1. “(…) the soul is that by which the animate substance—I mean that which admits of life—is realized as substance” (al-Fārābī PA: 116).

2. The only treatise where the natural world is described as emanated from the agent intellect is The Treatise on the Intellect. In The Political Regime and The Virtuous City, however, this task is assigned to the celestial spheres.

3. For further analysis and discussion on the influence and causation of the heavenly bodies see Druart 1981: 35–45.

4. Cf. Hansberger 2008: 73 and 2010: 158; Daiber 1997: 40. For an Aristotelian interpretation but in a different direction see Streetman 2008: 211–246.

5. For an examination of the meaning of these first principles or practical sciences, cf. Druart 1995: 476–485 & 1997: 403–423.

6. For a comprehensive analysis on al-Fārābī’s understanding of abstraction see Taylor 2006: 151–168.

7. For further discussion on the use of this analogy see Eastwood 1979: 423–425.

8. For al-Fārābī’s understanding of demonstration see Galston 1981: 23–34. For the different types of demonstration introduced by al-Fārābī in the Book of Demonstration, see Strobino 2019, 42–62.