1. There is discussion of the nature of applied ethics. On one model, one moral theory or other (e.g., utilitarianism, Kantian deontology, virtue theory) is imposed upon the problem at hand, in the hopes of producing a resolution. But this model, according to its detractors, overplays the separation of the theoretical from the applied. What does it mean to apply an existing theory to a practical problem? How easily can the distinction between applied ethics and ethical theory be sustained? Many say that the field of applied ethics cannot be what the name would lead us to suppose it is. See Caplan 1980; MacIntyre 1984; Beauchamp 1984; Caplan 1989; Agich 2001; Archard and Lippert-Rasmussen 2013; and Magelssen et al. 2016.

2. There is much discussion of what constitutes a moral theory. For example, see the entry on moral theory. Many suggest moral theory is characterized by some combination of generalization, universality, systemization, abstraction, explicitness, and the capability to generate recommendations. See Nussbaum 2000; Arras 1991 [2017: 47]; Arras 2003; Louden 1990; Louden 1992. There is related discussion of what qualifies as an anti-theoretical approach to moral philosophy. See Clarke 1987; Clarke and Simpson 1989; Louden 1990; Fotion 2014.

3. “Narrative ethics” can refer not only to an approach to ethical analysis as such but also to the practice of health care providers focusing on patients and listening to their stories and perspectives. Such a narrative ethics orientation recognizes that moral duties are incurred in hearing a patient’s description of their situation; it also involves a move away from a focus on “technical questions” (such as whether a certain course of action preserves patient autonomy) and toward a focus on the more ordinary questions and priorities typical of everyday patients (Charon and Montello 2002).

4. Jennifer Hawkins forwards an argument in this neighbourhood (that one can offer a good philosophical argument without theory), specifically with respect to theories of welfare (Hawkins 2021). In brief, she argues that theories of welfare are too abstract to be useful for practical medical ethics. Hawkins makes reference to Hall 2016, who argues that standard philosophical theories are not well-suited to the medical context because of what he sees as the difficulty in using theory to make any kind of practical decision.