1. Dodd (2007) and Friedell (2020) argue for this view; Juvshik (2018) argues against it.

2. The view that properties are tropes goes back at least to William of Ockham, and you might reasonably think that Locke, Berkeley, and Hume endorse this view. More recently, the view has been endorsed more recently by Stout (1921), Williams (1953a,b), Campbell (1990), and Moltmann (2013b).

3. One might think that something is missing from this new version of the One Over Many, for one might think that part of the problem is to account for how two different things could share a nature. But people like Devitt would presumably say that if you can account for how object a is F and also for how b is F, then you have accounted for how a and b share a nature.

4. It is worth pausing to note why this principle says only that we’re committed by the singular terms in simple sentences and the existential quantifiers in existential sentences. The reason is that some singular terms and existential quantifiers are not ontologically committing. For instance, if I say “If Santa Claus lives at the North Pole, then we should be able to find him”, I have not committed to the existence of Santa Claus; and if I say “If there is a God, then there is a tooth fairy”, I have not committed to the existence of a God or a tooth fairy. This problem is avoided by concentrating on

1. (a) singular terms within simple sentences, or atomic sentences, i.e., sentences of form “a is F”, “a is R-related to b”, “a, b, and c are S-related”, etc.; and
2. (b) existential quantifiers in what we are calling existential sentences, i.e., sentences in which the existential quantifier is the main logical operator, i.e., sentences of the form “There is an object such that…”.

Now, it would be wrong to say that these are the only sentences that are ontologically committing—e.g., we’re committed by the singular term and existential quantifier in the sentence “Mars is a planet and there exist some teeth”, and this sentence doesn’t fit into category (a) or (b)—but for present purposes, we can ignore such sentences and concentrate on sentences in categories (a) and (b).

5. Maddy did not take mathematical objects to exist outside of spacetime, so her view was not a version of platonism, as that view has been defined here. But she is included in this list because on some alternative definitions, she might count as a platonist, and she is often thought of as something like a platonist. In any event, we can say that her view has platonistic leanings, as is clear from the fact that it entails the existence of mathematical objects that are non-mental and, in some sense or other, non-physical (in particular, there is more to Maddian sets than the physical stuff that makes up their members).

6. Premise [5] is analytic and entirely trivial. And if we wanted to, we could make [6] analytic by stipulating that “abstract object” is to mean non-physical, non-mental object. (You might think that, intuitively, there are other kinds of objects—e.g., social objects; but it can be argued that such objects reduce to physical objects, mental objects, and abstract objects.)

7. In addition to fictionalism, there is a second (much more radical) way to claim that our mathematical theories are not true: one could endorse a non-cognitivist view of mathematics, claiming that sentences like “3 is prime” don’t really say anything at all and, hence, aren’t the sorts of things that have truth values. One such view is game formalism, which holds that mathematics is a game of symbol manipulation and that, e.g., “3 is prime” is one of the “legal results” of the game of arithmetic. This view was defended by Heine (1872) and Thomae (1898) and attacked vigorously by Frege (see Frege 1893/1903: §§88–131). One might also interpret Wittgenstein’s (1956) philosophy of mathematics as non-cognitivist, although this is controversial.

8. One might doubt that this paraphrase is really nominalistic; for it would seem to commit people to things like sentences and mathematical theories, and one might argue that these things are best thought of as abstract objects.

9. Someone like Davidson (1967) might claim that Boris believes the English sentence token (i.e., the one in the belief report) in virtue of the fact that it says-the-same as Russian sentence tokens that he believes. But the problem with this is that Boris has lots of beliefs that don’t correspond to any Russian sentence tokens. For instance, he presumably believes that 17.427 is greater than 13.961; but it’s unlikely that there has ever been a Russian sentence token that says this.

10. It needs to be kept in mind here that in formulating this argument for the existence of propositions, platonists do not commit to the view that all “that”-clauses are singular terms that denote propositions. Consider, e.g., the sentence “Ralph fears that the killer is coming”. One might very well doubt that this sentence says that Ralph fears a proposition; after all, since propositions are abstract objects, they are causally inert, and so they are not very scary—for instance, they can’t shoot people. One might take this as evidence that the “that”-clause in the above sentence (that is, in “Ralph fears that the killer is coming”) does not denote (or purport to denote) a proposition, and indeed, one might take it as evidence that this “that”-clause isn’t a singular term at all. There are a number of ways that platonists could try to respond to this: they might try to argue that despite appearances, the above “that”-clause does denote a proposition; or they might admit that it doesn’t denote a proposition (they might even admit that it’s not a singular term at all) and then argue that this doesn’t undermine the claim that the “that”-clauses in belief ascriptions denote propositions. We won’t pursue the question of how platonists ought to respond to challenges of this kind.

11. Frege’s view entailed that for every predicate, there is a concept and an extension of that concept, and as Russell pointed out in a letter to Frege, this leads to contradiction. Contemporary Fregeans, such as Boolos (1987), Wright (1983), and Anderson and Zalta (2004), have found ways to avoid the contradiction.

12. It might seem that if stories are best thought of as abstract objects, then fictionalism about things like mathematical objects and propositions is not a genuinely nominalistic view, because fictionalism seems to commit to the truth of sentences like “‘3 is prime’ is true in the story of mathematics”. But fictionalists can avoid this worry by taking a fictionalistic attitude about stories, or fictions. It might seem that this would lead them into an unacceptable regress, but it does not.

13. This interpretation of Gödel is a bit controversial. Evidence for it comes not just from his (1947), but also from his (1951). For more on the interpretation of Gödel, see C. Parsons (1995) and van Atten and Kennedy (2003).

14. For theories of how we could attain knowledge of consistency (and other logical knowledge) without this sort of information-transferring contact, see, e.g., Berry (forthcoming) and Balaguer (2021: chapter 6).

15. Leng (2022) argues that instead of starting with the assumption that FBP is true, platonists could start by assuming Hume’s principle—i.e., by assuming that the number of Fs = the number of Gs if and only if the Fs and the Gs are equinumerous; she argues that, given this assumption, platonists could construct a plausible naturalistic epistemology.