of the twentieth century, she says, biological findings have revealed a complexity of developmental dynamics that make it impossible to conceive of genes as distinct causal agents in development. Keller emphasizes that words have power and devotes a good deal of attention to the way loose gene talk has affected biological research by reinforcing the assumption that the gene is “the core explanatory concept of biological structure and function” (Keller 2000, p. 9), an assumption with which she strongly disagrees. Yet Keller does not endorse the view of gene skeptics who argue that biology would be improved if biologists stopped talking about “genes” and restricted themselves to terms designating molecular units such as nucleotide, codon, coding region, promotor region, and so on. Keller maintains that the term gene continues to have “obvious and undeniable uses.”

One use of the term gene, according to Keller, is that its vagueness, the very feature that troubles philosophers, makes it possible for biologists to be flexible, to communicate across disciplinary boundaries, and to think in new ways:

The meaning of an experimental effect depends on its relation to other effects, and the use of language too closely tied to particular experimental practices would, by its very specificity, render communication across difference experimental contexts effectively impossible. (Keller 2000, p. 140)

Keller identifies a second reason that gene talk is useful. The term gene applies to entities that can be experimentally manipulated to produce definite and reproducible effects (though given Keller’s criticism of gene concepts, it is unclear to what entities she thinks the term refers). She suggests that genes are short-term causes. She points out, however, that this does not mean genes are long-term causes or that genes are the fundamental causal agents of development. Rather, what it means (and Keller thinks this is an important reason why gene talk will continue) is that genes can be used as handles to manipulate biological processes. And for these two reasons, Keller concludes, gene talk will and should continue to play an important role in biological discourse.

Another version of the pragmatic approach can be found in (Waters 2018). Based on his earlier analysis reviewed above, he suggests that there are multiple ways of individuating molecular genes depending on what stage of gene expression biologists are looking at, which depends on the explanatory, investigative and technological context. Thus, the term “gene” is indexical: “DNA segments are not simply genes, they are genes for sequences at some stage of genetic expression in a particular cellular context”. As a result, “the division of DNA sequences into molecular genes is a complicated mess” (Waters 2018). But this flexibility of molecular gene individuation is purposeful: It ensures that the linear structure of a bewildering diversity of linear biomolecules can be explained by appealing to molecular genes. However, Waters stresses that such explanations are very limited or partial. To be precise, gene sequences merely act as actual-difference making causes (Waters 2007) in specific populations of linear biomolecules (e.g., primary transcripts, mRNA, polypeptides). These are causes that exhibit actual variation in a population such that this variation accounts for the variation in another feature. Thus, gene sequence variation merely explains why some other linear biomolecules (e.g., primary transcripts, spliced mRNAs, polypeptides) differ in sequence. These explanations abstract away from the zillions of other causes that must be present in cell for the processes of transcription and protein synthesis to operate. They also abstract away from the temporal dynamics of these biosynthetic processes, as the regulation of gene expression involves complex interactions between numerous DNA-binding proteins and extragenic DNA regions (e.g., enhancers, silencers). Thus, molecular genes do have explanatory import, albeit but a very limited one. They leave a “vast explanatory void” (Waters 2018).

Individuating genes in this way also serves other purposes, including prediction and experimental intervention. The former often occur in experimental contexts. E.g., the sequence of a mutant protein made by a genetically manipulated organism can be predicted from the DNA sequence introduced into the organism’s nuclear DNA. This predictive use of individuating molecular genes also points to another important purpose: Genic DNA sequences serve as important targets for experimental interventions aimed at unraveling molecular mechanisms and processes. With respect to this purpose, the molecular gene concept is much less limited than in its explanatory uses in RNA and polypeptide synthesis.

5. The Quest for a Fundamental Theory

5.1 Distinguishing between basic and fundamental theories

The modest answer to the question ‘What do genes do?’ is that they “code for” or “determine” the linear sequences in RNA molecules and polypeptides synthesized in the cell. (As we have seen in Section 4.3, even this modest answer needs to be qualified because RNA molecules are often spliced and edited in ways that affect the linear sequence of amino acids in the eventual polypeptide product).

But biologists have offered a far less modest answer as well. The bolder answer is part of a sweeping, fundamental theory. According to this theory, genes are “fundamental” entities that “direct” the development and functioning of organisms by “encoding” proteins that in turn regulate all the important cellular processes. It is often claimed that genes provide “the information”, “the blueprint”, or “the program” for an organism (e.g., Bonner 1965, Jacob and Monod 1961, Mayr 1961, Maynard Smith 2000, Rosenberg 2006). The pioneering molecular geneticist Max Delbrück has even likened the genetic information stored in DNA to Aristotle’s concept of form, while the rest of the cell provides merely matter (Delbrück 1971). Although the idea that the chromosomes contain a “code-script” for the development and functioning of an organism was famously expressed by Schrödinger (1944) before the era of molecular genetics, today it is often expressed in explicitly molecular terms. It is useful to distinguish this sweeping, fundamental theory about the allegedly fundamental role of genes from the modest, basic theory about what genes do with respect to the synthesis of RNA and polypeptides. These two theories are not always clearly distinguished when molecular genetics is being criticized for using intentional metaphors such as “coding”, “information”, or “instruction”, or for unduly privileging genes and DNA while neglecting extragenic causes of development.

5.2 The tenability of the fundamental theory

The concept of genetic information has a prominent place in the history of molecular genetics, beginning with Watson and Crick’s observation that since any sequence of nucleotide base pairs could fit into the structure of any DNA molecule “that in a long molecule many different permutations are possible, and it therefore seems likely that the precise sequence of the bases is the code which carries the genetic information.” (Watson and Crick 1953). As Downes (2005) recounts, the geneticists Jacob and Monod reinforced the use of information language as did those who sought to crack the “genetic code”. By the early 1960s, the language of information was well-entrenched in the field of molecular genetics. For instance, Francis Crick’s (1970) “Central Dogma of molecular biology” was framed in terms of information transfer from DNA to RNA to protein but not in the reverse direction (Weber 2006). Crick’s “Central Dogma” expresses an early version of the basic theory that has been modified considerably since its first formulations.

Philosophers have generally criticized the theory that genes and DNA provide all the information and have challenged the use of sweeping metaphors such as “master plan” and “program” which suggest that genes and DNA contain all developmental information (e.g., Oyama 2000, Griffiths and Gray 2005, Oyama et al. 2001, Moss 2003, Robert 2004). Critics have taken a number of different positions (see also the entry on biological information). Most seem to accept the notion that biological systems or processes contain information, but they deny the idea that DNA has an exceptional role in providing information. Some are content to argue that under various existing theories of information, such as causal theories or standard teleosemantic theories, information is not restricted to DNA. But others contend that understanding what genes do requires a new conception of biological information. One approach is to retreat to a narrow conception of coding specifically aimed at clarifying the sense in which DNA provides information for the synthesis of polypeptides, but not for higher-level traits (e.g. Godfrey-Smith 2000). Another approach is to construct a new, broad conception of biological information and use this conception to show that the informational role of genes is not exclusive (Jablonka 2002, Griffiths and Stotz 2013, Griffiths et al. 2015, Planer 2014).

A different approach is to abandon information talk altogether and explain the investigative and explanatory reasoning associated with molecular genetics in purely causal terms. Several philosophers have developed such accounts, e.g., Waters (2007), Woodward (2010), Stegmann (2014), Weber (2006, 2017), Franklin-Hall (2015). The goal of these attempts is to show that, while many causal factors contribute to the synthesis of RNAs and proteins, the genes play some unique causal role. Woodward (2010) suggested that this role may be characterized by the notion of causal specificity. Specific causal variables are such that they can take many different values (e.g., distinct DNA sequences) and there is a bijective or near-bijective mapping to the values of the effect variable (e.g., RNA or protein sequences). Waters (2007) argued that the genes’ causal role is characterized by a combination of causal specificity and being the actual-difference makers in a cell’s population of RNAs or proteins. Weber (2006) suggested that causal specificity comes in degrees and Griffiths et al. (2015) suggested a way of measuring it. Stegmann (2014) analyses the role of genes in terms of external causal ordering. Weber (2017) argues that genes are the causally most specific causes of RNA and protein sequences when causal specificity is taken in Woodward’s (2010) original sense (not in Griffiths et al.’s informational sense) and restricted to biologically normal variation. Bourrat (2019) and Ferreira Ruiz (2021) criticize that the notion of causal specificity has been used ambiguously in this debate and present additional clarifications. Franklin-Hall (2015) argues that considerations of explanatory economy support a focus on genes in some contexts but not in others.

In any case, what these attempts accomplish, if they succeed at all, is to explicate the basic theory in causal terms. Because their intended scope is only the basic theory’s claim of differential sequence determination of linear biomolecules and not the regulation of gene expression, considerations about causal specificity etc. cannot support the gene-centric fundamental theory (see Section 4.4). Thus, accepting a unique causal role for genes in differential sequence determination does not commit us to accepting the gene-centric fundamental theory, which seems to be the main target of some influential critiques of gene-centrism (Oyama 2000, Moss 2003, Griffiths and Gray 2005, Robert 2004, Vecchi 2020).

5.3 Developmentalist alternatives

Several philosophers and some biologists have set out to replace the fundamental theory associated with molecular genetics with a new fundamental theory that does not “privilege” the gene. Among the proposals is Robert’s (2004). Drawing upon the writings of Burian, Griffiths, Keller, Oyama, Moss, and others, Robert tries to construct a new “framework for understanding and explaining organismal development” (p. 78) that does not reduce “the problem of development” to the problem of gene action and gene activation. He seeks a framework that is free from the alleged assumption that development involves the expression of “preformed genetic information” (p. 56). Robert says that his framework focuses on organisms rather than genes and that it “takes seriously” the dynamical complexities of development emphasized by Keller.

While some scientists have endorsed such theories or presented their own attempts at an alternative fundamental theory (e.g., Gottlieb 2007), the existing alternatives have not (yet) made it into standard molecular genetics textbooks. A possible explanation has been suggested by the biologist Günter Wagner:

Robert and his colleagues who argue for a similar interpretation are correct in that the genes alone cannot make an organism and instead are embedded in a large network of causal interactions. But scientists are usually not interested in general statements about what in principle is required to understand a phenomenon. Yes, scientists make pragmatic decision about what to study, but I think that these decisions are anything but arbitrary. The power of molecular genetic approaches did not come easily, rather it is the result of a long history of strenuous research based on a vision that derived from the work of Richard Goldschmidt, Alfred Kühn, and Thomas Hunt Morgan early in the 20th Century. It is thus not intellectual laziness that drives the genetic research program; instead we are raking in the spoils of a hard-won victory over biological complexity. (Wagner 2004, p. 1405)

Wagner’s comment suggests that the reason why so much biological research has been and continues to be focused on genes is not (or not only) the acceptance of a gene-centric fundamental theory by practicing scientists. Rather, it is the possibility to use genes as tools for the experimental study of numerous biological processes instead of an alleged fundamental role in directing or programming all life processes that explains this focus (Schaffner 1998, Keller 2000, Waters 2006, Weber 2022). This view is also in line with the experimental practice-oriented approach outlined in Section 4.1. According to this approach, no fundamental theory, gene-centric or not, is actively involved in the geneticist’s epistemic labor, in contrast to what we call the basic theory.

5.4 The limits of generalization

A deeper reason for thinking that there might only be a modest, basic theory but no fundamental theory that is empirically confirmed has been proposed by Waters (2017). He contends that the world contains many structures like dispersed nucleotide sequences that map onto some parts of a protein in a piecemeal fashion, but no general structure. On this view, the world may simply not be such that it can be represented by fundamental theories. Baxter (2023) argues that Waters doesn’t go far enough in thinking that the world has at least enough structure for a coherent molecular gene concept (see also Sections 4.3 and 4.4).

Thus, it might be suggested that the role of fundamental theory in molecular genetics (and perhaps also more broadly in molecular biology) is more social or “Latourian” than epistemic. On this view, it serves mainly to provide a platform for rallying the troops and bringing resources to research endeavors (Latour 1987, Latour 1988). A different, but related framing considers the gene-centric fundamental theory as a kind of marketing hype that draws limited resources away from alternative genetic approaches (Radick 2023).

It is widely agreed that there are limits to gene-centric approaches. Sultan et al. (2021) identify three areas in which gene-focused biology has been less than successful. First, the attempt to identify DNA sequences associated with phenotypic variation in humans via genome-wide association studies (GWAS) has turned out surprisingly few DNA regions associated with the susceptibility of diseases (see also Kampourakis 2022). While such regions exist, they appear to be special cases. The prevalence of conditions such as obesity, type 2 diabetes, asthma, chronic inflammatory diseases and many more cannot be explained by DNA sequence variation. More precisely, genetic regions identified by GAWS in these cases account only for a small fraction (less than 10%) of the phenotypic variation. Sultan et al. explain this by the “failure to consider the physiological and environmental context of gene expression and how the developmental response systems of organisms contextually modulate phenotypes.” Second, the ability of GWAS to explain parent-offspring resemblance in humans also appears to be modest, which is in part due to maternally and paternally inherited epigenetic modifications (i.e., effects mediated by chemical modifications of the germline DNA and some of its accessory proteins). Third, major evolutionary innovations such as the vertebrate eye or insect wings seem to have occurred without the evolution of any novel genes or even novel gene regulatory networks, just by exploiting existing developmental pathways.

All this may seem embarrassing for an endeavor that is sometimes (inadequately) defined as the “science of inheritance”, but it should be noted that these findings are only embarrassing for the fundamental theory, not what we call the basic theory of molecular genetics. The latter only contains an account of DNA sequence inheritance and of the basic mechanisms explaining how DNA sequence translates into RNA and protein sequence. It makes no general predictions about trait inheritance. What molecular genetics does provide is some of the experimental tools for learning about mechanisms of trait inheritance, which vary between traits and organisms. It is in part due to these molecular tools that we know about the messiness of genotype-phenotype relations.

6. Conclusion

The philosophy of molecular genetics is a lively area of research that reflects much of the excitement and diversity in contemporary philosophy of science. Philosophers examining the related areas of genetics have different philosophical interests and adopt contrasting approaches. Some philosophical research is aimed at setting science straight while other research is aimed at correcting our understanding of science. Some philosophers employ traditional methods of philosophy of science, for example the analyses of concepts and models, while others are pioneering new philosophical approaches by drawing upon methods from social science including survey studies. While some philosophers focus their attention on fundamental theorizing, others are investigating the dynamics of empirical investigation. Research in the philosophy of molecular genetics is also generating new ideas about basic concepts of general philosophical interest including reductionism, information, and causation, as well as about metaphysical issues.

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As of the 2026 update, Marcel Weber has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.