Gershom Scholem

First published Tue Apr 14, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Daniel Weidner replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Gershom Scholem (1892–1982) is considered one of the most important Jewish intellectuals of the twentieth century and an eminent representative of Jewish thought in times of crisis. His pioneering studies on the Kabbalah effectively founded an entirely new field of studies that flourishes until today. Being a friend and correspondent with Walter Benjamin and a number of other prominent contemporary thinkers, such as Martin Buber and Hannah Arendt, his memoirs, letters, and diaries are important testimonies of the history of modern Judaism and express a lifelong intellectual engagement. His influential essays on Tradition, Messianism, and Jewish History express and discuss general ideas of language, politics, and historical understanding. The following entry will discuss the biography and political context (§1), Scholem’s early theoretical reflections (§2), his research on Kabbalah (§3) and his more general reflections on language (§4) and history (§5), as well as the critical research on Scholem (§6).

1. Biography and political context

Scholem’s biographical path From Berlin to Jerusalem—this being the title of his memoir—is an example of post-assimilatory Jewish self-fashioning accompanied by an intensive reflection on questions of belonging, on the relation between tradition and modernity in Judaism as well as more generally about the relation between personal identity, political action, and intellectual life.

Scholem grew up as Gerhard Scholem in a family and milieu of assimilated German-Jewish Bourgeoisie. Like many other youths of the fin de siècle, he rebelled against his parents and their culture, characterized, in his eyes, by “confusion” (JJC 11). He became a devoted Zionist, turned to the Jewish youth movement but soon became skeptical of its romantic attempts to revive the past through direct experience, regardless of historical distance: “Leaping over the chasm is no solution to the problem. We can’t leap” (LY 59). At the same time, he got more acquainted with Jewish knowledge. In retrospect, he describes his decisive “‘Erlebnis’ (experience)” in his “relationship to things Jewish” as the first day of reading the Talmud in the orthodox Bet-ha-midrash. “It was my first traditional and direct encounter, not with Bible but with Jewish substance in tradition” (FBJ 47). Different from the older generation of, e.g., Martin Buber or Hermann Cohen, Scholem did not receive a traditional education but became a self-learned traditional Jew—a paradox position that soon let him reflect on the very idea of tradition and its paradoxes (see below §2).

Scholem’s youth was determined by fierce debates between different branches of Zionism. Soon he began to see Martin Buber, whom he had at first admired, very critically, calling him “inherently anti-Jewish” (LL 57). He wrote a farewell letter to his former fellows of the German Jewish youth movement, arguing that “community requires loneliness” and that the present task was not to experience and to confess, but “to pass down Zion and the teaching in silence” (JJC 58). Personally, he underwent different existential and religious crises, calling himself a “holy swindler”, a “spiritual hypocrite” (LY 173) and judging himself “too dishonest to kill myself” (LY 207). He began to cultivate the aura of a solitary radical and developed ideas of an esoteric Zionism, that consisted of a small group which would drive forward a spiritual renewal of Judaism in secrecy without going public. At the same time, he continued to insist on the essential importance of Jewish learning and on aliyah, the immigration to Palestine, as the only way to escape the confusion of Jewish existence in Europe.

Scholem’s own aliyah in 1923 did not fully resolve these tensions. Like many other immigrants from Western Europe, it wasn’t easy for him to integrate into the culture of the Yishuv. Both skeptical about socialism and—even more so—critical towards the nationalism of the emerging revisionist movement, Scholem experienced moments of disappointment he expressed in melancholic poems, letters, and private notes (see N. Zadoff 2015 [2018: ch. 1]; Weidner 2003 [2022: ch. 5]), blaming the political and public success of Zionism for the failure of its spiritual aim to renew Judaism. He also realized that the political association of Zionism with the British colonial powers would compromise it and lead to severe conflict with the Arab population. He became engaged in the Brit Shalom movement that tried to establish a cooperation with the Palestinian Arabs but turned away after the riots of 1929. Especially after World War II and the destruction of European Judaism, Scholem seemed to have lost most of his utopian hopes for the restoration of Judaism. Nonetheless, he continued to call himself a Zionist and to defend Zionism against its critics, e.g., against Hannah Arendt whose Eichmann-Book he strongly disapproved of (see Engel 2017: chapter 6). He now described Zionism as the necessary and legitimate attempt of Jewish self-determination, i.e., as a political movement the religious “overtones” of which should rather be held at bay: “The redemption of the Jewish people, which as a Zionist I desire, is in no way identical with the religious redemption I hope for in the future” (JJC 44).

After the war and until his death in 1982, Scholem continued his research on the Kabbalah and became an important member of Israeli academia and a world-renowned scholar as well as a public intellectual in Israel, the US, and in Germany. In Germany in particular, he became an authority on the history of German Judaism, most notably in a public polemic: In 1964, he was asked to contribute to a volume dedicated to memorializing the German Jewish “Dialogue”, an idea prominent among assimilated Jews at the beginning of the twentieth century, Scholem sharply denied the existence of such a dialogue:

It takes two to have a dialogue, who listen to each other, who are prepared to perceive the other as what he is and represents, and to respond to him. (JJC 61–62)

The Germans, however, if they had spoken with the Jews at all, had done so only under the silent precondition that Jews would sooner or later fully assimilate into German culture. The Jews, on their part, were both eager to fulfill this precondition but also to preserve their Jewish belonging in some, mostly rather invisible and implicit, way. This led, according to Scholem, for Jews, to the “confusion” that Scholem experienced in his youth, as well as to the “self-deception” of Jewish integration into German culture. For non-Jewish Germans it led to irritation and detestation that the Jews seemed all too willing to give up their past. Scholem’s interventions did not only prove important for the emerging German discussion of the Jewish past but also contained important insights into the dynamics of acculturation.

2. Symphilosophy

Scholem’s turn towards his way of being Jewish is not only a personal and cultural, but also an intellectual undertaking. In an early diary entry, he noted it to be insufficient to believe in Judaism, moreover “one must be able to prove it”. (LY 153). During his youth he continues to sketch reflections on Judaism and its language, and history, that substantiate his personal and political choices, inform his later work on the Kabbalah and contribute to more general discussions on philosophy, theology, and historiography.

Broadly interested in contemporary philosophy, Scholem was influenced by the linguistic skepticism of Fritz Mauthner, Gottlob Frege, the Neo-Kantian epistemology of Hermann Cohen, as well as by the philosophy of life of Friedrich Nietzsche and others. His most important interlocutor in his youth was Walter Benjamin whom Scholem greatly admired and with whom he held a lifelong exchange both personal and philosophical. After Benjamin’s death in 1940, Scholem not only dedicated his magisterial Major Trends of Jewish Mysticism to his friend but undertook considerable efforts to publish Benjamin’s dispersed writings and letters and to explain his works in essays and in a personal memoir Walter Benjamin—Story of a Friendship. If Benjamin is today one of the most famous thinkers of the twentieth century, this results in large part from Scholem’s efforts.

The exchange with Benjamin during their youth, well documented in Scholem’s diaries, is a ‘symphilosophy’ in the sense the German early romantics Friedrich Schlegel and Novalis conceived it: A thinking in dialogue in which at times Scholem applied Benjamin’s intuitions to Jewish texts, and at times inspired Benjamin’s ideas, both inspiring and answering to the ideas of the other. Studying together in Bern, both developed ideas on language and history in critical dialogue with current philosophical trends such as Neo-Kantianism and Phenomenology, most notably in their common reading of Hermann Cohen’s theory of experience, which the friends consider as disappointingly narrow in its focus on scientific experience. As a consequence, Benjamin formulates a “Program of the coming philosophy” that should include a much broader realm of experiences as those of history, religion, art, and particularly language (see below §4). Scholem, for his part, provided ideas and texts from the Jewish tradition, e.g., on Talmudic interpretation, on the nature of language, and on the category of (“Lehre”) “teaching” or “doctrine”, a term which both would use to refer to a postcritical concept of truth: as the Kant of the three critique gestures to the possibility of a new, transcendental philosophy, the idea of “teaching” would articulate the linguistic and historic predicaments of experience. Scholem usually identifies this “teaching” with “torah” which he also designates as “the principle according to which the order of things is fashioned” as well as “the language of God”, and “the network or embodiment of Jewish tradition” (LL 54), or:

Torah is the transmission of God and divine things, it is the principle of the gradual discovery of the truth that is hinted at in writing but whose understanding has been lost. (LY 153)

These notes already contain formulations that will be important for Scholem later on, e.g., on the paradoxes of the written tradition:

To the extent that the Teaching relates to consciousness, the teaching is passed on in silence. The passages in which the teaching breaks through silence, are double points of the Teaching. It is here that the Teaching’s relationship to life becomes dialectical. (LY 194)

However, these thoughts do not form a coherent theory. Scholem’s notes and aphorisms are decidedly experimental, provisional and playful just as the fragments of Friedrich Schlegel and Friedrich Novalis they are modeled on (Weidner 2003 [2022: ch. 10]). Rather, they form a laboratory of ideas and formulations and a practice of self-reflection wherein all statements are ironically reflected. If teaching cannot be spoken out directly this also applies to Scholem himself:

I am a composer of symbolic literature comprehensible only to myself. … But I would transmit the system of philosophy (which is certainly paradoxical) only as an eminently Jewish paradox. (LY 287)

Because tradition is much more a medium of implicit messages than a system, Scholem can conceive his own unsystematic and fragmentary writing as typically Jewish. At the same time, the “Jewish paradox” infuses these thoughts with a reflexive irony Scholem will later return to in his historical writings.

The symphilosophical project came to an end in 1919 due to private conflicts and Benjamin’s refusal of Scholem’s Zionist rigour, even though the two remained friends until Benjamin’s death. In the 1920s, Scholem would become increasingly sceptical towards philosophical interpretations of Judaism, if not to philosophical rationality itself. As other thinkers, such as Franz Rosenzweig or Leo Strauss, he would criticize the idea of Judaism as a religion of reason so dear to emancipated Judaism from Moses Mendelssohn to Hermann Cohen. Influenced by Nietzsche, Kierkegaard, but also by more orthodox thinkers as Samson Raphael Hirsch or Salomon Steinheim, and, indirectly, by the dialectical theology of Karl Barth, he would claim that Judaism conceives reason as insufficient and man to be heteronomous. From the late 1920s he would also criticize other projects to give a systematic account of Judaism. Thus, despite admiration for Franz Rosenzweig’s Star of Redemption, he criticized his systematic parallel between Judaism and Christianity, which according to Scholem effectively renders Judaism more churchlike than it is and downplays the anarchic moment that the Messianic idea presents for Judaism. In later theological debates he would often stress that in Judaism revelation is not a subjective feeling but has an objective nature, without which one cannot have a meaningful understanding of Judaism. In his essay “Reflections on the possibility of Mysticism in our time” from 1963, he argues for the “basic assumption” of all classical Jewish mysticism to be “the acceptance of Torah” as the “word of God”, since it is precisely this affirmation of dependency that enabled Jewish mysticism to be productive: And it is this very assumption, as Scholem goes further, that we, the moderns, do no longer share:

We do not believe in Torah from heaven in the specific sense of a fixed body of revelation having infinite significance. And without this basic assumption one cannot move. (PM 15)

Thus, even if modern man might still have mystic experiences, those won’t be socially binding any longer:

The binding character of Revelation for a collective has disappeared. … Even where a mystical conception of revelation is positively admitted, it necessarily lacks authoritative character. (JJC 274)

Theologically, Scholem thus remained rather conservative but also skeptical.

3. Kabbalah

The study of Kabbalah became Scholem’s main occupation and the professional field he influenced most strongly to the extent that he is often said to have founded the entire field of Kabbalah studies singlehandedly. Neglected throughout the nineteenth century, Kabbalah garnered new attention at the wake of the twentieth century, partly due to the general interest in mysticism, partly due to a Zionist interest in the Jewish heritage that led to anthology projects that would collect the different layers of the Jewish ‘national’ literature and would thus also include kabbalistic texts, as in the kinus-project of Chaim Nachman Bialik. Scholem, too, is less interested in the mystical element per se but would always connect it to Jewish history: “There is no mysticism as such, there is only the mysticism of a particular religious system” (MT 6). He often highlights the verbal meaning of Kabbalah as “tradition” or “reception”, implying that Kabbalists did not understand themselves as revolutionaries or grounded in subjective experience, but as a legitimate part of the Jewish tradition, which is the essential basis on which their mystical interpretation rests. This assumption also fits well with his philological approach: Being trained in oriental philology, he treats the Kabbalah mostly as a textual tradition in continuity with the more normative biblical and rabbinical traditions; other elements of Kabbalah, such as magical practices and subjective mystical mythical experience, are largely downplayed by Scholem.

Scholem’s work on Kabbalah started in the realm of philology: His dissertation comprised a critical edition and commentary of the book of Bahir, and throughout his lifetime he would spend much work on recovering and collating manuscript sources and producing critical editions of major Kabbalistic texts. This includes also the discussion of critical questions of authorship, dating and attribution, e.g., of the Zohar, the main source of medieval Kabbalah, which the young Scholem considered a collection of authentic ancient traditions, before he had to concede it, in fact, to be a pseudepigraphic product of Moses de Leon, written in the twelfth century (see Dan 1987). Quite early, Scholem also decided the Kabbalah has to be seen not as part of, e.g., the history of philosophy—as nineteenth century researchers like Adolphe Frank had argued—but as part of the “history of religion”, referring to the “history of religion school”, a scholarly paradigm of German biblical studies represented by such scholars as Hermann Gunkel and Wilhelm Bousset (see E. Hamacher 1999; Weidner 2003 [2022: ch. 14]), from whom Scholem adopted important concepts.

Gunkel and Bousset analyzed the mythical origins and the different transformations of main biblical concepts as “creation” or “redemption” that they trace back to pagan narratives about anthropomorphic Gods, e.g., in the Babylonian Epics, narratives that have been reinterpreted in monotheism, e.g., in the historization of natural feasts in Deuteronomy or the ethical interpretation of the cult in the prophets. Scholem, too, assumes an original process of rationalization and “demythologization” of the divine that finally leads to rational philosophies of religion, as in Maimonides, but at a certain price:

The price of God’s purity is the loss of His living reality. For the living God can never be subsumed under a pure concept. (KS 88)

Kabbalah would then be a return of the repressed mythical life, or, more precisely the attempted compromise between purity and life.

Scholem thus adopts the threefold scheme of (anthropomorphic, pagan) myth, (monotheistic) religion, and mysticism (MT 7–18) which he in fact considers much more fitting to Kabbalah than to the biblical heritage:

With regard to the survival or revival of mythical notions, which modern biblical researchers must strive so hard to clarify, the texts with which the scholar of the Kabbalah is concerned allow him to proceed with far greater methodological confidence. (MS 140–141)

In Judaism, the role of myth is mainly played by Gnosticism, a dualist revision of the biblical story which confronts the (evil) God of creation with a second redeeming savior which is yet hidden. Gnosticism, too became prominent in the “history of religion” school, especially in Wilhelm Bousset and Hans Jonas (see Wasserstrom 1999). For Scholem, it is Gnosticism that infuses the Kabbalah with an anarchic and antinomian energy essential to its history and meaning. This force renders the history of Kabbalah a “counter-history” that not only undercuts the official representations of Judaism as a rational religion but is driven by constant inner tension and conflict (see Biale 1979 [1982]).

During the 1930s, Scholem’s approach to the Kabbalah becomes more historical, even more dramatic, since he turned away from the mythic origins of the movement to the conflicts and crisis it underwent in historical time. Increasingly, his account of the Kabbalah focuses on a historical event, namely the rise and fall of the false Messiah Shabbatai Zvi in the seventeenth century. As many others, Scholem compared the rise of National Socialism to power to the expulsion of Jews from Spain in 1492. According to him this catastrophic event had a traumatic effect on Jews and led to the development of a strong feeling of being in exile expressing itself, among others, in the development of the Lurianic Kabbalah. For Luria, the entire world has undergone a major crisis of divine order that has to be mended, a doctrine Scholem interprets as a “metaphysics of the exile”. This doctrine prepared the events of Sabbateanism, for Shabbetai Zwi’s antinomian acts and even his forced apostasy can be interpreted as attempting to redeem the fallen world.

From Scholem’s essay Redemption through Sin (1937, English version MI 78–141) on, the acute messianism and antinomianism of the Sabbatean Movement become the center act of his story of the Kabbalah. They are conceived as an “explosion” or as a “historical test” (MT 328) in which antinomian, gnostic, and nihilist ideas latently transmitted in the Kabbalah break forth into the realm of public history. This construction does not only enable Scholem to narrate the history of Kabbalah as one coherent development, but it also underlines the meaning of Kabbalah for Jewish history more generally: Kabbalah has had a “double function as an interpretation of history and as a factor in Jewish history” (SS 44).

Building on this narrative, Scholem developed a broader account of the entire Kabbalah in lectures published as Major Trends of Jewish Mysticism in 1941. These lectures, especially after their publication in English, had an enormous impact. Later, he wrote a major biography of Shabbetai Zvi and the Sabbatean movement and devoted considerable research to its afterlife, e.g., in the writings of the Jewish nihilist Jacob Franck or several underground writers in freemason and revolutionary circles all of whom he considered a trajectory from Sabbatianism to enlightenment and Jewish emancipation. After the war, he also talked more broadly about the Kabbalah in the context of comparative religion. He joined the Arcona-Circle where a younger generation of scholars of religion met in Switzerland (Wasserstrom 1999). There he presented the Kabbalah as one form of religious symbolism:

In the mystical symbol a reality which in itself has, for us, no form or shape becomes transparent and, as it were, visible through the medium of another reality. (MT 27)

Here, too, he would stress the power of the “productive misunderstanding” (KS 102; MT 24–25) whereby the Kabbalists invested old ideas with new and often incompatible meanings and which often results in a “profound ambiguity” (KS 96) and “apparent self-contradiction inherent in a great many Kabbalist symbols and images” (MT 34). Thus, his Symbolism tends to be more complex and more dialectical than the primordial simple symbols most researchers of that circle are interested in.

4. Language

For Scholem, the Kabbalah is mostly a textual tradition; it has to be understood through its language. The stress on language goes back to the early philosophical speculations already mentioned above and can be seen as part of a linguistic turn in early twentieth century philosophy, as in thinkers like Ludwig Wittgenstein or Ernst Cassirer. For Scholem as well as for Benjamin, human experience is fundamentally mediated by language. Benjamin had sketched ideas of a non instrumental concept of language by way of a Genesis commentary in his 1916 essay “On language as such and on the language of man”, a text that also inspired Scholem to reflect on the nature of Hebrew, e.g., on the grammatical tenses of the Hebrew Bible or on aspects of Hebrew poetic language in Song of Songs, Lamentations, Job, and the Prophetic books.

Lament represents, according to Scholem, language at the limit of silence which is therefore paradigmatic for language as such (see Ferber & Schwebel 2014): In the book of Lamentation, the loss of language in exile—when God seemingly has withdrawn from Israel, and does not answer any more—is poetically transformed into an address to God. In Prophecy, and in the book of Jonah in particular, the limits of human language are ironically demonstrated: Jonah erroneously takes prophecy for prediction, whereas it is actually rather about the possibility that different times, past and future, might be transformed into each other. In Job, namely in the speeches of God that overwhelm Job rather than answer his questions, the idea of revelation manifests itself, since in Judaism, the “word of God” is not a specific message, but rather a “medium”, thus: “the absolute, that which gives meaning but is in itself meaningless” or the “interpretable, which only lays itself out in the continuous relationship to time, in tradition” (Br I, 469–470). Thus, despite being a concrete communication to the people of Israel, Revelation also implies all other meanings tradition will be able to attribute to it, it is semantically open, but also performatively forceful and thus inherently dangerous.

The word of God in its absolute symbolic fullness, even if it were immediately (undialectically) significant in time, would be destructive. (Br I, 469).

Later in his life, Scholem will argue that the kabbalistic theories of language and of the Name of God in particular express this very experience with language: Containing all potential meaning, this name has no conventional meaning any more, but at the same time it is extremely powerful and can be put into action in magical practice (“The Name of God”).

These thoughts on language not only strongly echo poetic traditions; they are used to read poetry as well. The notion of Lament goes back to the poetics of the elegy as developed in German Romanticism, e.g., by Friedrich Hölderlin for whom poetic language became the placeholder of religious experience. Scholem was also deeply impressed by the Hebrew writer Shai Y. Agnon who combines classical traditions with modern forms to represent the “anarchic vitality, the lawlessness and roughness of the new language” (JJC 95–96) of modern Hebrew. Even more important for Scholem are the writings of Kafka which represent a trace of tradition in the modern world and thus become an object of an intense and important correspondence with Walter Benjamin.

Benjamin had developed a secular reading of Kafka, whose work represents the absence of the divine. Scholem, however, argues, that revelation is not absent in Kafka’s world, but it is unreadable: Kafka’s figures “are not so much those who have lost the Scripture […] but rather those students who cannot decipher it”, revelation is thus still present, but “returned to its own nothingness” (Corr 126–127): His work represents the modern world, but in a sense different from a purely secular understanding:

a state in which revelation appears to be without meaning, in which it still asserts itself, in which it has validity but no significance. A state in which the wealth of meaning is lost and what is in the process of appearing (for revelation is such a process) still does not disappear, even though it is reduced to the zero point of its own content, so to speak. (Corr 142).

Revelation as a medium can thus also involve a completely undetermined meaning in which fullness and emptiness coincide. Thus, also, a world that seems to have lost the divine may be marked by its withdrawal, although, as Scholem would later go on to argue, this process of withdrawal of meaning or of the reduction to itself might be a regular occurrence in the case of mystical traditions:

I would say such an enfeebling is rooted in the nature of the mystical tradition itself: it is only natural that the capacity of tradition to be transmitted remains as its sole living feature when it decays, when it is on the crest of a wave. (Corr 236f)

The image of the waves of tradition already implies that there is a possibility of continuity, even if Scholem is careful to spell it out.

But Scholem’s reflections on the power of language do also have a political connotation. Upon immigration, he experienced the revival of Hebrew as a spoken language and “the inner contradictions of the revival of the secular language and the silence overpowering the language” (JJC 36). This implies both the difficulty of learning Hebrew for many immigrants, but also the emergence of a nationalist language that would use biblical terminology to legitimate the Zionist undertaking. In an open letter to Franz Rosenzweig, Scholem underlined the dangers of this development: “It is impossible to empty the words so bursting with meaning unless one sacrifices the language itself” (“On our Language”, 97). Either, Scholem suggests, this process would lead to a trivialization, i.e., loss, of language, or to the heritage enshrined in it coming to explode one day: “The day will come when the language will turn against those who speak it” (ibid., 98).

Finally, Scholem’s thinking on language is also self-reflexive in allowing him to conceive his own scholarly work as “philology”, i.e., literally, as a “love to language”, a notion also developed in early romanticism (see Weidner 2003 [2022: ch. 13]). In different fragments and notes and a short text entitled Ten Unhistorical Aphorisms, he describes his own philological research on Kabbalah as an “ironic” undertaking, since it is

engaged with a veil of fog that hangs as the history of mystical tradition around the corpus, the space of the thing itself, a fog, however that comes from that very thing. (“Zehn unhistorische Sätze”, 264, [author’s translation])

This aphorism is centered on the paradox that the philological commentator is also a bearer of tradition, albeit a bearer who by his critical and historical thought excludes himself from that tradition. What is more, this paradox is already inherent in Kabbalah itself, as it cannot be conceived without betrayal: “True tradition remains hidden; only fallen tradition falls upon an object, and only in decline does it become visible in its greatness” (ibid.). Thus the dynamic of tradition has certain ironic or even tragic traits and only in this irony can we conceive it.

5. History

Scholem is an essentially historical thinker: He approaches Judaism through its history, he conceives Zionism as the return of Judaism into history, and his account of the Kabbalah is a deeply historical one more interested in the role of the Kabbalah in general Jewish history than in atemporal mystical experiences, and his historical interest does want to contribute to the modern self-understanding of Judaism, even though he is well aware that modern historical consciousness differs radically from religious tradition. In fact, his historical writings are at least so fascinating to the degree that they try to articulate the tensions between religious tradition and modern history.

Together with other thinkers of the late nineteenth century—e.g., Jakob Burkhardt, Franz Overbeck, Friedrich Nietzsche, or Ernst Troeltsch—Scholem knows the conditions of modern culture to be essentially historical, but also deeply ambivalent and aporetic, in particular for a minority position such as Judaism in a secularized Christian culture. His historical account of the Kabbalah and its role in Jewish life is therefore a decided “counter-history” that aims at a revision of the dominant account of historical progress and progressive rationalization that liberal historians developed in the nineteenth century (see Biale 1979 [1982]). He therefore also vehemently criticized his forerunners of the “Science of Judaism” for their antiquarian tendencies which aim at a “decent burial” of the Jewish past and for their deliberate ignorance of those irrational and primitive tendencies that would question their image of a rational and progressive Judaism, the most important of those tendencies being the Kabbalah that, e.g., in the account of Heinrich Graetz, is nothing but a symptom of the decay of Judaism.

Apart from the Kabbalah, the most important scene of conflict is the messianic tradition, i.e., the assumption that this world is not identical with the world to come but will finally undergo a transformation and redemption by a coming messiah—this is a complex and difficult tradition that was contested between Christians and Jews and played an ambivalent role in classic rabbinic Judaism, which feared the apocalyptic potential of messianism. Since the emancipation, liberal historians and philosophers like Heinrich Graetz or Hermann Cohen try to give this tradition a rational interpretation, equating it with moral progress. However, at the beginning of the twentieth century, it resurfaced in different contexts. In the exegesis of the New Testaments, scholars would stress the apocalyptic nature of Early Christianity which expected the imminent end of the world. The catastrophe of World War I led to the “Theology of Crisis” that stressed the downfall of the bourgeois world, critical thinkers such as Hugo Ball, Ernst Bloch, and Walter Benjamin associated the revolutions at the end of the war with an apocalyptic turnover and the emergence of a new mankind. Messianism becomes a form of radical utopianism that wants to break away from the liberal idea of progress towards a more revolutionary understanding of history, that would be more interested in the overturning of present conditions than in their reformation.

Scholem adopted these ideas with a decidedly anarchic twist. The messianic crisis of Sabbatianism became the center of his conception of the Kabbalah (see above part 2). And he would continue to emphasize Jewish Messianism as essentially “a theory of catastrophe” (MI 7) since the redemption it expects is “in no causal sense a result of previous history” (MI 109). This unrelatedness could be understood conservatively as in the mainline rabbinic Judaism which asks the Jews not to press the end, or in a more revolutionary sense, as in the apocalyptic traditions; and in fact it is this tension of different interpretation by which “ancient mythical images are filled with utopian content” (MI 6). In fact, it is precisely by relating those two contradictory terms that the Messianic idea receives its “vitality” and its “effective force” (MI 2), that leads to historical crises: For these different aspects could coexist in theory, “but they could not be united in their execution” (MI 22). Thus, every time the messianic expectation becomes acute, as in the Sabbatean crisis, the categorical boundary between this world and the world to come tends to collapse and the messianic furor tends to see the world to come as being already actual. Here too, we seem to face a case of “productive misunderstanding”: Even though the Messianic idea in principle contrasts the immanent and the transcendent, it also tends towards their conflation. It is by this conflation

that the Messianic idea devalued every historical action in its concrete execution. When the idea went beyond being a mere idea by entering into a messianic execution, it exploded in the course of this very execution. (LL 378)

It is by this conflation too that the Messianic Idea still continues to be effective in other conceptions of history:

The redemption is not the product of immanent developments such as we find it in modern Western reinterpretations of Messianism since the enlightenment, where, secularized as the belief in progress, messianism still displayed unbroken and immense vigor. (MI 10)

As the—always blurry—notion of secularization suggests, modern notions of history are both a misunderstanding of the Messianic idea and its consequence.

At times, Scholem elaborates this paradoxical relation of the Messianic idea to history into a general rule that a historical-political “dialectic” of history is both operative in his historiography and expresses his political experiences with Zionism. It concerns the relation of ideas to the historical reality and does not describe any regular progress but a paradoxical logic of unintended effects. In a drafted introduction to his book on Shabbetai Zvi he calls this relation, the “dialectics of truth”. Truth is only simple as long as it is abstract and general:

A contentious truth, […] a truth that lives and is ready to step out among the living does not retain its genteel simplicity for long. Its inner vitality will detonate that which is simple […]. The hidden side of truth is the emergence of its inner contradictions. (“Ursprünge, Widersprüche”, 119–120, [author’s translation])

History—at least the history of ideas—thus never progresses along straight lines, but always in detours and always through moments of crisis and rupture.

6. Research on Scholem

Scholem’s fame is reflected in the remarkable research devoted to his work, including a number of monographs. In 1979, David Biale provided the first introduction to Scholem with Gershom Scholem: Kabbalah and Counter-History, which focuses on the antagonistic and anarchistic impulse which shaped Scholem’s youthful Zionist rebellion as well as his later attempt to counter the bourgeois histories of liberal Judaism by writing the history of mysticism. Daniel Weidner (Gershom Scholem. Politisches, esoterisches und historiographisches Schreiben, 2003, translated as: The father of Jewish Mysticism. The writing of Gershom Scholem, 2022) focuses on the early years of Scholem, namely the laboratory of ideas of his early diaries and the formation of his academic approach to the history of religion. Amir Engel (Gershom Scholem: An Intellectual Biography, 2017) argues that Scholem’s emigration to Palestine induced a profound crisis in Scholem’s self-understanding, expressed in his engagement with Sabbatianism, and it was only after the Holocaust that Scholem identified more and more strongly with Israel. Noam Zadoff (Gershom Scholem: From Berlin to Jerusalem and Back, 2015 [2018]) focuses on the postwar period after which he oriented himself increasingly toward Europe and Germany. And Biale published another Study (Gershom Scholem: Master of the Kabbalah, 2018), emphasizing that it is precisely Scholem’s contradictoriness that makes him so interesting today.

These Monographs are supplemented by a number of other useful resources. Jay Howard Geller (2019) has reconstructed the story of the Scholem family, and Miriam Zadoff (2014) has presented a biography of his communist brother Werner. Eric Jacobson (2003) underscores the importance of anarchism, Christoph Schmidt (1998) analyzes the relation to political theology, and Ilit Ferber (2013) and Werner Hamacher (2014) deal with Scholem’s early theory of language. His relations to Martin Buber are explored by Klaus Davidowicz (1995) and Shaul Magid (2018), and his dialogue with Benjamin is subject of an important essay by Irving Wohlfahrt (1995). Robert Alter (1991) reads Scholem within the context of Jewish modernism, Stéphane Mosès (1992 [2009]) relates him to the Jewish theological tradition, and Andreas Kilcher (1998) to German Romanticism. With respect to Scholem’s historical research, there are so many valuable resources and discussions it is difficult to list them. Among the most important are Joseph Dan’s (1987) summary of Scholem’s findings, Eliezer Schweid’s (1983 [1985]) critique of Scholem’s image of biblical and rabbinic Judaism, Elisabeth Hamacher’s (1999) analysis of his relation to the phenomenology of religion, David Myers’ (1995) study of the context of twentieth century Jewish historiography, Boaz Huss’s (2005) stress on Scholem’s reluctance to engage with living kabbalists in the Yishuv, and Moshe Idel’s (1988) general and radical critique of Scholem’s account of the Kabbalah as limited insofar as it largely ignores the more practical and magical streams of the mystical tradition.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

[Br]
Briefe, Itta Shedletzky and Thomas Sparr (eds), 3 volumes, Munich: Beck, 1994–1999.
[Corr]
Briefwechsel 1933–1940, Gershom Scholem (ed.), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1980; translated as The Correspondence of Walter Benjamin and Gershom Scholem, 1932–1940, Gershom Gerhard Scholem (ed.), Gary Smith and Andre LeFevere (trans), New York: Schocken Books, 1989.
[FBJ]
Von Berlin nach Jerusalem : Jugenderinnerungen, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1977; translated as From Berlin to Jerusalem: Memories of My Youth, Harry Zohn (trans.), New York: Schocken Books, 1980.
  •
Kabbalah, Jerusalem: Keter, 1974.
[LY]
Lamentations of Youth: The Diaries of Gershom Scholem, 1913–1919, Anthony David Skinner (ed./trans.), Cambridge, MA: Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, 2007.
[LL]
A Life in Letters, 1914–1982, Anthony David Skinner (ed./trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2002.
[MT]
Major Trends in Jewish Mysticism (Hilda Stich Stroock Lectures 1938), Jerusalem: Schocken Publishing House, 1941. Third edition, London: Thames and Hudson, 1954. Page numbers to 1955 edition.
[MI]
The Messianic Idea in Judaism and Other Essays on Jewish Spirituality, New York: Schocken Books, 1971.
  •
“The Name of God and the Linguistic Theory of the Kabbala”, Simon Pleasance (trans.), Diogenes, 20(79): 59–80 and 20(80): 164–194, 1972. doi:10.1177/039219217202007903 doi:10.1177/039219217202008008
[JJC]
On Jews and Judaism in Crisis: Selected Essays, Werner J. Dannhauser (ed.), New York: Schocken Books, 1976.
  •
“On Our Language: A Confession”, Ora Wiskind (trans.), History and Memory, 2(2): 97–99, 1990.
[KS]
Zur Kabbala und ihrer Symbolik, Zürich: Rhein-Verlag, 1960; translated as On the Kabbalah and Its Symbolism, Ralph Manheim (trans.), New York: Schocken Books, 1965. Page numbers from the 1965 translation.
[MS]
Von der mystischen Gestalt der Gottheit: Studien zu Grundbegriffen der Kabbala, Zürich: Rhein-Verlag, 1962; translated as On the Mystical Shape of the Godhead: Basic Concepts in the Kabbalah, Jonathan Chipman (ed.); Joachim Neugroschel (trans.), New York: Schocken Books. Page numbers from the 1991 translation.
[PM]
On the Possibility of Jewish Mysticism in Our Time: & Other Essays, Avraham Shapira (ed.), Jonathan Chipman (trans.), Philadelphia, PA: Jewish Publication Society, 1997.
[SS]
Sabbatai Sevi: The Mystical Messiah, 1626–1676 (Bollingen Series 93), R. J. Zwi Werblowsky (trans.), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1973. A revised and augmented translation of the Hebrew edition, Shabtai Tsevi Ṿeha-Tenuʻah Ha-Shabtaʼit Bi-Yeme Ḥayaṿ, Tel Aviv: Am Oved, 1957.
  •
“Ursprünge, Widersprüche und Auswirkungen des Sabbatianismus”, in Judaica 5: Erlösung durch Sünde, edited and translated into German by Michael Brocke, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1992: 117–130.
  •
Walter Benjamin—Die Geschichte Einer Freundschaft, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Verlag, 1975; translated as Walter Benjamin: The Story of a Friendship, Harry Zohn (trans.), Philadelphia, PA: Jewish Publication Society of America, 1981.
  •
“Zehn unhistorische Sätze über Kabbala”, in Judaica 3: Studien zur jüdischen Mystik, Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1973: 264–271.

Secondary Sources

  • Alter, Robert, 1991, Necessary Angels: Tradition and Modernity in Kafka, Benjamin, and Scholem, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Biale, David, 1979 [1982], Gershom Scholem: Kabbalah and Counter-History, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1982; first published, 1979.
  • –––, 2018, Gershom Scholem: Master of the Kabbalah, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
  • Dan, Joseph, 1987, Gershom Scholem and the Mystical Dimension of Jewish History, New York: New York University Press.
  • Davidowicz, Klaus S., 1995, Gershom Scholem und Martin Buber: Die Geschichte eines Mißverständnisses, Neukirchen-Vluyn: Neukirchener Verlag.
  • Engel, Amir, 2017, Gershom Scholem: An Intellectual Biography, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Ferber, Ilit, 2013, “A Language of the Border: On Scholem’s Theory of Lament”, The Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy, 21(2): 161–186. doi:10.1163/1477285X-12341246
  • Ferber, Ilit and Paula Schwebel (eds), 2014, Lament in Jewish Thought: Philosophical, Theological, and Literary Perspectives (Perspectives on Jewish Texts and Contexts, volume 2), Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter. doi:10.1515/9783110339963
  • Geller, Jay Howard, 2019, The Scholems: A Story of the German-Jewish Bourgeoisie from Emancipation to Destruction, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Hamacher, Elisabeth, 1999, Gershom Scholem und die Allgemeine Religionsgeschichte (Religionsgeschichtliche Versuche und Vorarbeiten, 45), Berlin: W. de Gruyter. doi:10.1515/9783110807455
  • Hamacher, Werner, 2014, “Bemerkungen zur Klage”, in Ferber and Schwebel 2014: 89–110. doi:10.1515/9783110339963.89
  • Huss, Boaz, 2005, “Ask No Questions: Gershom Scholem and the Study of Contemporary Jewish Mysticism”, Modern Judaism, 25(2): 141–158. doi:10.1093/mj/kji010
  • Idel, Moshe, 1988, Kabbalah: New Perspectives, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
  • Jacobson, Eric, 2003, Metaphysics of the Profane: The Political Theology of Walter Benjamin and Gershom Scholem, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Kilcher, Andreas B., 1998, Die Sprachtheorie der Kabbala als ästhetisches Paradigma: die Konstruktion einer ästhetischen Kabbala seit der Frühen Neuzeit, Stuttgart: J.B. Metzler. doi:10.1007/978-3-476-03710-7
  • Magid, Shaul, 2018, “For the Sake of a Jewish Revival: Gershom Scholem on Hasidism and Its Relationship to Martin Buber”, in Scholar and Kabbalist: The Life and Work of Gershom Scholem (IJS Studies in Judaica 19), Mirjam Zadoff and Noam Zadoff (eds), Leiden/Boston: Brill, 40–75 (ch. 3). doi:10.1163/9789004387409_004
  • Mosès, Stéphane, 1992 [2009], L’Ange de l’histoire: Rosenzweig, Benjamin, Scholem (Couleur des idées), Paris: Seuil; translated as The Angel of History: Rosenzweig, Benjamin, Scholem (Cultural Memory in the Present), Barbara Harshav (trans.), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2009.
  • Myers, David N., 1995, Re-Inventing the Jewish Past: European Jewish Intellectuals and the Zionist Return to History (Studies in Jewish History), New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Schmidt, Christoph, 1998, “Der häretische Imperativ: Gershom Scholems Kabbala als politische Theologie?”, Zeitschrift für Religions- und Geistesgeschichte, 50(1): 61–83. doi:10.1163/157007398X00299
  • Schweid, Eliezer, 1983 [1985], Misṭiḳah ṿe-Yahadut le-fi Gershom Shalom: nituaḥ bikarti (Meḥkere Yerushalayim be-Maḥashevet Yiśraʼel, mossaf 2), Yerushalayim: Y. Magnes, ha-Universiṭah ha-ʻivrit; translated as Judaism and Mysticism According to Gershom Scholem: A Critical Analysis and Programmatic Discussion (Scholars Press Reprints and Translations Series), Caroline McCracken-Flesher (ed.), David Avraham Weiner (trans.), Atlanta, GA: Scholars Press, 1985.
  • Wasserstrom, Steven M., 1999, Religion after Religion: Gershom Scholem, Mircea Eliade, and Henry Corbin at Eranos, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Weidner, Daniel, 2003 [2022], Gershom Scholem: politisches, esoterisches und historiographisches Schreiben, München: W. Fink; translated as The Father of Jewish Mysticism: The Writing of Gershom Scholem (New Jewish Philosophy and Thought), Sage Anderson (trans.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 2022.
  • Wohlfahrt, Irving, 1995, “‘Haarscharf an der Grenze zwischen Religion und Nihilismus’: Zum Motiv des Zimzum bei Gershom Scholem”, in Gershom Scholem : Zwischen den Disziplinen, Peter Schäfer and Gary Smith (eds), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 176–256.
  • Zadoff, Mirjam, 2014 [2018], Der rote Hiob. Das Leben des Werner Scholem, München: Hanser Verlag; translated as Werner Scholem. A German Life, Dona Geyer (trans.) Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press 2018.
  • Zadoff, Noam, 2015 [2018], Mi-Berlin li-Yerushalayim uva-ḥazarah: Gershom Shalom ben Yiśraʼel ṿe-Germanyah, Yerushalayim: Merkaz Kovner; translated as Gershom Scholem: From Berlin to Jerusalem and Back: An Intellectual Biography (The Tauber Institute Series for the Study of European Jewry), Jeffrey Green (trans.), Waltham, MA: Brandeis University Press.

Other Internet Resources

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