Notes to Anna Julia Cooper

1. Note: In this entry, Black and Blackness are capitalized, in the same way that African American is typically capitalized. Black is used rather than African American throughout because it is a more inclusive term. Also, white is used in lowercase as an intended disruption of the norm (i.e., using either capitals or lowercase letters for both terms). This usage doesn’t apply to quoted material.

2. Sojourner Truth, whom Cooper described as a “unique and rugged genius,” (VAJC, 116). For more on the controversy see Neil Painter’s “Sojourner Truth in Life and Memory: Writing the Biography of and American Exotic” in Gender and History 2 (1990), 3-19. See also Painter’s full biography of Truth, Sojourner Truth: A Life, A Symbol (W. W. Norton and Company, 1997).

3. Cooper, Anna Julia. Slavery and the French Revolutionists (1788-1805). Trans. Frances Richardson Keller. Studies in French Civilization, Volume 1. Lewiston/Queenston, New York: The Edwin Mellen Press, 1988. Keller recently edited a reprint of the dissertation retitled, Slavery and the French and Haitian Revolutionists (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 2006).

4. Nelson Baker is the first African American to earn a Ph.D. in philosophy (Yale University 1903). The first African American woman to earn a Ph.D. in philosophy is Joyce Mitchell Cook, also from Yale University in 1965.

5. See Anika Mann’s, “Sartre’s Ethics of the Oppressed” in Philosophy Today; 2005; 49, p. 105-109.

6. Delany's emphasis. Delany also asserts that young women should be educated, informed, and qualified because they are the first nurses and instructors to children, making the first and most lasting impact on their lives.

7. Cooper discusses the financial prosperity of America “counting her millionaires by the thousand” and how “women’s work and women’s influence” are needed.

8. In a handwritten note available in her papers archived at the Morland-Spingarn Research Center at Howard University in Washington, D.C.