Notes to Religious Diversity (Pluralism)

1. The phrase “religious exclusivist” has been used by some as a label for those who claim that their perspective on a religious issue is true (and, thus, that any incompatible perspective is false). In this sense, for example, those who claim that their perspective on the question of who will spend eternity with God is true—whether that perspective is that no one spends eternity with God, that the proponents of only certain religions will spend eternity with God, or that everyone will spend eternity with God— are by virtue of this truth claim religious exclusivists. Looking at it this way, “religious pluralism,” however defined, is not a competing position. Rather, individuals are either religious exclusivists or not. If they believe that a given perspective on a religious issue is true, then, regardless of the nature or content of that perspective, they are religious exclusivists; if they don’t hold such a belief, then they are not religious exclusivists with respect to the issue in question (Schilbrack 2014, 6–7).

2. Some will surely be uneasy with Plantinga’s dependence on nonfalsifiable private, privileged truth, noting that many, if not most, religious extremists make an unacceptable appeal to such truth as justification for their actions. Plantinga’s supporters can counter that the fact that some such appeals are ad hoc, self-serving justifications for very harmful behavior doesn’t mean this is always or even normally the case.

3. This does not require a strong form or doxastic involuntarism that rules out rational belief assessment in the face of epistemic peer conflict. But it may be worth considering that factors outside of our control make an objective assessment of our deeply ingrained beliefs much more difficult than is often acknowledged.

4. The focus of discussions about reasonable belief among those engaging in the current “epistemology of disagreement” dialog is not exclusively, or even primarily, on religious beliefs. However, the various perspectives do apply directly to religious beliefs.

5. David Holly offers a helpful discussion of the conceptual and practical complications of suspending judgment on beliefs (including religious beliefs), especially those that impact our actions (Holly 2013).

6. It’s important to note that some distinguish an intellectual (cognitive) understanding of religious practices and beliefs from an affective (emotional) understanding of the personal experience of those with differing religious practices and beliefs (what it feels like to be an adherent of a differing religion) and argue that the latter is a key element in promoting harmonious interaction with those of other religions (Armstrong 2010).

7. It should be noted that in keeping with our emphasis on diversity questions currently under discussion in Western analytic philosophy of religion, our discussion of the eternal destiny of humankind will focus primarily on personal immortality – that is, the belief in the actual survival beyond physical death of the core element of our personality or consciousness, and sometimes aspects of our physical bodies, for an indefinite period. Moreover, since Jewish thought doesn’t focus on personal immortality as specifically and to the extent found in Christianity and Islam, while the concepts discussed apply to any religion that affirms personal immortality, the examples will be from Christianity and Islam.

8. It is important to note explicitly that a person can be an exclusivist on the question of who can spend eternity in God’s presence while a non-exclusivist in relation to other issues, for instance, with respect to the question of who can experience God’s presence now.

9. This is section referring to public education as it is understood in the United States, Canada, Australia, and many European and Asian countries: education funded by the government and administered by governmental agencies. This must be distinguished from public education in, for instance, the United Kingdom, where "public" refers to education furnished by independent, fee-based institutions independent of government funding and administration.

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David Basinger <basingerd@roberts.edu>

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