Aesthetics in Critical Theory

First published Tue Mar 25, 2025

Critical theory arose as a response to perceived inadequacies in Marxist theory, and perceived changes in modern capitalism. Critical theorists emphasized the ability of capitalism to shape the thought and experience of individuals: it distorts how modern society and its products appear to us, and how we think about them. So, aesthetic experience – like all other experience – is moulded to and compromised by capitalism. For critical theory, if we seek to understand aesthetics we need to acknowledge this distorting effect.

Critical theorists ask us to pay attention to how art, and aesthetic experience, suffer under capitalism, and become part of the way in which capitalism prevents the formation of a better life. They argue that art at all levels is succumbing to commodification – which is to say, is increasingly conforming to the demands of making profitable products, rather than the demands of producing good art. For critical theorists, commodification brings with it standardization and external influence incompatible with genuine artistic achievement. This concern applies both to popular culture and ‘high’ culture, although in different ways.

For critical theory, aesthetics and art are thus part of the wrong state of things: the world pervasively formed by instrumental reason, reification, and ideology. As a result, genuine art, and aesthetic experience, are increasingly being made less possible in capitalist society – as are uncompromised thought and life more generally.

However, critical theory also recommends art and aesthetic experience as part of the potential solution to this wrong state of things. Artworks and aesthetic experiences can overturn the delusive effects of capitalism, and disclose the genuine, changeable, nature of things. Through formal rigour and imaginative openness, art can expose contradictions, suppressed phenomena, and produce representations of alternative ways of living. Art’s liberating properties are thus aligned with formal experimentation.

1. History

As noted in the separate entry, critical theory can be thought of narrowly or broadly. Thought of broadly, ‘critical theory’ picks out philosophical work which combines a moral-political conviction that human flourishing is presently blocked, and a methodological conviction that interrogation of prevailing norms, practices, and concepts is necessary (but perhaps insufficient) to remove this blockage. Thought of narrowly, ‘critical theory’ picks out a specific area of philosophy animated by these twin convictions – the work of philosophers associated with the Frankfurt Institut für Sozialforschung (Institute for Social Research). This group is often referred to as the ‘Frankfurt School’.

This entry will use ‘critical theory’ in the narrow sense. This entry will be further narrowed by focusing almost exclusively on the first generation of the Frankfurt School. For economy, I will use ‘critical theory’ as shorthand for the more unwieldy ‘first-generation critical theory’. Closely related figures – like Walter Benjamin (1892–1940) and Ernst Bloch (1885–1977) – will not be collected under this phrase, but explicitly picked out as and when they are relevant.

The Frankfurt School is often spoken of as having three generations. Core figures in the first generation include Max Horkheimer (1895–1973), Theodor Adorno (1903–1969), and Herbert Marcuse (1898–1979). Horkheimer, who would become a close collaborator with Adorno, took directorship of the Institute in 1930. The Institute was closed by the Nazis in 1933. Horkheimer was instrumental in relocating and re-starting the Institute, eventually settling in America in 1934. Adorno and Marcuse followed. The most famous of their works would be Dialectic of Enlightenment (Adorno & Horkheimer 1944 [2002]), One-Dimensional Man (Marcuse 1964), and Negative Dialectics (Adorno 1966 [2006]). As important as this American context – and exposure to American popular culture – would be to their aesthetics, so too was the German cultural milieu of the 1920s and 1930s. For example, before joining the Institute Adorno had studied musical composition with the atonal composer Alban Berg (later commemorated in Adorno’s Alban Berg: Master of the Smallest Link, 1968 [1991]), befriended philosopher and critic Siegfried Kracauer, and written musical criticism for the journal, Musikblätter des Anbruch (Claussen 2008: 52–56, 102–106, 152). Walter Benjamin’s ideas were broadly disseminated via his friendship with Adorno (for more on their relationship, including with respect to aesthetics, see Rosen 2004, Buck-Morss 1977 & 1991, Nicholsen 1997b). The ideas of Georg Lukács and Ernst Bloch were also influential on the first-generation critical theorists, as we will see.

The second and third generations of critical theory are roughly marked by the coming to prominence of Jürgen Habermas (1929–) and Axel Honneth (1949–), respectively. The three generations are not merely distinguished by their personnel. There are important theoretical differences. The Cambridge Habermas Lexicon begins its ‘Aesthetics’ entry (Duvenage 2019) with the statement that ‘Whereas aesthetics plays an important role among the thinkers of the first generation … this is not so for Habermas.’’ (For an opposing view of Habermas’ relationship to aesthetics, however, see Duvenage 2003, McMahon 2011, Mackin 2022.) Honneth seldom mentions aesthetics (though see Honneth 2007). While there are valuable remarks on aesthetics in the work of both, then, they do not obviously belong in a discussion of the characteristic shape of the interface between critical theory and aesthetics. Critical theory’s distinctive treatment of aesthetics is thus confined largely to the first generation.

2. Why Does Critical Theory Have an Aesthetics?

In 1937’s ‘Traditional and Critical Theory’ Horkheimer offers the following statement about the programme he and his colleagues pursue, and its moral urgency –

If activity governed by reason is proper to man, then existent social practice, which forms the individual’s life down to its least details, is inhuman, and this inhumanity affects everything that goes on in the society …. The goal at which the [critical theorist] aims, namely the rational state of society, is forced upon him by present distress … It is the task of the critical theoretician to reduce the tension between his own insight and oppressed humanity in whose service he thinks …. (Horkheimer 1937 [2002: 210, 217, 221])

It is not surprising that this approach produced books with titles like Eclipse of Reason (Horkheimer 1947), One-Dimensional Man (Marcuse 1964) or Prophets of Deceit (Lowenthal & Guterman 1949). But the emergence of books with titles like Aesthetic Theory (Adorno 1970 [2004]), or The Aesthetic Dimension (Marcuse 1978) is perhaps harder to anticipate. Given the nature of critical theory, and its urgent pursuit of concrete improvement in people’s material and social lives, one might wonder why critical theory has an aesthetics at all.

One answer is that ‘critical theory’ has no need for an aesthetics. Its practitioners simply happened to like to think about art and did so. It is certainly true that many of the members of the first generation had biographical connections to, or a pre-established interest in, the world of art. But critical theory has an aesthetics for theoretical, not biographical, reasons. To make these reasons clear we need to take a detour through the work of Karl Marx (1818–1883), and then Georg Lukács (1885–1971).

2.1 Commodity Fetishism

Critical theory is grounded in a very particular approach to Marx, which emphasizes capitalism’s power to determine the world of individual thought and experience (see Kautzer 2017). This approach rests on a keen interest in commodity fetishism, a phenomenon which Marx discusses relatively briefly in volume one of Capital:

A commodity is … a mysterious thing, simply because in it the social character of men’s labour appears to them as an objective character stamped upon the product of that labour; because the relation of the producers to the sum total of their own labour is presented to them as a social relation, existing not between themselves, but between the products of their labour. This is the reason why the products of labour become commodities, social things …. This I call the Fetishism which attaches itself to the products of labour, so soon as they are produced as commodities, and which is therefore inseparable from the production of commodities. (Marx 1867 [1932: 83])

For Marx, commodity fetishism is an effect produced by the objective structure of social exchange. The buying and selling of goods draws equivalences between the goods exchanged. But this equivalence is performed not by comparing the labour time expended on those goods, but by comparing what appear to be properties of the commodities themselves. Price indices are driven by social facts about exchange and production; but these social facts vanish from view, and the prices themselves appear to be properties of objects. (“This gold bar is worth £__, and thus equivalent in value to 1,000 coats, 2,000 bricks and so on” – not “The socially necessary labour time involved in gold mining is such that a gold bar’s exchange value is expressed as …”). Capitalism thus presents itself as natural. This conceals the fact that exchange value arises not from the nature of things, but rather from the way we organize our labour. In turn, this conceals the fact that the way we organize our labour is not natural but in fact open to change.

On Marx’s account commodity fetishism affects the way in which we experience, and therefore theorize about, the social world. It conceals the true nature of capitalism. This concealment can be understood as something like an optical illusion. Marx uses the instructive analogy of the appearance of air:

The recent scientific discovery, that the products of labour, so far as they are values, are but material expressions of the human labour … by no means, dissipates the mist through which the social character of labour appears to us to be an objective character of the products themselves …. [T]his fact appears to the producers … to be just as real and final, as the fact, that, after the discovery by science of the component gases of air, the atmosphere itself remained unaltered. (Marx 1867 [1932: 85–86])

While the appearance of air – or of commodities – is not altered by our coming into scientific knowledge of their true constitution, the fact remains that we can and have acquired this knowledge in spite of that appearance. Thus, for Marx all that is needed to ‘see through’ commodity fetishism is to employ reason to enquire into what lies beneath the apparent nature of capitalism.

2.2 Reification

Lukács’ most influential work, History and Class Consciousness (1923), extends and revises Marx’s analysis of commodity fetishism. Unlike Marx, Lukács does not see capitalism as merely presenting a misleading appearance (as an optical illusion might) but exerting an effect on our very way of thinking and perceiving altogether (as a hallucination or delusion might). Accordingly, Lukács held commodity fetishism to have a systemic and general influence on consciousness. He used the term ‘Verdinglichung’ or ‘reification’ to name the broader effects he saw as stemming from commodity fetishism. Reification covers not only thought about or adjacent to the economy, but thought in general:

In the process we witness, illuminatingly, how here, too, the contemplative nature of man under capitalism makes its appearance … all issues are subjected to an increasingly formal and standardised treatment and in which there is an ever-increasing remoteness from the qualitative and material essence of the ‘things’ to which bureaucratic activity pertains. (Lukács 1923 [1971a: 97–99])

The richness and unpredictability of the world is glossed over by a form of thought which presumes complete agreement between abstract concepts and particular things. And this narrowing of thought is replicated in a narrowing of experience. Reification as a form of thought is grounded in and enforced by a broader tendency towards standardization which capitalism carries with it, from commodification (the increasing tendency to convert goods into products produced for exchange in line with the demands of the market), to bureaucratization (the administration of the social world according to inflexible rules), and so on. The claim, then, is that under capitalism we come to conceive of and experience the world in terms of general categories.

This is a problem because these general categories are, it is claimed, overly restrictive. The world has properties (causal, moral, and functional) which are not captured by these categories, and hence are excluded from reified thought and reified experience. Facts which might undermine the present social order (the exploitation integral to capitalist production, for example) are excluded from thought and experience. This also has moral implications. General moral and political categories (like ‘citizen’, ‘human’, ‘worker’, and so on) will tend towards excluding persons who do not conform to the restrictive standards these categories come with.

The idea of reification – if we hope to overcome it, or indeed to explain our ability to perceive it – requires us to posit some counter-reifying force. For Lukács, it is the proletariat (working class) that are (potentially) this force. The proletariat need only realize the exploitative nature of capitalist production and recognize that they have the power to change this process. The proletariat are necessarily always on the brink of this realization, in Lukács’ view, as their working conditions are intrinsically counter-reifying. They themselves are the contingent human labour which is concealed by the apparently natural and necessary world of capitalism and commodities.

2.3 Critical Theory’s Account of Reification

While Lukács’ account of reification exerted great influence on the Frankfurt School (see Feenberg 2017, Kavoulakos 2017), the proletarian strand of his thought did not. Returning to Horkheimer’s seminal “Traditional and Critical Theory” we find the following remark:

But it must be added that even the situation of the proletariat is, in this society, no guarantee of correct knowledge. … Even to the proletariat the world superficially seems quite different than it really is (Horkheimer 1937 [2002: 213–214]).

This leaves critical theory in a difficult position. If reification is total, and counter-reifying forces are totally absent, then Horkheimer’s claim to be thinking in ‘service of’ those oppressed by capitalism is incoherent. Critical theory requires a counter-reifying force to explain how it can perceive and see beyond the epistemic errors produced by reification.

For Marx, commodity fetishism was a problem with the comprehension of labour, which could be solved either through reading more accurate literature about labour (hence the writing of Capital), or better acquainting oneself with the reality of the production process (hence Marx’s ability to write Capital). Lukács appears to identify revolutionary proletarian consciousness as the means to undo the effects of reification, although the mechanics of its formation are not entirely clear. For critical theory, by contrast, commodity fetishism and reification are not problems which can be overcome by modifying either the content of experience (by reading Capital, say) or the social position of the experiencer. One can learn as much as possible about the conditions of the working class, and be as close to the production process as one likes, but reification will still obtain.

For critical theory, reification is a problem with the very form of experience itself; and the solution to reification will come through processes which can engage and manipulate that form of experience. Thus, for critical theory reification is an aesthetic problem in its original and broadest sense: as concerned with the realm of sensible experience.

Critical theory’s task will be to find avenues which can disrupt the influence of reification and make the genuine state of things – and the genuine possibilities for change – open to thought and experience. Several avenues for producing this effect were explored, but chief among them was art, and aesthetic experience.

3. The Problem of Commodification

Lukács, whose early work had been so influential on Critical theory, later became much closer to Soviet orthodoxy, even to the extent that he repudiated his earlier work on reification. He also broke with his earlier, equally influential, work on aesthetics (like 1910’s Soul and Form). Here too Lukács moved into closer alignment with Soviet thought. The Soviet art movement known as Socialist realism explicitly thematized concrete social and political factors in art, in order to instil a correct understanding of them in the art appreciator. Lukács was not uncritical of the actual implementation of this movement, especially under Stalin (Lukács 1971b: 116–130), and nor does he deny the quality and power of the ‘critical realists’ who likewise include concrete historical detail, but without explicit socialist ideology (Lukács 1971b, chapters 2 and 3). But above all it is realism in opposition to the ‘decadent formalism’ (Lukács 1971b: 133–135) of modernism that Lukács urged as best serving the moral and political aims of Marxism.

Adorno, Marcuse, and Benjamin, by contrast, found their favourite examples of the liberating power of art in multiple schools and time periods, including modernism, nearly all of which refused any overt political content. They also openly questioned the efficacy and quality of much political art (see, e.g., Marcuse 1978: 19; 33–39, Schoolman 1976: 58–60, Klassen & Blumenfeld 2018, Adorno 1961 [1977a], 1977b). This rejection was seen by many, including the later Lukács, as evidence of elitism, political disengagement, and immoral indifference to the world at large (see Zuidervaart 1994: 28–44 for an overview).

However, critical theory’s rejection of ‘politically engaged’ art is not driven by disagreement with the politics of such artworks. Rather, it stems from an apparently apolitical disagreement about the necessary and appropriate relationship between content and form. critical theory generally emphasizes the primacy of form in explaining both art’s achievement and its counter-reifying effects (see Hartle 2018 for an overview of the development of this position). The demands of such formal success are (it is claimed) incompatible with direct political engagement. To clarify this, we need to look more closely at what form and content mean in this context.

3.1 Form and Content

For critical theory, aesthetic value is reducible neither to form nor content. A complex relationship between the two is at the core of critical theory’s aesthetics. It is claimed that form and content are inextricable and mutually informing. But here again, we should not confuse this with more familiar positions. The claim is not that form and content are identical (as in A.C. Bradley’s infamous claim in 1909’s Oxford Lectures on Poetry, or Cleanth Brooks’ (1947: 192–215) ‘Heresy of Paraphrase’). Rather, the claim most often advanced is that content is converted into, or ‘sedimented into’, form while still not becoming identical with it.

This idea requires further explanation. When Marcuse and Adorno claim that content is converted into form within art, they are best understood not as advancing the claim that the surface themes and content of the artwork are rendered formal, but as claiming that the meaning of the artwork is expressed primarily by the formal properties of the artwork.

For example, while Kafka’s The Trial has as its surface content a story about a man who is subjected to an interminable and senseless trial for an unknown crime, its true meaning (according to Adorno) is an expression of certain features of capitalism (see further O’Connor 2013). This expression of its deeper meaning is achieved through the texture and organization of the novel itself, rather than in its apparent themes. Nowhere does The Trial baldly state that capitalism has produced an absurd and inhuman form of life. Nor, importantly, is it necessary that Kafka believed such a thing. Critical theory’s claim is that the truth of life under capitalism is in some way communicated to the form of artworks directly. (Some problems with this view are presented in section 3.3.)

To see why content must be converted into form in this way for art to be successful, and why this seemingly abstruse issue prevents critical theorists from endorsing expressly political art, we need to look once more at reification.

The theory of reification claims that thought has taken on a characteristically abstract and instrumental character. It is this form of thought which ultimately underlies the persistence and dangers of capitalism. Anything which can be assimilated by this form of thought is rendered exchangeable and serves as evidence of the appropriateness of that form of thought itself. This means that moral or political claims in art can themselves become part of their commodity value, and fail to disrupt the form of thought which caused the moral or political injuries that motivated the art itself. The dissenting novel, music, or film is something which for all its sincerity is still offered alongside all the others, and whose mode of delivery and consumption replicates, and vindicates, the very form of exchange – and hence consciousness – it seeks to undermine.

3.2 Avoiding Commodification

If art is able to show a form of life and thought outside of capitalism, then it must resist absorption by the characteristic structure of capitalism. Via Marx, critical theorists see the characteristic structure of capitalism as commodity exchange. Commodity exchange has the characteristic function of rendering objects perfectly exchangeable by assigning them monetary value. Via Lukács, critical theorists see commodity exchange also having a characteristic, reified kind of experience and thought – that which sees objects as all conforming to general laws, concepts, and types.

From this, we see that successful art must resist being easily turned into a generic commodity, and must also resist being formed by and wholly comprehensible through pre-set types. In art’s case, these pre-set types would include compositional conventions, cliches, platitudes and the like.

These are structural reasons why art must resist easy adoption by the market (and, in turn, audiences). It must also resist easy adoption to avoid contradicting its own meaning. If art is aimed against exchangeability and cliché, then it must also be aimed against having its content easily converted into products and clichés.

This is why form is primary in understanding art’s ability to undo the effects of reification. It is only through the problematization of the relationship between form and content, and art and its consumption, that the meaning of an artwork can be protected from commodification and nullification. Art is obliged to ceaselessly formally innovate, and to ceaselessly reject pre-set established compositional norms.

In this way, art’s meaning – its critical relationship to capitalism – is communicated in its form, and not in its explicit subject matter. Artworks avoid baldly stating claims about the inhumanity of contemporary society – these could become slogans; be resold and defused – and instead show it through their challenging formal organization.

How, exactly, this critical content becomes converted into formal properties is not clear. Nor is it clear how broad social problems come to be encapsulated in specific artworks authored by specific artists. This is a problem which critical theory never fully mastered. In Adorno’s work, there is no suggestion that this formalization of content is a product of the artist’s conscious or subconscious intention. Rather, the process is ‘blind’, and the social content enters the artwork, and creative process, not as thematic content but as formal problems with which the artist is faced (see Hulatt 2016a).

Marcuse (1978: 14–15), for his part, likewise emphasizes the migration of social content into form, and notes that it is a central perplexity in Marxist aesthetics. In a move which mirrors Adorno’s attempt to see social problems as translated into artistic problems, Marcuse (1978: 41) explains this migration partly in terms of the social preformation of the meaning of artistic materials. The very stuff out of which art is made (‘word, colour, tone’) carries socially encoded meanings, expectations and conventions. This ‘limitation of aesthetic autonomy’, he writes, ‘is the condition under which art can become a social factor’.

Unlike Adorno, however, Marcuse also sees art as a repository of ‘transhistorical’ truths and features. These relate both to certain core definitional features of art and aesthetic response (Marcuse 1978: 15–16) and to core features of the transhistorical ‘species being’ he sees as underlying human experience (Marcuse 1978: 29). Marcuse introduces these non-historicist elements in order to rule out a reductive Marxist account which would claim that art’s function, quality and meaning is chained to its society and class position. Marcuse holds that aesthetic properties cannot be so reducible, as this would render our appreciation of artworks across epochs and economic systems inexplicable. Further, it would nullify art’s important ability to speak beyond and outstrip contemporary ideals and norms.

While for Adorno art’s relationship to its social content was thoroughly hostile – both in its defiance of contemporary norms, and its demonstration of the revisability of those norms – Marcuse offers a more variegated picture. Art critically engages with and negates society, but also describes unrealized potentials for improvement (see, e.g., Marcuse 2006: 140–149). This difference between the two thinkers will be discussed further in section 4.

3.3 Popular Culture

Adorno and Horkheimer coined the phrase ‘Culture Industry’ in their jointly authored book Dialectic of Enlightenment. It was intended ironically, as an insulting oxymoron. This irony has been overtaken by history. The music and film spheres, for example, proudly refer to themselves as industries. This outcome illustrates, after a fashion, the thesis and limits of critical theory’s critique of popular culture.

To critical theory, culture is in a process of coming to an end. This coming to an end is precipitated by ever-increasing strength of norms of exchange and standardization (‘industry’) in controlling the production of art (‘culture’) (see further Hulatt 2016b). This thesis is developed in part sociologically, through examination of the mechanics of radio transmission, the nascent Hollywood system, the distribution and sale of records, and so on. Empirical research into this claim was pursued in various ways, including the Princeton Radio Research Project at which Adorno worked once he arrived in America (see further Jenemann 2007).

The thesis was also developed through aesthetic analysis of popular culture itself. Critical theory found Western popular artforms wanting, judging whole genres and media devoid of merit. Adorno’s criticisms of specific popular artworks were often mordant and unsympathetic, and have had an outsize effect on perception of critical theory’s stance towards popular culture. It can appear that critical theory simply rejects popular culture as inferior, and seeks a return to the kind of high culture many critical theorists enjoyed in fin-de-siecle Germany. Such snobbery would appear particularly odd in supposedly radical Marxist philosophy. However, the broader account of popular culture – its superiority to ‘high culture’ in some respects, and the tragedy of its unrealized technical potential – is innovative and often overlooked.

In a 1936 letter to Benjamin, Adorno remarks that popular and ‘high’ art are ‘two torn halves, which do not add up to a whole’ (Adorno 1977c: 123). This remark conveys a number of things which must be borne in mind. The existence of two separate spheres of popular culture and high art is a reflection of the wrong state of things – their opposition and polarization would not be part of a good society. Both popular culture and high-art have capacities and deficiencies which the other lacks – indeed, they each form a mirror image of the other. However, these two spheres of culture cannot be re-unified by sheer force of will – they do not add up to a unified whole, because they have been objectively driven apart by the nature of the social whole. (Marcuse 1965 takes a similar view.)

We see, then, that Adorno does not see popular culture as merely coarse product. It in fact preserves properties key to art, and serves as a rebuke to ‘high’ culture. For example, popular music is pleasant to listen to, and more or less immediately accessible. This kind of accessibility and pleasure is part of what ideal art would be – and it is part of the failure of modern art that it has been forced to lose both its accessibility and its beauty. (We will enter into the reasons why it suffers this loss momentarily.) Adorno is also not blind to the economic injustices which govern the world of high art – the leisure time and disposable income necessary to acquire a taste in classical music for example.

Conversely, classical music has the virtue that it delivers on what it promises – genuine novelty, pure aesthetic satisfaction and formal achievement. By contrast, popular music promises novelty, ungoverned satisfaction of impulses, and perhaps some associated lifestyle, but is forced to repeatedly renege on these promises (see for example Adorno’s discussion of syncopation in Jazz, in Lewandowski 1996). One way of putting Adorno’s point is that popular culture is not objectionable because it stimulates the passions, but because it does not truly satisfy them (Rebentisch & Trautmann 2019: 22–23). This criticism is shared by Marcuse, who sees increasingly permissive popular culture not as objectionable because it is permissive (he is in favour of relaxed sexual mores, for instance) but because it never delivers on its promise. For Marcuse the release of emotions in cultural products – be they sexual longing, political frustration, or repressed aggression – is allowed just enough to ensure the popularity of the product, and not explored in its full transformative power.

This idea of reneging on promises also underwrites Adorno’s criticism of movements to popularize high culture. For example, Adorno deeply objected to the transmission of performances of Beethoven over the radio. This was not because Beethoven was too good for the public, but because the technology involved was not good enough for the public. The genuine experience of a live performance was being replaced by a low resolution transmission – and the public were invited to believe they had received the genuine article. (Or so Adorno claims, Adorno 1945: 209–210.)

This thread runs through critical theory’s treatment of popular culture – not a suspicion of popularity, accessibility, or pleasurability, but a suspicion of the failure to genuinely provide these things. Popular music and cinema promise excitement and novelty – but in fact work according to pre-set schema. Popular media promises to bring excitement of high culture into the home – but in fact the transmission is poor, and incapable of properly conveying what you wish to listen to. This is the mirror image of high culture’s failure. Quoting Brecht, Adorno notes that culture’s ‘mansion is built out of dogshit’ (Adorno 2006: 366). By this he means that high culture is dependent on a society whose inequality and inhumanity makes the better form of life high art outlines ever more impossible. (For more on the role of Brecht in Adorno’s thought, see Rothe 2018.)

Under capitalism, both high culture and popular culture are not good enough for the public; not vice versa.

4. Aesthetic Experience Against Reification

In section 3.2, the counter-reifying force of art was explained negatively. The unusual formal organization of artworks serves to protect their content from being nullified by the effects of commodification and reification. But the position is not simply that the artwork conceals its meaning such that it cannot be easily commodified. It is that the meaning of the artwork in some fashion breaks with and undermines the false consciousness it has been protected against. Art is thus not merely defensively organized, but aggressively organized also. It does not merely elude reification, but actively combats it.

This claim is one of the more vexed and complex elements of critical theory’s aesthetics. To anticipate, it will be the subject’s experience of the artwork which is held to have this aggressive counter-reifying effect. That experience will be elicited by the appreciator’s active participation in attending to the form/content organization of the artwork.

The counter-reifying effect of art appears to be socio-historically specific (it can be lost over time) and critical (the artwork appears to indict and overturn certain pathologies of thought and social organization). In this section we will look more closely at how various critical theorists explain this view.

4.1 Ernst Bloch

We can find one source of this idea in the work of a contemporary, Ernst Bloch, who had a marked influence on the Frankfurt School. Bloch saw art as combining a faithful account of both the current state of things, and of possibilities usually ignored. This is the ‘not-yet’ which Bloch saw as concealed by conventional experience, but forcibly disclosed by the successful artwork (as well as other cultural products – see Kellner and O’Hara 1976). The utopian aspect to the artwork – its representation of another form of life – is in some sense fantastical and imaginary. It is not a depiction of how things are, but a depiction of how they genuinely might be. But in this way, art discloses the close proximity of another way of ordering life, and the malleability of that which appeared as necessary and natural (see Moir 2018, Levitas 1990).

As with Adorno and Marcuse, Bloch apparently paradoxically combines a keen attention to the formal constitution of the artwork and its autonomy (Bloch 2000: 118) with a commitment to the claim that social conditions enter into the artwork (Bloch 2000: 129–141). Crucially, it is the combination of the autonomous processes of art and the participation of the appreciator which yields up a disruptive experience (Bloch 2000: 143). This disruption within the aesthetic experience serves to point beyond the integration of the artwork’s form and its material; and via the relationship between the artwork and the social content it integrates, it likewise points beyond the established social order (Bloch 2000: 117, 149, 155–156). This is the utopian moment integral to great art, for Bloch. In Spirit of Utopia Bloch largely develops this thought through analysis of music, but in later works like Principle of Hope (Bloch 1954–59), the same approach is recapitulated and applied not only to the various artistic media, but other cultural areas also (see Bloch 1989).

This core vision – of the artwork as eliciting in aesthetic experience a changed outlook on a reified society – is inherited by both Adorno and Marcuse. But both revise Bloch’s approach in differing ways.

4.2 Adorno

For Adorno art does not directly show the world as it really is, but makes plain the contradictions and distortions internal to reified consciousness itself. Rather than disclosing new potentials for action and change, art instead discloses the full estrangement between reified consciousness and the world. In other words genuine aesthetic experience is a process of disillusionment. Our reified consciousness perceives no obvious difference between the world as we take it to be, and the world as it is. But art forcibly discloses this difference. The art appreciator comes to learn the depth and extent of their ignorance, and the urgency of breaking with the dominant form of thought. The utopianism of Bloch reappears in a more muted form – art gives us awareness that the demands and tendencies of capitalist society are not absolute but could in principle change. Adorno’s caveat is that we do not know how or in what direction this change should be effected. This is due to the broader ethical dislocation produced by modern society. (For differing takes on Adorno’s negative ethics see Finlayson 2002, Freyenhagen 2011, 2013, Bernstein 2001; a transcribed discussion between Adorno and Bloch on the nature of utopian thinking provides useful further detail, in Bloch 1989: 1–18).

The way in which art demonstrates the disconnection between reified thought and the world is highly complex. We can say that for Adorno art engages the conceptual structure of thought and experience, and guides it such that this structure is lead to collapse in the course of its being applied. This is a power it shares with philosophy, with the key difference that philosophy achieves this explicitly – through manipulation of and argument about concepts in the course of their application in thought – and art accomplishes it through the manipulation of aesthetic material. To answer how the ‘hermetically sealed’ artwork is able to do this, we would need to spell out Adorno’s claim that extra-aesthetic content is sedimented into formal aesthetic problematics in individual artworks. This is beyond the scope of the present entry (but see Hulatt 2016a, Nicholsen 1997a, Paddison 2011, Sherratt 2009: 169–209).

4.3 Marcuse

Marcuse sees artworks as having a liberating potential, and as disclosing to us possibilities for change. Art discloses these possibilities in both a destructive and creative way. It is destructive in that it serves as an ‘indictment’ of certain governing forms of thought and experience. But it is also creative; art serves to re-present the genuine state of things, and thus uncovers the objective potentials for ‘liberation’ which are concealed there (Marcuse 1978: 6). Marcuse’s work can thus be understood as an amalgam of some of the formal sophistication of Adorno’s aesthetics with the utopian emphasis of Bloch’s account.

For Bloch and Adorno, engagement with the artwork leads in radically differing directions. For Adorno, aesthetic experience does not point towards a better future, nor show any signs of such a future in the present. It rather shows the inhumanity of the present. This is the ‘indictment’ Marcuse likewise finds in art. For Bloch, by contrast, aesthetic experience presents an account of the genuine state of things, which includes already existing anticipations of a better form of life. These ‘anticipations’ provide the intelligible, if incomplete, link between the present and the utopia that could emerge from it. These Marcuse often refers to as moments of ‘liberation’.

It may seem that the two points from Bloch and Adorno are in tension, and thus that Marcuse is ill-advised to try to combine them. However, Marcuse introduces a third theoretic element which resolves the apparent tension – the work of Sigmund Freud (1856–1939). The rational, critical element of Marcuse’s account conforms significantly to Adorno’s approach – but the utopianism of Bloch is recast in a psychoanalytic register.

Marcuse understands the utopian function of art to be discharged by its ability to facilitate ‘desublimation’ – the expression of repressed urges. This should not be confused with catharsis. Catharsis – in which emotions are activated and then ‘purged’ – leaves the subject pacified, free of the troublesome energies that were activated. This pacifying effect of catharsis in art is criticized by Marcuse, and desublimation is held to avoid it.

For Marcuse, desublimation is an expression of repressed emotions, urges and potentialities of which the appreciator was unaware. On learning of their existence, the appreciator is made aware of ‘repressed potentialities of man and nature’ and is granted an ‘emancipation of sensibility’ which points towards the form of life, and of sensibility, which revolution would bring about (Marcuse 1978: 8–9; see further 43–44). This is continuous with Marcuse’s broader political program, for which a better world would not only entail re-organization of the structure of society, but also of the psychological structure that society imposes on individuals (see Kellner 1999, Marcuse 1955).

For Marcuse, then, the aesthetic experience is both critical and rationally ordered, and an arena for the liberation of drives, emotions and potentials. These respectively articulate the contradictions and intolerability of the present, and unharness the libidinal resources which could realize the potential for a better future.

5. Natural beauty

In the 20th century philosophers – anglophone and non-anglophone – largely shifted away from discussing the aesthetics of nature. The Frankfurt School were a marked exception to this tendency. In their emphasis on the moral and aesthetic significance of nature’s beauty, critical theorists anticipate many features of contemporary work in environmental aesthetics. Like environmental aestheticians, critical theorists understand our appreciation of nature’s beauty to be morally significant. They also likewise see aesthetic appreciation of nature to be bound up with the recognition of and resistance to humanity’s destruction and exploitation of nature.

Critical theorists differ sharply from contemporary environmental aestheticians, however, in their account of what carries this moral significance. It is not nature ‘in itself’, without human interference, that is of prime importance. Any idea of nature being ahistorically beautiful ‘in itself’ is rejected. It is nature in relation to our current human capacities, needs, and projects which carries both beauty and a moral impetus to relate to nature in a less damaging fashion.

This section will touch briefly on some of the distinctive features of their work on this theme.

5.1 Nature and History

Adorno, Horkheimer, and Marcuse consistently problematized the distinction between nature and history. They did not claim that nature – as picked out by the physical sciences – was historically relative. They rather claimed that the concept (and experience) of nature – as a realm of facts and values outside of human control – was historically determined in its content and means of application.

When Adorno and Horkheimer claim that what is natural is historical they are interested in normative conceptions of nature which are used either to make the contingent appear necessary (‘capitalism simply follows human nature’) or to advocate for inhumane treatment of persons. Likewise, they propose that nature as experienced is influenced by these historical factors. (Adorno’s complex account of nature is developed in its various strands in Cook 2011, Vogel 1996: 51–101, Flodin 2018, 2022.)

Natural beauty in both its scope (what counts as natural) and quality (those aesthetic properties which can attach in virtue of an object’s being natural) is seen as a historical phenomenon (Hammer 2015: 45–72). This further means that natural beauty stands under the threat of cliché, ideological misuse, and co-optation, just as artworks do. Simply, the aesthetic properties of nature shift across time – and what is thus appropriate in judging natural beauty likewise develops over time (Daniels 2020).

Any well-developed aesthetics of nature includes not only a criterion of appropriate judgement, but also a criterion of the appropriate objects of judgement. Trivially, aesthetic judgements of nature cannot be well-formed when aimed at an object which is the product of, and perceived under the description of, complete artificiality. Conventionally, the meaningful debate to be had is over what degree, if any, objects produced by artifice are appropriate objects of the appreciation of natural beauty.

Critical theory adds a unique complication to this debate. It denies that the merely natural is an appropriate object for aesthetic experience (Johnson 2011). We will explore this in the next section.

5.2 Mere Nature

Critical theory sets a high store on the aesthetic experience of nature, but not on the experience of mere nature. This is made particularly stark in Aesthetic Theory, where Adorno compares raw nature with industrial materials:

[N]ature that has not been pacified by human cultivation, nature over which no human hand has passed – alpine moraines and taluses – resembles … industrial mountains of debris. … [Human artifice] is said to have ravished nature, yet under transformed relations of production it would just as easily be able to assist nature and on this sad earth help it to attain what perhaps it wants. … [I]n every particular aesthetic experience of nature the social whole is lodged. Society … determines what nature means[.] (Adorno 1970 [2004: 89])

This rejection of an aesthetics of nature in the raw is combined with a keen interest in natural beauty. This appears paradoxical, but can be elucidated through comparison with contemporary environmental aesthetics.

For environmental aesthetics, mere nature is indeed an appropriate object of aesthetic attention (see, e.g., Budd 1996: 211–213, Saito 1998). The properties of mere nature, as opposed to artworks, are held to undermine some traditional dichotomies. For example, Ronald Hepburn (1966) influentially observed that nature needs to be ‘framelessly’ appreciated as an enclosing space. The usual strict separation between an art-object and its environs is not present, as nature is both the immediate object of interest (a copse of trees, for example) and the enclosure continuous with the object (the vista in which the copse is situated). Separately, it has been claimed that appropriate aesthetic appreciation of nature benefits from, or requires, theoretical understanding of nature itself and its structure (for examples of such scientific cognitivism, see Carlson 1979, Eaton 1998, Parsons 2006). Such scientifically grounded appreciation of nature is held to be objective appreciation of nature as what it is.

Critical theory’s rejection of mere nature can be seen as stemming from a similar desire to appreciate nature ‘as what it is’, and a similar conviction that doing so will dissolve the oppositions and dichotomies familiar from art. But critical theory urges us to further dissolve the dichotomy between nature and human artifice itself.

Adorno, Horkheimer, and Marcuse see nature and humanity as not separate but continuous (for an overview of this, and its relation to Lukács and Marx, see Feenberg 1981: 240–255). And so proper contemplation of nature ‘as-it-is’ is of nature-for-us, as parts of that nature. Mere nature is nature which stands opposed to us, and which we are approaching as if it were radically different to us, rather than a fellow piece of nature. This is why Adorno sees untamed nature as resembling unrefined industrial material – in both cases (the merely natural; the industrial byproduct) we have objects which appear to stand opposed to human need, and present as hostile to us.

This is what stands behind remarks by both Adorno and Marcuse to the effect that both humanity and nature are not fully realized. Nature by itself, for Adorno and Marcuse, is unreconciled and hostile towards humans, who are themselves part of nature. For nature’s own benefit, a different kind of relationship between humans and nature is required. And natural beauty is held to point towards it (Krebber 2020: 184–186).

It is common to find in environmental aesthetics an admission that the area of enquiry is bound up either with moral intuitions about nature’s value, or in some way importantly tied to a broader moral project of environmental conservation and transformation (e.g. Saito 1984, Saito 2018, Carlson 2018, Alcaraz León 2022, Carlson & Lintott 2008). Here again, Adorno and Marcuse can be understood as sharing this feature and transforming it. Their environmental aesthetics is not embedded in care for nature-without-humans, but for nature-for-humans, and correlatively, humans-for-nature.

5.3 Reconciliation, Ruins and Landscapes

Adorno and Marcuse embed aesthetic response to nature into a broader project of reconceiving and reorienting the relationship between humanity and nature. Following on from a myriad of influences (some anthropological – chiefly Henri Hubert and Marcel Mauss (1902–1903), James George Frazer (1890), and Roger Caillois (e.g., 1937) – and some philosophical) critical theory understands the relationship between humanity and nature to have been predominantly ‘dominating’, just as humanity’s relationship to itself has been dominating and oppressive. Similarly, just as aesthetic experience offers a vision of a different order of social being, so too does aesthetic experience of nature offer a vision of a reconciled relationship between human agency and nature.

Mere nature, then, is ineligible to produce such an insight, as mere nature is outside of and opposed to a relationship with humanity. This leads Adorno to find images of reconciliation in, paradoxically, images of bygone eras of the exploitation of nature. Here Adorno intersects with the rich aesthetic traditions of both the picturesque and the ruin, but brings a very different sensibility to these phenomena. In Aesthetic Theory he writes,

Historical works are often considered beautiful that have some relation to their geographical setting, as for instance hillside towns that are related to their setting by the use of its stone …. So long as progress … does violence to the surface of the earth, it will be impossible – in spite of all proof to the contrary – completely to counter the perception that what antedates the trend is in its backwardness better and more humane. (Adorno 1970 [2004: 84])

What grounds Adorno’s positive aesthetic evaluation here is the image of a relationship between nature and humanity which, from our timeframe, appears more pacified. Given the environmentally disastrous logic of modern society, the images of a reconciled, utopian relationship to nature can be found only retrospectively, in the image of the less-bad relationships to nature which have now passed away.

6. Conclusion – Critical Theory and Aesthetics

We can pick out four features of critical theory’s distinctive treatment of aesthetics. The first of these is a product of critical theory’s general methodology at that time. First generation critical theory largely holds that any object of experience or theory is a part in and reflective of a social totality of facts and processes (see further Jay 1992). The form and depth of this ‘reflection’ varies; but the general view is that any element of this totality could be determined by, and inform us about, any other. This warrants speculative kinds of philosophical interpretation, in which facts apparently limited to one sphere (of logic, or psychology, say) are in fact determined by and reflective of apparently disconnected spheres (of economic exchange, or social institutions, say). Art is no exception to this approach. Both works of high art and ephemeral pieces of pop culture can have philosophical, social, and political content as parts of their objective constitution.

Secondly, this emphasis on the philosophical richness of art is combined with a primary interest in aesthetic form. In turn, this amalgam is wedded to a conviction that aesthetic experience – despite being formally rigorous and content-laden – can offer a form of insight unavailable through conventional conceptual reasoning. This insight – precisely by being a break with the kind of experience moulded to the ‘wrong state of things’ – is held to have emancipatory promise.

Thirdly, the tensions and instabilities between these jointly held aesthetic methodologies are not accidental, but intentional. Critical theory refuses to attempt to deliver static definitions, but also refuses to do without such definitions. (It is neither ‘rationalized’, nor irrational.) Art really does have general features; but successful artworks always both engage and destabilize general concepts. There is an emphasis on the necessity of using concepts to understand art, and on the ability of artworks to ultimately elude conceptual capture. This complex approach – which is incapable of delivering a closed definition of art or aesthetic value – is intended to prioritize fidelity to aesthetic experience over dogmatic conceptual structures.

Fourthly, and following from the preceding three features, there is the seemingly paradoxical conviction that artworks are political and practical via their very refusal of explicit politics and practicality. It is artworks of surpassing quality, attended to for their own sake, that have a liberating potential. Critical theory tends to assume (and sometimes explicitly argue) that artists who primarily pursue a non-artistic goal in their art (political or otherwise) cannot realize this level of quality, and art-appreciators who seek a pay-off in art (political or otherwise) cannot properly attend to the value of artworks.

These four features all reach their most extreme expression in the work of Theodor Adorno. But they are also pursued at differing levels of extremity and emphasis in other critical theorists and thinkers associated with them, most obviously Marcuse, Benjamin and Bloch.

For critical theorists, there is a balance to be struck between analysing art – and hence articulating it in conceptual terms – and making clear the importance of the artwork’s ability to outstrip concepts altogether. The preceding has been an account of the ways in which critical theory has explored and handled this demanding balancing act, and the broader theoretic considerations which, together with the artworks investigated, entered into that balance.

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Owen Hulatt <owen.hulatt@york.ac.uk>

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