Mysticism

First published Thu Nov 11, 2004; substantive revision Fri Sep 4, 2026

Under the influence of William James’ Varieties of Religious Experience, philosophical interest in mysticism has primarily focused on distinctive, allegedly knowledge-giving “mystical experiences.” Philosophers have dealt with such topics as the classification of mystical experiences, their nature, to what extent mystical experiences are conditioned by a mystic’s language and culture, and whether mystical experiences furnish evidence for the truth of mystical claims. Some scholars have questioned the emphasis on experience in favor of examining broader mystical phenomena. Indeed, “mysticism” is best thought of, not as simply a matter of exotic experiences, but as a constellation of distinctive practices, discourses, texts, institutions, traditions, and experiences aimed at human transformation, variously defined. But this entry will concentrate on the topics philosophers have discussed concerning mystical experiences as limited mental events and continuing states of consciousness.

1. Mystical Experiences

Because of its variable meanings, any definition of “mystical experience” must be partly stipulative. It is common among philosophers to refer to “mystical experience” in a narrow sense: a purportedly nonsensory or extrovertive unitive realization of realities or states of affairs that is of a kind not accessible by way of conventional types of experience or standard introspection. A unitive experience involves the eradication of a sense of multiple discrete entities, including a separate experiencing subject. The cognitive significance of the experience is deemed to lie precisely in that phenomenological feature. The experiences can be considered “nondual” since the knowing subject and known reality are not distinguished in the act of knowing. Examples are experiences of “union with God,” the realization that one is identical to the being shared with God or that one is identical to the Brahman of Advaita Vedanta, experiencing a oneness to all of nature, and the Buddhist unconstructed extrovertive experience devoid of a sense of any multiplicity of realities (see Smart 1958 and 1978; Wainwright 1981, chap. 1). However, as discussed in Section 2.2, few classical mystics refer to their experiences as the union of two realities: there is no literal “merging” or “absorption” of one reality into another resulting in only one entity. Thus, the narrow definition excludes, for example, experiences of “communion” with God in which the subject and God remain ontologically distinct, even if there is a lessening of boundaries, or a Jewish Kabbalistic experience of a single supernal sefirah.

A more inclusive definition of “mystical experience” is:

A purportedly nonsensory awareness or an unstructured sensory experience realizing realities or states of affairs that are not accessible by way of ordinary types of subject/object awareness.

“Experience,” “consciousness,” and “awareness” are notoriously difficult to define and will be left unanalyzed here, but the other key terms in the definition can be understood as follows:

  1. “Purportedly” allows the definition to be accepted without necessarily accepting that mystics ever really do experience realities or states of affairs in the way they described.

  2. “Nonsenory awareness” includes content of a kind not appropriate to sense-perception, somatosensory modalities, or standard introspection. Some mystics have referred to a distinct “spiritual” means of knowing appropriate only to a non-physical realm (nous, intellectus, buddhi).

  3. “Nonstructured sensory experience” consists of phenomenological sensory content but lacks the conceptualization normally structuring sense-perception. A super sense-perceptual mode of experience may accompany sense-perception as in the cases of “nature mysticism” or “cosmic consciousness”, as when a person has an awareness of God being present in nature. Buddhist mindfulness can also lead to structureless perceptions.

  4. “Realizing” realities in mystical experiences means the subject is purportedly aware of one or more realities in a way that overcomes the normal subject/object duality. The “acquaintance” is “knowledge by participation” or “knowledge by identity” rather than ordinary “knowledge by acquaintance” — the distinction of knower and known fades or disappears completely. Mystical experiences are allegedly “direct” or “unmediated” insights in that sense.

  5. “States of affairs” include the impermanence of phenomenal reality and that God is the ground of the self. “Realizing” states of affairs comes in two forms. In one, a subject is aware of realities on which (one or more) states of affairs supervene. An example would be an awareness of God (a reality) affording an awareness of one’s utter dependence on God (a state of affairs). In its second form, realizing states of affairs involves an insight directly into a reality. An example is coming to “see” the impermanence of all that exists in the phenomenal world.

Hereafter, “mystical experience” will be used in the broader sense, not merely for absolutely unitive experiences. Correspondingly, the term “mysticism” will refer to practices, discourse, texts, institutions, and traditions associated with these experiences. The definition excludes paranormal experiences such as visions, voices, out-of-body experiences, and powers such as telepathy. All of these are “dualistic” experiences of objects or qualities that are accessible to the senses or to ordinary introspection.

Mystical experiences occur within all world religions and probably all primal religions. In some traditions, the experiences are allegedly of a supersensory reality, such as God or Brahman. Many Buddhist traditions, however, make no claim for an experience of a supersensory reality but instead cultivate an experience of “unconstructed awareness” involving an awareness of the world on a nonconceptual level (Griffiths 1993). The nonconceptual experience is thought to grant knowledge of the true nature of phenomenal reality, such as the impermanent and conditioned nature of all things. Prajnaparamita and Madhyamaka Buddhists refer to this as the experience of the “thusness” (tathata) or “thatness” (tattva) of reality that is accessible only in the absence of ordinary sense-perceptual cognition that is structured by cultural conceptions.

It should be emphasized that classical mysticism is a matter of practices and ways of life, not episodic experiences. The goal is to transform one’s inner life in line with an ultimate reality, not to acquire pure consciousness or exotic experiences, no matter how cognitive. Classical mystics value achieving enduring states of consciousness over transient experiences. In particular, they value the personal transformation leading to the enlightened state free of a sense of a phenomenal “self” in which they are aligned with the way things really are (as defined by their tradition).

Care should also be taken not to confuse “mystical experience” with “religious experience.” The latter refers to any experience having significance appropriate to a religious context. (See the entry on “Religious Experiences.”) “Secular” mysticism is also possible (see Section 10).

2. Classifying Mystical Experiences

Mystical experiences can be classified through various dichotomies (see Wainwright 1981, 33–40 and Jones 2016, 31–34 for detailed typologies). The most common are these:

2.1 Extrovertive and Introvertive

Walter Stace (1960) fixed the distinction between “extrovertive” and “introvertive” mystical experiences in philosophy of mysticism. When an experience includes sense-perception, it is an “extrovertive” experience. Mystical extrovertive experiences include consciousness of the unity of nature overlaid onto one’s sense-perception of the world, as well as extrovertive experiences such as “cosmic consciousness” (Bucke 1901). When not extrovertive, an experience is “introvertive.” Examples include the experience of “nothingness” — an awareness lacking all differentiated content — and an awareness lacking sense-experiences of God.

Extrovertive mystical experiences are not merely stunted introvertive ones but complete experiences in their own right (see Jones 2016; contra Stace 1960). Paul Marshall (2005) has developed a detailed phenomenology of these experiences.

2.2 Dualistic and Monistic

A favorite distinction of Western philosophers is between “dualistic” and “monistic” experiences. A dualistic experience maintains some distinction, however tenuous, between the subject and what is disclosed while the two seem connected. Thus, theistic mystical experiences typically are dualistic, retaining, at some level, an ontological distinction between God and the mystic. Monistic experiences are the extreme of unitive experiences in that they dissolve all duality (Merkur 1999). They are either experiences of the absolute ontological oneness of everything, free of our conceptual distinctions, or “pure consciousness” experiences free of all differentiated content including any sense of an experiencing self or experienced object. Experiences may also be “nondual” in the Advaitic sense of there being in fact only one reality, not a duality of realities. Or there may be a pluralism of distinct transcendent souls as with Samkhya-Yoga and Jaina’s “purushas.”

2.2.1 Union with God

Classical mystics did not usually speak of a true “union with God.” Few Christians used the term “unio mystica” before the modern era (McGinn 2001, 132; Jantzen 1995). Only in the modern study of mysticism has unio mystica received a central place (McGinn 2006, 427). When Abrahamic mystics do use the language of union, it involves a falling away of the separation between a person and God short of identity: the idea is more of “communion” with God than union. “Deification” means becoming as God-like as humanly possible. All mystical experiences involve overcoming a sense of “self,” but usually not a sense of becoming another reality. In theisms, this is an alignment of spirits or a sense of communing with God, not an ontological union of different substances that were once distinct — the self/soul is not identical with God.

Christian mystics used various metaphors (see Pike 1992, chap. 2). Jan van Ruysbroeck (1293–1381) described union as “iron within the fire and the fire within the iron.”. A “spiritual marriage” of the soul (the bride) and Christ (the bridegroom) is common. Bernard of Clairvaux (1090–1153) described unification as “mutuality of love.” Overall, classical Christian mystics usually treated “becoming one with God” as a loving union of wills with God’s or even a fusion of the mind with God’s (McGinn 2006, 427–429). Medieval Christian mystics generally interpreted the biblical claim that “it is no longer I who lives but Christ who lives in me” (Galatians 2:20) to mean the Holy Spirit was filling their mind or spirit resulting in a complete alignment of one’s will with God’s.

In Sufism, when one’s sense of self passes away (fana), one is filled with the presence of Allah (baqa), although the orthodox Sufis insist that the soul does not cease to exist but only that one is unaware of it in the blinding light of the presence of Allah (Schimmel 1975).

2.2.2 Identity with God

Theistic mystics sometimes speak as though they have the awareness of being fully absorbed into God or even becoming identical to God. Examples are the Islamic Sufi mystic al-Husayn al-Hallaj (858–922) proclaiming “I am the Real” (see Schimmel 1975, chap. 2) and the Jewish Kabbalist Isaac of Acre (b. 1291?) who wrote of the soul being completely absorbed into God “as a jug of water into a running well” (Idel 1988, 67). The Hasidic master Rabbi Shneur Zalman of Liadi (1745–1812) wrote of a person as a drop of water in the ocean of the Infinite with an illusory sense of individual “dropness.” The Christian mystic Meister Eckhart (c. 1260–1327/8) claimed that we and God share the same being (esse) supplied by a transcendent Godhead (Eckhart 2009, 109). It is still controversial, however, as to when such declarations are to be taken as assertions of true identity and when they are hyperbolic variations on descriptions of communion-type experiences.

Shankara’s Advaita Vedanta gives a nontheistic example: our essence (atman) is identical to the only reality there is (Brahman) — there is a nonduality (a-dvaita) of all essences. Our essence does not become united to or absorbed into Brahman since there was only one reality all along. The popular image of a drop of water merging in a jar of water and losing its identity does not fit Shankara’s metaphysics. In fact, he explicitly rejected that image (Brahma-sutra-bhashya 3.2.9; also see 1.4.22) and employed a competing image: all of reality (Brahman) is contained in its entirety in each part of the phenomenal world just as the entire sun is reflected in its entirety in each ripple on a pond (ibid., 3.2.18–20).

2.3 Theurgic and Non-Theurgic Mysticism

In theurgic (from the Greek “theourgia”) mysticism a mystic intends to activate the divine (e.g., God’s grace) in a mystical experience (Shaw 1995, 4). Nonetheless, theistic mystics typically claim that experiences of God’s activity do not result from their own endeavors. And most mystical traditions do not involve theurgic activity. The Jewish Kabbalah is the most prominent form of theurgic mysticism. In it, the mystic aims to bring about a modification in the inner life of the Godhead (see Idel 1988).

2.4 Apophatic and Kataphatic Mysticism

Apophatic mysticism (from the Greek “apophasis,” meaning negation or “saying away”) is contrasted with kataphatic mysticism (from the Greek “kataphasis,” meaning affirmation or “saying with”). Apophatic mystics claim that nothing positive can be said about objects or states of affairs that they experience. These are absolutely indescribable or “ineffable.” Thus, apophatic theology typically will be negative theology. Kataphatic mystics make claims about what a mystic experiences. Pertaining to God, this means that God can be described by positive terms. Analytic philosophers of mysticism have mainly dealt with kataphatic conceptions. (For an exception see Alston 2005 in the Other Internet Resources.)

Shankara’s Advaita Vedanta is apophatic: no words describing phenomenal features apply to Brahman. So too, Plotinus (205–270 CE) stated that no name applies to the One (Enneads IV.9.5). In a remark echoed by Augustine and Thomas Aquinas about God, he wrote that we can only state what the One is not, not what it is (Enneads V.3.14).

The two approaches can represent two stages in mystical contemplation with the apophatic approach usually treated as higher. Theologians who are not also mystics may utilize the apophatic approach (and ineffability) in contexts unrelated to mystical experiences. Even the theologian who introduced the via negativa to Christianity, Pseudo-Dionysius the Areopagite (c. 500), also wrote works in the kataphatic approach on religious symbolism and the names of God, while still stressing that God cannot be fully captured by any name.

3. The Attributes of Mystical Experience

Three purported features of these experiences are of special interest to philosophers:

3.1 Noetic Quality

Both introvertive and extrovertive mystical experiences are allegedly “noetic,” i.e., giving knowledge of what a subject apprehends (see James 1958). As Chris Letheby puts it: “Noetic quality refers to a strong sense of gaining a genuine and unmediated insight, or of encountering ultimate reality; the mystical experience, by definition, is felt to be ‘more real than real’” (Letheby 2021, 25).

3.2 Ineffability

When classical mystics invoked “ineffability,” it was typically to affirm that there is more to what was experienced than can be expressed in any language, not to deny anything can be said about that reality. But William James (1958, 292–93) deemed absolute ineffability or indescribability to be an essential mark of mysticism. Even indirect depictions of what is experienced through analogies, metaphors, and art turn it into something like a phenomenal object and thus must ultimately be denied. (And it should be noted that reconciling absolute ineffability with the noetic quality is hard to do, even though James takes them both to be features of mystical experiences — how can you claim to have a noetic insight if you cannot express anything about it at all? How can something completely ineffable be evidence for any claim?) Moreover, it is not always clear whether it is the experience or its alleged object or both that are considered ineffable by a given mystic.

Mystical knowledge is alien to our dualistic subject/object knowledge since there is no sense of an experiencing self or a distinction between an experiencing subject and an experienced object. So too, language necessarily requires making distinctions but the mystical content is free of conceptualizable differentiations. Thus, mystics cannot use language during introvertive and some extrovertive mystical experiences without ending their experience. That is, attempting to express what is experienced drops a mystic out of introvertive and some extrovertive mystical states, unlike in ordinary subject/object experiences. Thus, nondual mystical experiences occur in a state of consciousness without the subject/object structure that makes conceptualizing possible (Gäb, 2021). Hence, there is a “concurrent ineffability” (Metzinger 2024, xxi) in experiences that completely overcome the subject/object duality that is not present in ordinary experiences.

However, concurrent ineffability does not mean that the experience and what was experienced are necessarily unconceptualizable after mystical experiences are over. And here mystics have trouble expressing claims about the reality allegedly experienced. (Experiencers have less trouble expressing phenomenal features of the experiences [see Yaden et al. 2016, 2017].) They often claim that what is experienced is indescribable, inexpressible, and even unnameable, and then they proceed to name, express, and describe it. How can Meister Eckhart say “God is above all names” (2009, 139, 153) or is “unnameable” (ibid., 263) when he just identified the reality by name?

Hence, the conundrum of even naming the nameless: don’t we at least need to identify the reality with a word in order to know what we are talking about or even to say that the reality is “ineffable”? This logical problem with ineffability was noted long ago by Augustine: God should not be said to be ineffable, for to say that X is ineffable is to say something about X, which contravenes ineffability (Augustine 1958, 10–11).

Several responses to this problem are possible. One is to avoid speech altogether and remain silent about what is revealed in experience. Mystics, however, have not been very good at this. A second is to distinguish first-order from second-order attributions: “ineffability” is a second-order term concerning all first-order phenomenal descriptive terms. That is, to say that something is ineffable is to assert that it cannot be described by any first-order terms, including “ineffable.” Thereby, self-contradiction is avoided (Jones 2016, 204–208). A third possibility is that ineffability means we cannot express how God is “in himself,” but this does not mean that we cannot refer to his actions or relation to creation (Gellman 2022).

A fourth possibility lies in the ongoing negation of whatever is said about X ad infinitum. It is an infinite taking back of what has been said (Sells 1994, chap. 1). An example of “unsaying” can be found in the endless negations in a Zen meditative exercise. Since the truth about reality “as it is” lies outside of our conceptualizations, we cannot say that truth, only experience it. Hence, when we say “Reality is not reality” (i.e., that reality as it truly is always differs from what we take it to be conceptually), we must also say that “Reality is not not-reality” to counter an affirmation of its nature as not-reality. We must then negate the latter by saying “Reality is neither not-reality nor not-not-reality,” and so on (see Nhat Hanh, 1994, chap. 5). But Buddhists and other classical mystics typically affirmed, as Shankara did with Brahman, that a reality lay behind all negations. So too, Eckhart prayed to God to make him free of God (Eckhart 2009, 424, 531) — it is not a denial of God but an attempt to get the experiencer beyond all conceptions, including conceptions of God, to the Godhead behind God and creation.

William Alston (1991) offers a fifth possibility: when mystics talk about “indescribability,” they refer only to the difficulty of describing in literal terms rather than by metaphor, analogy, and symbols.

A sixth solution comes from Richard Gale and Ninian Smart each of whom have argued that “ineffability” is merely an honorific title marking the value and intensity of an experience a mystic considers profound (Gale 1960; Smart 1958, 69).

As another possibility, Wayne Proudfoot (1985, 125–27) argues that invoking ineffability is not to describe but to prescribe that no language shall be applicable, and so ineffability serves to create and maintain a protective sense of mystery. However, experiences of ineffability occur in art and music (Gallope 2017) and in everyday experience. Think of the impossibility of describing the taste of coffee to someone who has never tasted it (King 1988). This diminishes the “protective strategy” argument.

Some philosophers think that a stress on ineffability consigns mysticism to the irrational, thus excluding it from more sensible human pursuits, or it consigns it to the realm of the emotions (Jantzen 1995, 344). Others defend the rationality of mysticism against charges of irrationalism (Staal 1975; Jones 2016, chap. 7).

3.3 Paradoxicality

Scholars of mysticism sometimes stress the alleged “paradoxical” nature of mystical experiences. Stace sees this as a universal feature of mystical experiences (Stace 1960, 212). Four senses of “paradoxical” are relevant. (1) According to its etymology, “paradoxical” refers to something surprising or “contrary to expectation.” (2) Language can be intentionally “paradoxical” in using a logically improper form of words to convey what is not intended to be logically absurd. This may be for rhetorical effect or because of difficulty in conveying a thought without resorting to linguistic tricks. (3) A “paradox” can involve an unexpected logical contradiction, as in the “Liar Paradox.” (4) “Paradoxicality” may be intentionally contradictory for soteriological purposes.

Insofar as mystical experiences are out of the ordinary, and the nondual quality strange to most of us, reports of them may very well be surprising or contrary to expectation, and hence they may be paradoxical in sense (1). Reports of mystical experiences may be paradoxical in sense (2) because at times mystical language assumes logically offensive forms when actual absurdity may not be intended. Frits Staal argued that paradoxical mystical language has been used systematically to make logically respectable claims (Staal 1975). The logician Graham Priest has applied dialetheist logic to the statements of the works of the Madhayamaka Buddhist Nagarjuna (e.g., Priest 2025; but see Jones 2018). However, paradox occurs less frequently in first-hand reports of the phenomenology of mystical experiences and more in second-order mystical doctrines (Moore 1973).

There is no good reason for thinking that reports of mystical experience must imply logical absurdity, as in sense (3) or (4). While there do occur forms of expression that are contradictory, the contradiction is often removed by the device of “unsaying” or canceling out that propels the discourse into a non-discursive realm. So too, many apparent paradoxes can be resolved with paraphrases and explanations (Jones 2016, 238–52; 2018). For example, when Zen Buddhists speak of reaching a state of mind beyond both thought and “no-thought” and perception and “no-perception”, it is a matter of having thoughts but not projecting our conceptual distinctions onto reality, thereby avoiding the fabrication of a false world of discrete objects. Labeling mental activity ceases. No logical absurdity infects this description.

The attempt to designate mystical experiences as paradoxical in senses (3) and (4) may result from being too eager to take logically deviant language literally.

But paradox is only natural in mystical discourse: mystics want to affirm something of the nature of what they experienced, but they must utilize language that is designed for phenomenal realities, and so they must then deny the ascriptions as not actually applicable. Thus, the paradox of affirming something and then denying it is not irrational or nonsensical. We do need to have a mystical experience to see why the features are affirmed and then denied as not truly applicable when the unenlightened take what is said as making the reality experienced into a phenomenal object of some kind.

4. Pure Consciousness Events

“Pure consciousness events” (PCEs) — would be mental events that allegedly are empty of all phenomenological qualities and content (including concepts, thoughts, sense-perception, sensuous images, and a sense of self), thereby leaving only unconditioned consciousness and yet the experiencer remains awake and alert. PCEs would occur introvertively or they may underlie extrovertive mystical experiences. In Thomas Metzinger’s phrase, pure consciousness is the “maximally simple form of consciousness” (Metzinger 2024, xxviii). It should not be equated with “nondual experiences” since the latter may contain differentiated content even if the subject/object dualism is overcome. There would be no sense of an experiencing subject or of ownership of the experience even though experiencers know after the event that it occurred to them. In consciousness studies, mysticism has given rise to studies exploring whether consciousness is in fact an objective phenomenon rather than a subjective one (Metzinger 2024, xiii-xiv).

However, something must be retained after a PCE, even though one is aware of that fact only after the experience is over, if it is to be considered an “experience” or “awareness” at all — e.g., a sense of a changeless reality transcending matter, simplicity, a sense of knowing, connection or oneness, a sense of profound significance, and a sense that the experience itself did not come from the experiencing subject. Without some such content, the event would be only unconsciousness. Thus, “pure consciousness” is not actually “empty” or “contentless” but has some content even if experiencers describe it as “empty” due to its lack of differentiated content.

4.1 Defenders of Pure Consciousness Events

Defenders of PCEs depend on alleged references to pure consciousness in the mystical literature. One example is Meister Eckhart who described a “forgetting” that abandons concepts and sense-experience to sink into a mystical “oblivion” (Forman 1990, 121–159). An extrovertive example is the Buddhist philosopher Paramartha (499–569) who stated explicitly that all of our cognitions were “conditioned” by our concepts save for the “unconditioned” experience of the emptiness of phenomena (Forman 1989).

4.2 Denial of Pure Consciousness Events

Criticisms of the possibility of PCEs include: (1) Reports of PCEs found in the literature may not be decisive in establishing the occurrence of PCEs. We should suspect an “idealization” in these reports in which an ideal goal is presented as achieved when in fact it wasn’t. Mystics thereby remember an experience with content as pure consciousness only because of a “confirmation bias” of what was expected (Jones 2025, chap. 5). (2) Reports of “emptying” and “forgetting” may refer only to an emptying of ordinary experiential content to make room for extraordinary content. This accords well with the conception of ayin (nothingness) in Jewish mysticism, which is positively saturated with divine reality (Matt 1997). For a theist such as Eckhart, emptying the mind by “unknowing” is to empty the mind of all content other than the being that we share with God (Eckhart 2009, 34–36, 42–43), not emptiness of all content. (3) Even if a subject reports a pure consciousness episode, there may have been conceptual events that the subject either repressed or experienced in a nebulous way (Wainwright 1981, 117–119). The latter simply are not remembered. (4) Some argue that because of the way our brain has evolved for our survival, all experience or awareness is necessarily intentional and thus must involve a subject/object dualism and phenomenal content. Consciousness is always consciousness of something to a subject and hence necessarily contains some dualistic content. Thus, because of our nature, there can be no experiences free of any content (Katz 1978). Defenders of the possibility of PCEs reply that even if most experiences are intentional, our neurology does not rule out other types of experiences, and that it is the interpretation of the experience’s content mystics give after the experience that reflects cultural ideas, but the experience itself is only a pure consciousness.

5. Essentialism

Essentialists claim that there is a “common core” to all mystical experiences independent of culture. That is, the common low-ramified accounts of mystical experiences in different cultures and eras reveal that a universal mystical consciousness — the PCE — grounds all the different cultural expressions. Alternatively, there is a shared core of phenomenological features in all mystical experiences that is invariant from culture to culture and era to era. The common core is always culturally mediated in the expressions of each mystic’s culture, but this cultural flavoring does not erase the experiential uniformity since experience and interpretation can be distinguished.

Thus, essentialists argue either that there is only one type of mystical experience or that all types of mystical experiences share common phenomenological features. For secularists, the relevant common neurology of all people regardless of culture accounts for this commonality, not any alleged objects of mystical experiences.

The psychologist Ralph W. Hood, Jr. (2006 and 2017) argues that psychometric studies provide “strong empirical support” for the common core thesis. But neuroscientists have found different patterns of activity in the brain for different types of mystical experiences and meditative practices (see Section 9.7). Different patterns of brain activity at least suggest the possibility that the accompanying experiences may well be different. And even if there is a common neural basis to all mystical experiences, does this mean that the phenomenology of all the experiences must be identical?

Stace’s version of essentialism has generated much discussion (Stace 1960). He proposes two mystical experiences found in all cultures, religions, periods, and social conditions. The first is a universal extrovertive apprehension of the One or the Oneness of all in or through the multiplicity of the phenomenal world. The Oneness is experienced as a sacred objective reality in a feeling of “bliss” or “joy.” This universal extrovertive experience (or the experienced reality, it is not always clear which) is paradoxical, and possibly ineffable (Stace 1960, 79). Second, Stace identifies a universal monistic introvertive experience that “looks inward into the mind” to achieve “pure consciousness” — i.e., an experience phenomenologically not of anything but consciousness (Stace 1960, 86) — i.e., the PCE. Stace calls this the “unitary consciousness” or the “void and empty unity” that is left when all empirical content is excluded (Stace 1960, 110). Like his extrovertive experience, Stace’s universal introvertive experience involves a blissful sense of sacred objectivity and is paradoxical and possibly ineffable. Stace considers the universal introvertive experience to be a ripening of mystical awareness beyond the halfway house of the universal extrovertive consciousness.

Stace assimilates theistic mystical experiences to the PCE by distinguishing between experience and interpretation: theistic mystics are conditioned (perhaps subconsciously) by their surroundings to put a theistic interpretation on their empty introvertive experiences after the experience. Ninian Smart (1965) concurs: descriptions of theistic mystical experiences reflect an interpretive overlay upon an experiential base common to both theistic and non-theistic experiences.

Stace has been strongly criticized for simplifying or distorting mystical reports (see Moore 1973 for a summary) and for failing to properly articulate the differences between extrovertive and introvertive experiences (e.g., Almond 1982, chap. 4). Nelson Pike (1992, chap. 5) criticized the Stace-Smart position because in Christian mysticism union with God is divided into discernible phases. These phases plausibly reflect experience, not a culturally-controlled interpretation.

In contrast to essentialism, R. C. Zaehner identified three distinct types of mystical consciousness: a “panenhenic” extrovertive experience in which one experiences the oneness of nature, one’s self included; a “monistic” experience of an undifferentiated unity transcending space and time; and the “theistic” experience where there is a duality between the subject and the object of the experience (Zaehner 1957). Zaehner thought that theistic experiences are an advance over the monistic since the latter, he thought, express a self-centered interest of the mystic to be included in the ultimate. But in his typology, he had to tell Buddhists what their experiences really were (type 2) despite their explicit rejection of that position. He later admitted that Zen mystical experiences did not fit his typology.

6. Perennialism

Essentialists make a claim about mystical experiences, not doctrines. The term “perennial philosophy” has been a matter of doctrines since Leibniz. In the twentieth century, philosophers dubbed “perennial philosophers” or “perennialists” claimed that there are universal mystical doctrines about what is allegedly experienced that transcend all cultures and religions — a common core of esoteric doctrines that are expressed differently in different religions and cultures (Huxley 1945; Schuon 1975; Smith 1976 and 1987; Jones 2021). That is, perennialists argued for a universalism of “esoteric” mystical doctrines lying beneath the “exoteric” expressions of each salvific religion, not of mystical experiences. Scholars today who call themselves “new perennialists” (e.g., Rose 2016; Taylor 2017) are more properly labelled “essentialists” since they alleged a common core of experiences.

7. Constructivism

The approach that opposes both essentialism and perennialism is “contextualism.” Under this approach, all mystical phenomena, including mystics’ own understanding of their experiences and of what they experienced, must be understood in term of each particular mystic’s culture and era. Constructivists extend contextualism into experiences and assert the conceptual “construction” of mystical experiences by cultural influences — i.e., beliefs, memories, and expectations shaped by a mystic’s culture. (Biological mediation of all experiences is not the issue here.) There are cultural, social, psychological, and linguistic influences. Context penetrates mystical experiences themselves, not merely the post-experiential understanding given by mystics. For constructivists, there is no way to separate mystical experiences completely from their interpretations since our conceptual apparatus shapes our experiences (see Katz 1978 and 1983; for criticism, see Evans 1989; Forman 1990 and 1999; Stoeber 1992; Jones 2020).

“Moderate constructivism” is the view that there are no mystical experiences without structuring from the conceptualizations provided by the mystic’s culture that penetrates the entire experience. The core of mystical experiences is structured, but the experiences have substance of their own to contribute to mystical knowledge claims.

“Strong constructivism” is the view that, while mystics may have a vague cognitive feeling, their cultural background completely determines the alleged cognitive content of all mystical experiences, not merely shapes or influences an independent experiential element. In fact, Steven Katz states that the socio-religious milieu of a mystic “over-determines” mystical experiences (Katz 1978, 46). Thus, mystical experiences have no cognitive value. Rather, mystical experiences become, in the words of Robert Gimello, “simply the psychosomatic enhancement of religious beliefs and values” (Gimello 1983, 85). The structuring that each person brings to a mystical experience makes each mystical experience unique. In the hands of strong constructivists, contextualism even rules out a priori that the same transcendent reality is being experienced in all introvertive mystical experiences. Indeed, according to Hans Penner, the “central point” of contextualism is that “mystical languages cannot be thought of as referring to the same Reality, because Reality is relative to a language system” (Penner 1983, 93; also see Katz 1978, 50–52).

“Nonconstructivism” is the view that some or all mystical experiences are in fact free of any cultural influence, and the divergence in understanding their content comes from post-experiential interpretations. A core of these experiences is independent of cultural structuring. Thus, mystical experiences may have cognitive value.

Constructivism is based on prevailing philosophical theories of the nature of consciousness as intentional. But the principal difficulty in resolving the issue of constructivism is that we only have mystics’ post-experiential accounts, which all parties agree are shaped by a mystic’s culture — we can never get to the experiences themselves to see if they are constructed or not.

7.1 Constructivist Arguments Against Pure Consciousness Events

Constructivist arguments have been mobilized against the possibility of PCEs. Here is a sampling:

  1. PCEs are impossible because of the “kind of beings” that we are (Katz 1978, 59). It is a fact about being human that we can experience only with the aid of memory, language, expectations, and conceptualizations. Thus, we cannot have a “pure” awareness empty of all such content. According to Steven Katz, that mystical experiences are conditioned and mediated is a “fact” that “seems irrefutable” (Katz 2020, 247).

  2. We should distinguish an “experience” from an “event” (Proudfoot 1985, chap. 4; Bagger 1999, chap. 4). That a person has an experience entails that they conceptualize it during the event. Hence, even if PCEs happen to occur, they do not count as “experiences” until the subject conceptualizes them, and at that moment they cease to be “pure consciousness.”

  3. A survey of mystical literature shows that mystical experiences always have conceptual content and thus are not empty of conceptualizations.

  4. Subjects could not know they had undergone a PCE if the experience were truly empty of all conceptual content (Bagger 1999, 102–103) since there would be nothing to observe while it is going on, and hence nothing to retain later. Nor could a subject surmise that a PCE had transpired by remembering a “before” and an “after” with an unaccounted for middle — that would fail to distinguish a PCE from plain unconsciousness. In effect, the person had no experience at all.

  5. Suppose a PCE has occurred and that a subject somehow knows that. Still, there is a problem of the relationship of a PCE to the subsequent claims to knowledge: if a PCE were empty of all experiential content, the experiencers could not claim to have had acquaintance of anything (Bagger 1999, 102–103). Nothing could be retained from the experience to shape a mystic’s beliefs or values. Nor could such occurrence be evidence for any claim.

  6. So too, if PCEs were empty of everything but a featureless consciousness, they could not have an impact on the life of a mystic, and yet the experiences do have an impact. Thus, the state must have some differentiated content.

7.2 Criticism of Constructivism

Several objections can be raised against constructivism:

  1. While our cultural sets shape our ordinary experience, there is no good reason to believe that we cannot enjoy experiences on a pre-conceptual level of awareness, especially through a regimen of training. The constructivist Steven Katz notes our “most brutish, infantile, and sensate levels” of experience when we were infants (Katz 1988, 755). It is hard to see why in principle we could not retrieve such an unconceptualized level of experience.

  2. It makes little difference whether a PCE is called an “experience” or an “event.” A PCE occurs within a wider experience, including the subject’s coming out of the PCE and assigning it meaning. Let this wider experience be the “experience” under discussion, rather than the PCE alone.

  3. Neuroscientific studies of mystical experience point to the possibility of a state of pure consciousness. For example, a theory by Eugene d’Aquili and Andrew Newberg (1999) accounts for PCEs by reference to occurrences in the brain that cut off ordinary brain activity from consciousness. (Also see Hood 2006 and Section 9.7 below.)

  4. There may be no problem about mystics knowing after the experience that they had PCEs. If we accept a reliabilist account of knowledge, a belief is knowledge if produced by a reliable cognitive mechanism (perhaps with some further conditions). In order to have knowledge, a person does not have to be aware of and judge evidence, nor be cognizant of the reliability of the mechanism that produces the knowledge. Hence, “awakening” from what is in fact a PCE, if it produces the belief that one has “awakened” from a PCE, could be a reliable cognitive mechanism sufficient for knowing one had had a PCE. If we stick to an evidentialist conception of knowledge, mystics might be able to have evidence they had undergone a PCE, though not at the time of its occurrence, since a conscious event can have elements that one does not note at the time but recalls afterward. That is, as noted above, some content was retained and the experience was not truly empty, even if the content is only a nondual consciousness. Thus, it should be possible for a mystic who undergoes a PCE to recall immediately afterward the awareness that was present in the PCE, even though that awareness was not an object of consciousness at the time of the PCE. That the later account is always structured does not mean that those elements must have been present during the experience itself.

  5. Defenders of PCEs can champion their epistemological significance, although PCEs are not experiences of differentiated content. The noetic quality can come from an acquaintance of states of affairs involving a direct insight, without supervening on acquaintance of any reality. Nor need the insight be simultaneous with the occurrence of the experience but may arise only later. The PCE plus the later insight would constitute a complex mystical experience that afforded awareness of a state of affairs not otherwise accessible.

7.3 Strong Constructivism Against Essentialism

Strong constructivism’s main argument against essentialism and PCEs is as follows (Katz 1978): (A) The conceptual scheme that a mystic possesses completely determines the nature and content of the mystical experience; (B) mystics from different mystical traditions possess pervasively different conceptual schemes; therefore, (C) there cannot be a common experience across cultural traditions, and so essentialism is false.

Regarding (B), Katz (2013) has edited a massive volume on mysticism with the aim of displaying the stark differences between mystical experiences of different traditions, due to linguistic, cultural, religious, and sociological factors.

So too, theistic experiences are theory-laden as the result of being embedded in a propensity to think theistically. Such experiences, then, are “polluted” by theory (Oppy 2006, 350). That is why, allegedly, theistic experiences are rarely reported by those not already theists or in theistic communities.

7.4 Criticism of Strong Constructivism

Some objections to strong constructivism are not objections to moderate constructivism:

  1. It seems quite possible for subjects to apply “thin” phenomenal descriptions to experiences rather than always utilizing the “thick” conceptualizations of doctrinal schemes. Perhaps only on second thought will they elaborate on their experience in terms of the richness of their home culture. This would be like a physician with a headache, who experiences pain in the first instance just like ordinary folk and only subsequently applies medical terminology to the headache (compare King 1988). If so, there is a possibility of common first-instance mystical experiences across cultures, contrary to premise (A).

  2. Premise (A) is also thrown into doubt by expressions of surprise by experiencers who had no mystical training or expectations (Gellman 1997, 145–146; Barnard 1997, 127–130). So too, constructivists have trouble accounting for why some mystics become heretics (Stoeber 1992, 112–113) — under constructivism, their mystical experiences should reinforce their prior orthodoxy. Likewise, strong constructivism’s inherently conservative take on mysticism will struggle to explain transformations within mystical traditions, and cannot easily account for innovative geniuses within mystical traditions. These illustrate the possibility of getting out from under one’s cultural background to have new experiences.

  3. Consider two people walking together down the street and seeing an approaching dog. One experiences the dog as “Jones’s pet Fido” while the other experiences it as “a stray mutt.” Because of the excessive conceptual differences in their experiencing, constructivists must insist that there was no worthwhile sense in which both observers had the same experience. However, there is a valuable sense in which they are having the same experience: seeing that dog at that place and time. Similarly, there may exist a valuable commonality of experiences across mystical traditions despite conceptual disparity. The conceptual differences may not be sufficient to deny this important commonality (Wainwright 1981, 25).

  4. Mystical traditions characteristically involve disciplines aimed at loosening the hold of one’s conceptual scheme on subsequent experience. Meditative techniques promote a pronounced inhibition of ordinary cognitive processes — what Arthur Deikman (1980) labelled “deautomization.” This plausibly restricts the influence of one’s cultural background on one’s mystical experiences, in turn making possible identical experiences across mystical traditions to the extent that our neurology is the same in relevant respects.

  5. Strong constructivists also fail to account well for widely differing mystical understandings of the same religious text. For example, the metaphysics of the Upanishads and Brahma Sutra is an absolute nondualism for Shankara (c. eighth century CE), a “qualified dualism” for Ramanuja (c. 1055–1137), and a strict dualism for Madhva (1199–1278). (See Radhakrishnan 1968, introduction.) Different Indian, Tibetan, and East Asian Buddhist schools give different interpretations to texts on emptiness (shunyata). It is plausible to conclude that distinct mystical experiences were responsible, at least in part, for these differences. If so, the experiences control the mystics’ understanding of their basic scriptures rather than vice versa. At the very least, the texts have less control than constructivists contend.

  6. More generally, strong constructivists overemphasize the influence of pre-mystical religious teaching on the mystic’s experience. Mystical experiences can cause a mystic to reinvent the meaning of doctrines. An example is the Jewish Kabbalistic transformation of the notion of mitzvah (“commandment”) to that of “joining” or “connection” with God. Starting with “commandment,” the mystic ends up with “clinging” (devekut) to God.

  7. Analytic philosophy’s dogma that there is no nonconceptual content to ordinary perceptual states and knowledge is now being challenged. (See entry on “The Problem of Perception,” Section 3.3.3.)

8. Inherentists and Attributionists

Inherentists believe that there are experiences that are inherently religious or mystical. Attributionists believe that there are no inherently religious or mystical experiences (see Proudfoot 1985) — experiences are only deemed religious by the subject or a group. Ann Taves contends that people or groups have experiences of what afterward strikes them as “special.” Only then, depending on various factors, will they attribute a religious or mystical meaning to them (Taves 2009). Some neuroscientific research appears to support this position (Azari et al. 2001). Taves also rejects constructivism: constructivists see religious and mystical experiences as constructed from the very start by cultural conditioning, but attributionists deny this in favor of a tiered or “block-building” approach from experiencing something “special” to a religious or mystical conclusion.

William Forgie (1984 and 1994) argues, as would an attributionist, that there could not be an “experience of God” if we understand “experience of God” to mean that it is phenomenologically given in the experience itself that an experience is in fact of God. He argues that phenomenological content can consist only of general features and not features specifically identifying God as the object of experience. He compares this to seeing one of two identical twins. Which one of the two you perceive cannot be a phenomenological given. Likewise, that someone experiences precisely God and not something else cannot be a phenomenological datum. Pike (1992, chap. 7) argues against Forgie that the individuation of an object can be a component of the phenomenological content of an experience, drawing on examples from sense-perception.

Moreover, inherentists can argue an experience is “inherently mystical.” Today it is increasingly becoming apparent that mystical experiences are real: there is evidence of distinctive configurations of brain activity uniquely associated with mystical experiences (e.g., Newberg, d’Aquili, and Rause 2001, 143; Yaden et al. 2017, 60). However, by “real,” neuroscientists mean only that mystical experiences involve distinct neurological events and are not merely ordinary experiences interpreted as “mystical” or products of the imagination, not that they are necessarily noetic. But if unique patterns of brain activity do underlie different mystical experiences, then it may be that some experiences are inherently mystical even though their significance varies between different religious and nonreligious experiencers.

9. Epistemology

A major philosophical issue is whether mystical experiences give us knowledge of reality. Are they in fact more cognitive than ordinary experiences? Do they give knowledge only if they occur in the context of a religious way of life? If, as many analytic philosophers argue today, the ego does not exist but is only an illusion that the brain generates, wouldn’t cultivating a sense of reality free of a sense of “self” lead to knowledge of reality?

William James asked: “Do mystical states establish the truth of those theological affections in which the saintly life has its roots?” (1958, 319). This question can be divided into two: (Q1) Is a mystic warranted in thinking that his or her experiences are veridical or have evidential value? A mystical experience may be psychologically compelling for the person who had it, but is it also cognitively authoritative? And (Q2), are those who have not undergone any mystical experience, upon examining the evidence presented by mystics, warranted in thinking them veridical or endowed with evidential value? The major philosophical affirmative reply to Q1 is the “Doxastic Practice Approach.” The major defense of an affirmative reply to Q2 is the “Argument from Experience.”

9.1 The Doxastic Practice Approach

William Alston defends the beliefs that people form from their mystical and numinous experiences, specifically of a theistic kind, based on their “doxastic practice.” He defines a “doxastic practice” as consisting of socially established ways of forming and epistemically evaluating beliefs (the “output”) from a certain kind of content from various inputs, such as cognitive and perceptual ones (Alston 1991, 100; also see Alston 2005, chaps. 9–11). The practice is beholden to an “over-rider system” which is a background system of beliefs against which beliefs supported by the practice are checked for possible over-riders. The practice of forming beliefs about physical objects based on sense-perception is an example of a doxastic practice; drawing deductive conclusions from premises is another. Alston (1993) argues that the justification of every doxastic practice is “epistemically circular” — i.e., its reliability cannot be established in any way independent of the practice itself. However, we cannot avoid engaging in doxastic practices. Therefore, Alston contends, it is a matter of practical rationality to engage in the doxastic practices that we do engage in providing there is no good reason to think they are unreliable.

There are also doxastic practices consisting of forming beliefs about God, God’s purposes for us, and the like, grounded on religious and mystical experiences such as “God is now appearing to me.” The Christian doxastic practice has an over-rider system consisting of scriptures, Christian dogma, and guidelines resulting from the past history of the mystical Christian doxastic practice. It follows from Alston’s argument that it is rational for a person engaged in such a practice to take its belief outputs as true unless the practice is shown to be unreliable. Thus, we have an affirmative answer to question Q1.

Most objections to Alston are equally objections to the Argument from Experience or come from general epistemological complaints. Objections that apply specifically to Alston include Jonathan Kvanvig’s (1994) faulting of Alston for a loose employment of “rationality.” He argues that no one meaning of that term can do the work Alston does with it. Another objection is that Alston moves from “It is practically rational to engage in a Christian doxastic practice” to “It is rational for me to believe the Christian doxastic practice is reliable.” Others argue that there is a problem with the construction of the over-rider system of the Christian mystical practice since the guidelines gleaned from the history of the practice, so it is argued, were compromised by androcentric bias and outdated scientific beliefs. These detract from the practice’s epistemic legitimacy (Gellman 2011).

9.2 The Argument from Experience

Various philosophers have defended the evidential value, to one degree or another, of some religious and mystical experiences, principally with regard to experiences of God (Baillie 1939; Broad 1953; Davis 1989; Gellman 1997 and 2001a; Gutting 1982; Wainwright 1981; Yandell 1993; Swinburne 2004). These philosophers stress the “perceptual” nature of experiences of God. This approach can be summarized as follows:

  1. Experiences of God have a subject/object structure with a phenomenological content allegedly representing the object of the experience. Subjects are also moved to make truth claims based on such experiences. Furthermore, there are procedures for getting into position for a mystical experience of God (see Underhill 1945, 90–94), and others can take up a suitable mystical path to try to check on the subject’s claims (see Bergson 1977, 210). In these ways, experiences of God are perceptual in nature.

  2. Such experiences count as at least some evidence in favor of their own validity. That a person seems to experience some object is some reason to think he or she really does have experiential contact with it. Thus, experiences of God count as at least some evidence in favor of their own validity.

  3. Agreement between experiences of people in different places, times, and traditions enhances the evidence in favor of their validity (see Broad 1953). Hence, agreement about experiences of God in diverse circumstances enhances the evidence in their favor. (But see Section 9.6.)

  4. Further enhancement of the validity of a mystical experience can come from appropriate consequences in the life of the person who had the experience, such as increased saintliness (Wainwright 1981, 83–88). William James proposed a pragmatic “fruit” test for determining true mystical doctrines (James 1958, 368): if a mystical experience produces positive results in how one leads one’s life, then the experience is authentic and the way of life one follows is vindicated, and so the teachings leading to the positive life are correct. In short, the “truth” of one’s beliefs is shown by one’s life as a whole. (But what is considered “positive fruit” in one mystical tradition may not be considered so in another.)

Together (1)–(4) yield prima facie evidence in favor of the validity of (some) experiences of God.

Kai-Man Kwan has developed this type of argument further by specifying theistic experience, in particular, as a “well-established type of experience.” The tokens of such a type of experience occur to many people and on repeated occasions, have a common ontology, and are communicable in a coherent conceptual framework. This strengthens an argument from experience for theistic experience (Kwan 2011, 511).

Kwan (2011 and 2013) has also significantly expanded the Argument from Experience in a way that avoids focusing only on experiential episodes. He argues for what he calls a “holistic empiricism” that considers an array of dimensions of human experience: the noetic (consisting of epistemic seemings), the qualitative (the feel of what it is like to have the experience), and the volitional (action, choice, deliberation, and the like). Kwan argues that when judging the credentials of religious experience we should take into account the following experiences, in addition to narrowly selected religious experiences: experiences of the natural world and of the self, existential experience, interpersonal experience, moral experience, aesthetic experience, and intellectual experience. Kwan argues that the integration, in the appropriate way, of these types of experience coherently and fruitfully constitutes a defeasible justification for relying on the product of religious belief. Kwan argues in this way for theistic belief in particular. A similar argument can be presented for judging mystical experience construed narrowly. The unit of justification of believing a proposition when having had a mystical experience would be the entire holistic complex of all of the mystic’s experiences. Going beyond, but including, discrete mystical episodes, a mystic is able to fashion a cumulative case for mystical conclusions.

Kwan’s argument avoids the objection based on dissimilarities between mystical experiences and sense-experience since the unit of justification encompasses far more than mystical experiences themselves. This argument also neutralizes objections based on neuroscience against the validity of mystical experiences: belief in the import of mystical experience will seek justification far beyond what can be possibly identified as a brain state accompanying a mystical experience.

Whether any experiences of God are veridical in the end will depend on the strength of the initial evidential case, on other favorable evidence, and on the power of counter-considerations against validity. Defenders of the Argument from Experience differ over the strength of the initial evidential case and have defended the Argument against counter-evidence to varying degrees.

9.3 Disanalogies to Sense-Experience

Several philosophers have argued against either the Doxastic Practice Approach or the Argument from Experience, or both (Bagger 1999; Fales 1996a, 1996b, and 2001; Gale 1991, 1994, and 2005; C.B. Martin 1955; M. Martin 1990; Proudfoot 1985; Rowe 1982). Philosophers have disputed the Argument from Experience on the grounds of alleged disanalogies between experiences of God and sense-perception. The two basic issues are whether the disanalogies exist, and if they do exist, whether they are epistemologically significant.

9.3.1 Lack of Checkability

The analogy allegedly breaks down over the lack of appropriate cross-checking procedures for experiences of alleged realities that transcend the nature realm. With sense-perception, we can cross-check by employing inductive methods to determine causally relevant antecedent conditions; we can “triangulate” an event by correlating it with other effects of the same purported cause; and we can discover causal mechanisms connecting a cause to its effects. These are not available for checking alleged experiences of transcendent realities. Evan Fales (2001 and 2010) argues that cross-checkability is an integral part of any successful perceptual epistemic practice. Hence, the perceptual epistemic practice in which mystical experiences of transcendent realities are embedded is severely defective. Richard Gale (1991) argues that in experiences of God there is missing agreement between perceivers as well as missing the possibility of checking whether the perceiver was in the “right” position and psycho-physiological state for a veridical experience. For similar reasons, C. B. Martin (1955) concludes that claims to have experienced God are “very close” to subjective claims like “I seem to see a piece of paper” rather than to objective claims like “I see a piece of paper.”

William Rowe (1982) observes that God may choose to reveal himself to one person and not to another. Thus, unlike with sense-perception, the failure of others to have an experience of God under conditions similar to those in which another person did, does not impugn the validity of the experience. Hence, we have no way of determining when an experience of God is delusory. If so, neither can we credit an experience as authentic.

9.3.2 God’s Lack of Space-Time Coordinates

Some philosophers have argued that there could never be evidence for thinking a person had perceived God (Gale 1994 and 2005; Byrne 2001). For there to be evidence that a person experienced an object O, and did not merely have an “O-ish-impression,” there must be evidence that O was the common object of different perceptions. This is possible only if it were possible to distinguish perceptions of O specifically from possible perceptions of other objects that might be perceptually similar to O. This latter requirement is possible only if O exists in both space and time. Only space-time coordinates make it possible to distinguish O from objects of similar appearance existing in other space-time coordinates. Transcendent realities, however, do not exist in space and time. Therefore, there could never be evidence that a person had experienced God.

9.4 Evaluation of the Disanalogy Arguments

Although Alston defends the perceptual character of mystical experiences of God for his Doxastic Practice Approach, there is no restriction that the experiential input of a doxastic practice must be perceptual in nature. Any cognitive input will do. Hence, disanalogies between experiences of God and sense-perception, even if great, would not be directly harmful to this approach (Alston 1994). Indeed, Alston rejects the standards of reliability for sense-perceptions when applied to mystical experiences (Alston 1991, 73–74).

Regarding the bearing of the alleged disanalogies on the Argument from Experience, disanalogists take the evidential credentials of sense-perception as paradigmatic for epistemology. They equate confirming and disconfirming evidence only when evidence strongly analogous to the kind for sensory perception is available. However, the evidential requirement should be only “confirming experiential evidence,” be what it may. If God-sightings have confirming evidence, even if different from the kind available for dualistic sense-perception, they will then be evidentially strengthened. If God-sightings do not have much confirming empirical evidence, be it what it may, they will remain unjustified for that reason, not because they lack cross-checks appropriate to sense-perception.

A problem with the argument from God’s lack of dimensionality is that the practice of identifying physical objects proceeds by way of an interplay between qualitative features and relative positions to determine both location and identity. The judgments we make reflect a holistic practice of making identifications of place and identity together. There is no obvious reason why the identification of God cannot take place within its own holistic practice, with its own criteria of identification, not beholden to the holistic practice involved in identifying physical objects (see Gellman 2001a, chap. 3).

Using perception, which is inherently dualistic, as a model for nondual mystical experiences is problematic. Perhaps the justification of physical-object claims should not be our evidential standard since our ordinary physical-object beliefs are far over-supported by confirming evidence. We have extremely large constellations of confirming networks there. Hence, it does not follow that were mystical claims justified to a lesser degree than that, or by similar procedures, that they would not be justified at all.

9.5 The Argument from Experience as Dependent on the Doxastic Practice Approach

In the end, the Argument from Experience might have to yield to the Doxastic Practice Approach (Gellman 2010). One reason is that it is doubtful if many experiencers of God make truth claims solely on the basis of their mystical experiences, rather than within a doxastic practice. For example, Teresa of Avila said that one can tell if an experience comes from God or from the Devil by its fruits in actions and personality, the vividness of the memory of the experience, conformity to Christian scripture, and confirmation by church superiors (Interior Castles VI.3). Mystical experiences as such were given no special authority. Classical mystics in general did not take their mystical experiences as verifying the doctrines of their basic scriptures but vice versa — the fundamental scriptures vouched for the validity of genuine mystical experiences.

In addition, if identification of God takes place in a holistic practice (see Sections 9.2 and 9.4), then quite plausibly this is a social practice in which one judges one’s mystical experiences to be of God.

Finally, it is an open question to what extent alleged God-experiences are sufficiently detailed to provide grounds to the subject that they are of God. Hence, a subject’s judgment that a particular encounter is with God might well be a matter of assimilating the event into a larger social practice.

9.6 The Problem of Religious Diversity

Essentialists and others often rely on the alleged uniformity of claims of mystics around the world and throughout history. In William James’s words, there is an alleged “eternal unanimity” among mystics (James 1958, 321). But as he also realized, “if we take the larger mass as seriously as religious mysticism has historically taken itself, we find that the supposed unanimity largely disappears” (ibid., 325). Constructivists emphasize the diversity of mystical experiences; indeed, for them each mystical experience is utterly unique in its content.

Diversity of mystical claims, and especially any genuinely conflicting claims, would impact the Argument from Experience for the epistemic value of mystical experiences. Can belief in any of the conflicting clams be rational? There are experiences of nonpersonal ultimate realities, such as the Brahman of Advaita Vedanta. Brahman cannot be an ultimate reality if God is (Hick 1989, 234–235) since it is devoid of all personal features. Furthermore, different theistic faiths claim experience of the one and only God, ostensibly justifying beliefs that are in contradiction with one another (Flew 1966, 126). If theistic mystical experiences lead to such contradictory results, they cannot provide evidence in favor of their validity as experiences of God.

Philosophers and theologians have proposed different ways of dealing with conflicting mystical claims. (See entry on Religious Diversity.) For example, Michael Stoeber ranks theistic experiences occurring after a mystical experience empty of all differentiated content to be higher in importance, calling them “theo-monistic” experiences (Stoeber 1994). But Advaitins discount all theistic experiences as experiences in which the mind is not yet clear of illusory content.

Even if a philosophical or theological solution succeeds, the body of experiential data is too large to simply scrap on the grounds of contradictory claims. We should endeavor to retain as much of the conflicting data as possible by seeking some means of conciliation. Notice also that even if a philosophical or theological way to reconcile the competing claims is found, the divergence of claims that mystics themselves make still damages the idea that we should accept mystical claims concerning what is experienced in mystical experiences under a “principle of credulity” (Swinburne 2004) — i.e., experiences should be accepted as cognitive until defeated by rational considerations, and the burden of proof shifts to critics. The problem remains that some of the diverse knowledge claims contradict each other on the basic nature of what is allegedly experienced. For example, is what is experienced personal in nature (as with a god) or nonpersonal (as with Brahman)? Is an individual self/soul an independent transcendent entity (as with the Samkhya-Yoga and Jaina purusha), or is it in constant contact with a god, or does it not exist at all? And when the specific nature of the reality is added (e.g., the differences in the nature of God in the various Abrahamic and Vedantic theisms), the number of mystics who have the “correct” understanding drops further.

This conflict of claims undercuts the reliability of mystical claims as a source of knowledge: it appears that most mystics (and perhaps all) are wrong in their specific ontological claims even if they are experiencing the same reality and even if we reject naturalist options (see Jones 2016, 82–85). This damages mystics’ claim to have gained actual knowledge. Once mystics are aware of competing claims, whether the experiences can be authoritative even for the experiencers themselves, as James believed (1958, 324, 414), becomes an issue.

It must also be noted that religious theorists are just as willing as naturalists to tell mystics that they are mistaken about the content of their experiences. For example, Caroline Franks Davis has to twist the Advaitins’ and Buddhists’ accounts to show that mystical experiences really support a “broad theism” — i.e., Shankara was really experiencing God although he explicitly argued that the nonpersonal Brahman alone is real and that theistic experiences of Brahman are a distortion, and that the Buddha was totally unaware that he was experiencing God in concentrative states (jhanas/dhyanas). In addition, the Upanishads and early Advaita do not include “loving” or “compassionate” in their characterizations of Brahman. Nevertheless, she claims that all mystics really experience “a loving presence . . . with whom individuals can have a personal relationship” (Franks Davis 1989, 191). That is just what one would expect someone raised a Christian or in a Christian environment to see as the true “common core” of all mystical experiences. But the same process, mutatis mutandis, would be available for nontheists raised in other traditions for their claims.

As things stand, the diversity problem raises the issue of how much is given in mystical experiences and how much is a matter of interpretation based on a tradition’s beliefs. This in turn raises the issue of how much actual knowledge mystics can claim.

9.7 Scientific Studies: Meditation and Psychedelics

In the 1990s, interest revived in the neurology of the brain, and this revived interest in studying experiences enabled by meditation and psychedelic drugs to see what they may reveal about how the brain works. Different meditative techniques (especially mindfulness meditations) are now being studied through neuroimaging to gain data on the brain activity occurring during these experiences and practices. (For an overview, see McNamara 2022.) Losing a sense of an experiencing “self” necessarily alters our ordinary ego-driven state of consciousness. (See Millière et al. 2018 for an overview of different senses of “loss of self” and their phenomenological differences.) The phenomenology of mystical experiences has also become an important subject for the study of consciousness. Neuroscientists are finding unique patterns of brain activity during mystical experiences. This suggests as strongly as neuroscience can that the mystical experiences enabled by meditation differ from experiences in our normal waking state of consciousness. Different neurophysiological effects and unique patterns of brain activity have also been detected in mindfulness practices and in introvertive concentration practices (Hood 1997 and 2001; Dunn, Hartigan, and Mikulas 1999). The neurological signatures of concentration differ from those of mindfulness meditation (Valentine and Sweet 1999). Possible neural correlates of different mystical features — a loss of a sense of self, a sense of connectedness to others, a feeling of certainty, feeling of profound significance, loss of a sense of time, and so on — have been proposed.

The study of the mystical experiences enabled by psychedelics (in particular, psilocybin, LSD, and ayahuasca) is now also a major topic (Barrett and Griffiths 2018). Psychedelics are reported to occasion some of the most spiritually significant experiences in the life of the participants (Doblin 1991). The most important philosophical question is whether mystical experiences enabled by psychedelics are mere hallucinations that are no more cognitive than the LSD-induced effects on perception and our sense of time. Another important question is whether the experiences enabled by the drugs are the same as “natural” mystical experiences or only pale copies. Are mystical experiences allegedly triggered by God’s grace necessarily different in nature than those triggered by natural causes, or is the content of mystical experiences basically the same in nature regardless of the trigger (see Zaehner 1957; Van Eyghen 2025; Jones 2025, chaps. 2 and 4). Zaehner may have been thinking of “mystical experiences” in terms of lasting effects rather than as eposidic events (Kellenberger 1978). Stace invoked what he called the “principle of causal indifference” of triggers: if two experiences are phenomenologically indistinguishable, then one cannot be called a “genuine” mystical experience and the other not merely because they arise from dissimilar causal conditions (Stace 1960, 29–31). That psychedelics have been known to generate false empirical claims and to accentuate a person’s biases (McGovern et al. 2024; Tempone-Wiltshire and Floren 2024) must also be taken into consideration. (On philosophical issues, see Smith 1964 and 2005; Letheby 2021; Hauskeller and Sjöstedt-Hughes 2022; Letheby and Mattu 2021; Jones 2025, chap. 2).

This research leads to broader philosophical issues. In particular, does brain activity alone cause these experiences, or does meditation or a psychedelic drug merely disrupt the brain activity underlying our normal state of consciousness, thereby enabling new experiences to arise that are not caused by brain activity alone? If the former, can the alleged cognitive content of mystical experiences be discounted because mystical experiences are reduced to “merely brain events”? If the latter, does the same brain state underlie different meditation and psychedelic-enabled experiences? If so, the situation is the inverse of the “multiple realization” problem in philosophy of mind: multiple experiences are connected to the same brain state (see Jones 2025, chap. 6). Does the fact that such experiences can be touched off fairly consistently by drugs with the proper dosage and a conducive mental “set” of background beliefs, expectations, mood, and attitude and a conducive physical and social “setting” mean that the experiences are only products of the brain, or is that irrelevant? So too, the question remains of whether neuroscientists are actually studying mystical experiences at all by studying neural activity correlated with them (see Jones 2016, chap. 9).

9.8 A Critique of Naturalist Explanations

Various psychological explanations of mystical experiences, both their nature and their causes, have been offered. These include pathological conditions such as hyper-suggestibility, severe deprivation, severe sexual frustration, intense fear of death, infantile regression, pronounced maladjustment, and mental illness, as well as non-pathological conditions, including the inordinate influence of a religious mental beliefs and expectations (see Wulff 2000). In addition, sociological explanations for some mystical experiences in terms of socio-political power have been advanced (Fales 1996a and 1996b).

9.8.1 Pathology Model

Bertrand Russell (1935, 188) quipped that “We can make no distinction between the man who eats little and sees heaven and the man who drinks much and sees snakes. Each is in an abnormal physical condition, and therefore has abnormal perceptions.” C. D. Broad (1939, 164) wrote, to the contrary, “One might need to be slightly ‘cracked’ in order to have some peep-holes into the super-sensible world.” Thus, the issue is engaged whether we can “explain away” religious and mystical experiences by reference to natural causes.

If all mystics had a demonstrable pathology or brain-defect, plausible natural explanations would tend to discredit religious explanations of mystical experiences. However, that is not the case. Consider one popular pathological explanation: temporal lobe epileptic seizures (e.g., Persinger 1987, 111). However, ecstatic experiences of well-being, self-transcendence, and certainty from these seizures are very rare (1% to 2% of patients) (Devinsky and Lai 2008). That may be significantly less common than mystical experiences in the general population. Nor are all mystical experiences “ecstatic” in the emotional sense — serenity and calm characterize many mystical experiences. The epileptic experiences usually last only a few seconds out of a larger episode and usually are not a matter of joy but fear and anxiety (Kelly and Grosso 2007, 531–534). If seizures were the cause, why the vast majority of patients do not have mystical experiences would have to be explained, as would why these experiences occur to people not having such seizures. Moreover, visions and voices are more common than mystical experiences for these patients. Overall, mystical experiences have a different phenomenological content, but studies aligned with the temporo-limbic model truncate and misrepresent the phenomenological features of mystical experiences (Bradford 2013, 113). Nor can we simply assume that mystics in the past must have had some pathology. A study of medieval Christian mystics and ascetics did not turn up evidence of any major forms of mental illness such as schizophrenia or manic-depressive disorder (Kroll and Bachrach 2005). Today mystical experiences have been correlated with healthy indices of personality and adjustment (Hood and Byrom 2010; Griffiths et al. 2011). Mystical experiences also more often correlate with positive changes in family life, reduced fear of death, better health, and a greater sense of purpose than do pathological experiences, although some experiencers do require therapeutic care (Yaden et al. 2017, 59). The loss of a sense of self outside of mystical experiences is associated with maladaptive outcomes such as a sense of disconnection to other people and a loss of empathy (ibid.). The pathology model does not explain any of this. It also makes emotion, rather than cognition, the central feature of mystical experiences, and this does not jibe with the historical record (Bradford 2013).

In sum, pathologies may be one possible trigger, but they are not a total explanation of mystical experiences.

9.8.2 Evaluation of Neuroscientific Explanations

In principle, neuroscience can give as complete an account of brain activity during a mystical experience as it can for any conscious event or state. But a neuroscientific account can do no more than relate what happens in the brain when a mystical experience occurs, and merely identifying the activity does not discredit mystical claims any more than a neurological account of perception discredits sense-experience as cognitive — all human experiences have some grounding in neural activity. However, neurology cannot tell us that the ultimate cause of brain events is altogether internal to the organism. True, there may not be “God-receptors” in the body, analogous to those for sensory perception, and this might reinforce a suspicion that these experiences are totally subjective. But such receptors are neither to be expected nor required with non-physical stimuli, as in mystical experiences. For example, an immanent God, Brahman, or the Dao would not exist at a physical distance from the brain. Such realities would already be present in the body, and thus becoming aware of them would not require an external action. Thus, God could act directly upon the brain to bring about the relevant processes for perceiving God or otherwise use a natural medium (see Wainwright 1981, chap. 2).

9.8.3 The Claimed Superiority of Naturalist Explanations

The arguments in Sections 9.7 and 9.8.2 suggest that neuroscientific accounts of activity occurring in the brain during mystical experiences are neutral to whether that activity is all there is to producing the experiences and so is neutral between transcendent and natural explanations. Nevertheless, plausible natural explanations do weaken the religious case by offering a reasonable alternative explanation — there is competition for the best explanation where before there was none.

However, some philosophers have argued that because the “modern inquirer” assumes everything is ultimately explicable in naturalist terms, we should in principle reject any supernatural explanation of mystical experience (Bagger 1999). Invoking God to explain mystical experiences is like invoking miracles to explain natural phenomena. We should match our elimination of miracles from our explanatory vocabulary with an elimination of a supernatural explanation of mystical experiences. Thus, we do not have to wait until we discover a scientific alternative explanation to the theistic explanation of mystical experiences of God. We should resist any theistic explanation in the name of our epistemic standards.

This argument raises the important question of the relationship between any transcendent explanation and a naturalist program of explanation. Arguments have been presented for the compatibility of religion and natural science (e.g., Plantinga 2011). Of course, a person for whom supernatural explanations are not a live option would have reason to reject the Argument from Experience and refuse to engage in a doxastic practice of identifying valid God-experiences. However, most defenders of the Argument from Experience advance it as at best a defensible line of reasoning rather than as a proof of valid experiences of God that should convince anyone, and the Doxastic Practice Approach is not meant to convince everybody to participate in a theistic doxastic practice (see Gellman 2001b). The bar is lowered from advancing assent-compelling proofs to establishing merely the rationality of participation in a doxastic practice that would justify belief. Critics would have to show that it is actually irrational to reject naturalism in our current situation.

10. Secular Mysticism

The new scientific interest in meditation, the new cultural interest in meditating for limited psychological or physiological benefits, and the utilization of psychedelics in consciousness studies and psychotherapy have given rise today to a new phenomenon — “secular mysticism” (see Steinhart 2023; Ziporyn 2024; Jones 2025, chap. 8). Neuroscience appears to validate the positive effects of meditation and psychedelics on our psychophysical well-being, and secularists disconnect traditional practices from a mystical tradition (e.g., Batchelor’s “secular Buddhism” [2015]) or focus only on limited practices (e.g., Harris 2014). Thus, secular forms of meditation are practiced for benefits related to our well-being in the world rather than a total inner transformation. The interest is in the psycho-physiological effects of meditation and psychedelics, with mystical experiences understood within a naturalist framework. Awe and wonder at nature may be prominent in some cases (e.g., Critchley 2024). The option of Whiteheadian process philosophy on the relation of elements of the phenomenal world is also being explored (Buchanan 2022).

Mysticism thus becomes “naturalized” (Letheby 2017). It is reduced from a full way of life to experiences and practices for eliciting states of mind for limited worldly benefits. Mystical experiences break the sense of a narrow “self” and makes one feel connected to others and the rest of the world, and secularists see this in terms of brain activity alone. Participants in drug studies often attach great spiritual importance to mystical experiences even if their metaphysics remains naturalist (see Griffiths 2011). Mystical experiences often touch off wonder at simply being alive and so cause an interest in the “big questions” of philosophy and science or search for a meaning of life even if the experiences themselves are not taken to be cognitive. But these questions are asked within a secular naturalist worldview. That mystical experiences may involve transcendent realities or may otherwise give knowledge of reality is either denied in favor of a naturalist metaphysics or the issue is simply ignored.

Thus, secularists today understand their mystical experiences in nonreligious, naturalist, and sometimes explicitly atheistic ways. Hence, psychedelic-enabled experiences do not necessarily make an atheist into a theist (Nayak et al. 2023) — in fact, they can cause believers to abandon their faith (Newberg and Waldman 2016, 60, 69–75). However, there also appears to be a “significant decreases in identification as atheist and agnostic and significant increases in belief in ultimate reality, higher power, God, or universal divinity” (Davis et al. 2020, 1018). The percentage of participants in one psychedelic study who believed in an ultimate reality, higher power, or a god jumped from 29% to 59%, especially if the participant had a mystical experience (Nayak et al. 2023). Thus, it does appear that psychedelic-enabled experiences tend to cause a shift in many experiencers in metaphysics away from “hard” materialism to accepting transcendent realities (Timmermann et al. 2021; Letheby 2021, 206). In addition, some theists end up rejecting belief in a personal god and embrace a panpsychism, cosmopsychism, a transcendent consciousness, or a nonpersonal “Ultimate Reality” that is the ground of the natural universe.

Secular mysticism raises four basic philosophical questions. First, it impacts the epistemological question of whether mystical experiences give any insight into any reality beyond our own mind or generate any other knowledge. If the experiences do not necessarily lead to cognitive claims, we have to ask whether mystics’ knowledge claims come only from their tradition and ask what role mystical experiences actually play in mystical knowledge-claims. The issue of whether mystical experiences have any epistemic or ontological implications becomes clearer. Second, even if the vast majority of experiencers interpret their mystical experiences in terms of transcendent realities, can we be certain that some such reality is indeed experienced? Should a naturalist interpretation be accepted on grounds that they are more parsimonious? But should naturalist interpretations be the default position as long as the “hard problem” of consciousness remains? Third, it highlights the issue of the role of cultural interpretation in understanding mystical experiences and the constructivist issue of whether cultural influences penetrate some or all mystical experiences. Fourth, can the effect of mystical experiences lead to a meaningful or purposeful life without reference to transcendent realities?

11. Mysticism and Metaphysics

Secular mysticism also raises the issue of mysticism and metaphysics. Many mystical claims about reality are unexceptional as a matter of metaphysics. Virtually every mystical claim has been defended by others for reasons unrelated to mystical experiences. But a mystic’s understanding of the claims may be very different from those who see the world in dualistic terms and not from a mystical state of consciousness.

Moreover, mystical experiences do not dictate one set of metaphysical beliefs. No mystical metaphysics is derived directly and simply from mystical experiences. Nor is there one “mystical worldview.” Mystical experiences may establish that we are not the content of our consciousness but not what we are.

The introvertive mystical experience devoid of phenomenal content does not establish any one ontological claim. The sense that one has experienced in that mystical state something profound, fundamentally real, and objective leads naturally to identifying what is experienced with what is most important in one’s set of beliefs. But nondual mystical experiences and states of consciousness do not require transcendent metaphysics or an overarching oneness or union. They are in fact open to four types of ontological worldviews:

  1. Transcendent nonpersonal ground of beingness underlying all subjective and objective natural phenomena (e.g., Advaita’s Brahman and the Chinese Dao). Such a ground may be conscious in nature (e.g., a cosmic Mind independent of the natural realm). The phenomenal world is an emanation of this reality or is an unreal “dream.”

  2. Dualistic theism: a transcendent personal creator/sustainer god enters the mind (or the mind is already participating in the god’s being). Such a reality supplies all being to the natural world, but the world and persons remain realities distinct from the god in some way.

  3. Pluralism: multiple independently existing transcendent selves/souls that are distinct from matter as in the Samkhya-Yoga and Jaina metaphysics, not a “mystical oneness” of all reality.

  4. Naturalism: the “pure consciousness” of one’s own natural mind, inward awareness of the sheer being of the natural world, a malfunction of the brain’s proper functions, or merely some sort of feedback effect occurring when the mind is empty of differentiated content while one is still aware. Naturalists may accept that our consciousness participates in a natural consciousness transcending the individual person (e.g., panpsychism or cosmopsychism).

These different possibilities highlight the difference between the unitive/nondual state of consciousness and metaphysical claims. The sense of what reality was experienced comes only after the nondual experience is over. Naturalists see all interpretations involving transcendent realities as “metaphysical hallucinations” (Flanagan and Graham 2017, 294). Metzinger refers to this as the “phenomenological fallacy”: the error of inferring necessary features of a reality that is allegedly experienced from the subjective phenomenological features (Metzinger 2024, 57–59). But the secular reading that all that is involved is brain activity is not verified by the experience any more than the nonnaturalist readings — all the ontological claims involve more than what the experience alone justifies.

12. Mysticism and Morality

Some scholars maintain that there is an intrinsic connection between mysticism and moral behavior, or even that mystical experiences are the source and only justification of a moral concern for others. This is because mystical experiences blur or erase the distinction between the subject and others (Stace 1960) or a sense of “self” or self-interest disappears entirely.

Other scholars have argued, to the contrary, that at least some mystical doctrines are incompatible with morality (Danto 1987; see Kripal 2002): monistic mystical metaphysics eliminates all distinctions between one person and others — “all is one” — and so there is no recognition of real persons distinct from oneself toward whom one can exercise a moral concern. Morality must be between “independently real persons” (Wainwright 1981, 211–212), and thus monistic mysticism precludes morality. Under the Buddhist “no-self doctrine (anatta),” there are no real persons with interests to be taken into consideration. David Loy (2002) argues that even if monistic morality is not incompatible with morality, it fails to reveal the best way to help people with compassion. Others argue that morality can get off the ground with the ability to conceptualize “the welfare of others” without the need to recognize others as ontologically distinct beings (Zelinski 2007).

Others maintain that there is no intrinsic connection between mystical experience and either moral or immoral behavior: one can empty oneself of all self-centeredness and self-interest without necessarily adopting a concern for others or rejecting it. Enlightened mystics may no longer be self-centered, but they can be either moral or indifferent to others (Jones 2016, chap. 9). We need look no further than to Christian complaints about mystical antinomian excesses of the “Free Spirits,” the Mahayana Buddhist rejection of the Arhat ideal in Theravada Buddhism as selfish, or the moral scandals of some New Age gurus in the West today (Storr 1996). If moral behavior becomes part of a mystic’s way of life, it apparently does not issue from mystical experiences but from the mystic’s cultural background and training. Nor are the normative behavioral standards of the group derivable from mystical experiences alone. Rather, mystical experiences in themselves are nonmoral. Resulting axiological values and behavior will be a consequence of both the beliefs and practices undertaken to reach mystical experiences and the resulting detachment of the selfless mystical state (Jones 2004).

13. Gender and the Study of Mysticism

Some feminist philosophers have criticized what they perceive as the androcentric bias of male philosophers of mysticism. There are three main objections:

  1. Contemporary male philosophers treat mysticism as centered on private psychological episodes of a solitary person. They believe these private experiences reveal the meaning and value of mysticism (Jantzen 1994 and 1995; also see Turner 1996). Instead, philosophers should be studying the socio-cultural dimensions of mysticism, including its patriarchal failings. Sarah Coakley (2009) maintains that the focus of mysticism should be on the ongoing contemplative practice and all that entails. She also notes that while some analytic philosophers attend to the mysticism of Teresa of Avila, they do not do justice to the full content of her mystical writings, picking out experiences only.

  2. Scholars of mysticism have systematically ignored or marginalized much of women’s mysticism. Closer attention to women would reveal the androcentric bias in mystical studies (Jantzen 1995). Nancy Caciola (2000 and 2003) argues that the criteria the Christian church developed for authentic mystical experiences curtailed the power of women in the church. For example, on the basis of theories about female physiology, women were deemed more vulnerable than men to possession by the Devil and so their experiences were more suspect.

  3. The traditional male construction of God has determined the way male philosophers think of theistic experiences. Under this view, men typically understand theistic experience as a human subject encountering a being wholly distinct, distant, and overpowering. Some feminist thinkers deny the dichotomy between the holy and the creaturely (Daly 1973; Goldenberg 1979). Feminist theologians stress the immanent nature of the object of theistic experiences, and bring to prominence women’s experience of the holy in their fleshly embodiment, denigrated by androcentric attitudes.

This critique should help neutralize the conception of mysticism and mystical experience as completely private, introduced to philosophy largely by William James. Objection (2) has produced scholarship dedicated to women’s mysticism and its significance (e.g., Hurcombe 1987; Hollywood 2002). Several collections on women mystics have helped change the over-emphasis on male mystics (in particular, Furlong 2013). Regarding (3): the rich variegation of religious and mystical experience among men throughout history must also be considered. This includes men’s experiences of God’s immanent closeness as well as mystical “union” with God, unlike dualistic numinous experiences.

The principal impact of the feminist critique on philosophy of mysticism involves Objection (1): it would be to give more reasons to expand the consideration of mysticism to more than episodic experiences.

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