Supplement to Biological Individuals

Long descriptions for some figures in Biological Individuals

Figure 1 description

A diagram consisting of two overlapping ovals with a vertical line bisecting the overlap area. The left oval is labeled “Organisms” and the right oval “Darwinian Individuals”. The left side of the line has an arrow pointing left labeled “Multi-species” and the right side of the line has an arrow pointing right labeled “Single-species”. The area of the left oval not in the overlap contains “Squid-Vibrio”; the area of the overlap to the left of the line contains “Aphid-Buchnera”; the area of the overlap to the right of the line contains “Fruit Fly”; the area of the right oval not in the overlap contains “Chromosome”.

Figure 2 description

Figure 2, figure 3, and figures 5 and 6 are based on the same overall diagram.

Figure 2 is titled “Biological individuals”. It is the most basic of these related figures and consists of one oval divided into three regions: left, middle, right. The left-hand region is labeled “Some parts of organisms”. The middle region is labeled “Organisms”. The right-hand region is labeled “Some groups of organisms”.

Figure 3 description

Figure 2, figure 3, and figures 5 and 6 are based on the same overall plan.

Figure 3 is like figure 2 except that a dotted line encloses all the Organism region plus parts of both the left and right regions. The dotted line region is labeled “Living agents”. This creates five subregions.

Figure 4 description

Figure 4 is a diagram of a three dimensional space using a Cartesian coordinate system with axes:

  • B (for Bottleneck),
  • G (for Reproductive specialization (germ/soma), and
  • I (for Overall integration).

A cube is drawn connecting the unit points of (B,G,I) , i.e., (0,0,0) through (1,1,1). Eight small spheres representing examples are inside this cube. The table below gives information on the examples.

Examples with coordinates
Example B G I
Buffalo herd 0 0 0
Sponge 0 0 .5
Slime mold 0 .5 .5
Aspen ramet .5 .5 1
Gonium 1 0 .5
Oak from acorn 1 .5 1
Volvox carteri 1 1 .5
Us 1 1 1

Figures 5 and 6 descriptions

Figure 2, figure 3, and figures 5 and 6 are based on the same overall plan.

Figures 5 and 6 are like figure 3 except that a dot-dash line encloses parts of all the regions created in figure 3 except the dotted line enclosed bit of the original right region (“Some groups of organisms” and “Living agents”). The region delimited by the dot-dash line is labeled “Darwinian (evolutionary) individuals”. Each of the nine subregions is numbered, and, in figure 6, the associated table gives examples for each. The table as a list is repeated below with a description of which subregion:

  • Region 1, inside both “Organisms” [hereafter Organisms] (and therefore also “Living agent” [hereafter Living]) and “Darwinian individuals” [hereafter Darwin] : example is a Fruit fly
  • Region 2, inside both “Some parts of organisms” [hereafter Parts] and Darwin but not in Living: example is a Gene
  • Region 3, inside both “Some groups of organisms” [hereafter Groups] and Darwin but not Living: example is an Eusocial insect colony
  • Region 4, inside Parts but not Living nor Darwin: Example is Lysosome
  • Region 5, inside Groups but not Living nor Darwin: Examples are Clades (such as Bryophyta)
  • Region 6, inside Parts and Living but not Darwin: Example is a Heart
  • Region 7, inside Groups and Living but not Darwin: Example is a Coral reef
  • Region 8, inside Parts and Living and Darwin: Example is a Virus
  • Region 9, inside Organisms and Living but not Darwin: Example is Squid+Vibrio bacteria

In the text, regions 1, 2, and 3 are referred to as the lower half; regions 4 and 5 as outermost regions to the left and right; and regions 6 and 7 as the upper half.

Figure 7 description

Figure 7 has two diagrams, 7a and 7b. Each diagram is a quadrant. In both the y-axis is labeled from “less cooperation” (below) to “more cooperation” (above) and the x-axis from “more conflict” (left) to “less conflict” (right). For this description the quadrants are:

  • first quadrant (more cooperation and less conflict or above right)
  • second quadrant (more cooperation and more conflict or above left)
  • third quadrant (less cooperation and more conflict or below left)
  • fourth quadrant (less cooperation and more conflict or below right)

In both diagrams various labeled dots are spread across the four quadrants.

In diagram 7A, the overall title is “Groups of cells” and the table below lists the examples, quadrant, x and y coordinates. Note the values of the coordinates are only to indicate relative position and have no intrinsic meaning.

Examples with quadrant and coordinates
Example Quadrant x-coordinate y-coordinate
Tasmanian devil first 7 30
Plasmodium in mosquito first 5 7
Myxococcus first 18 7
Dictyostelium first 22 10
Volvox first 34 15
Trichoplax first 38 16
liverwort first 35 20
redwood first 33 24
marmoset first 29 30
whale first 35 34
mouse first 37 32
nematode first 38 29
biofilm second −20 10
E. coli bacteriocin producer second −10 3
yeast flocs third −6 −7
Gonium fourth 36 −3
Chlamydomonas fourth 12 −20

In diagram 7B, the overall title is “Groups of multi-cellular individuals” and the table below lists the examples, quadrant, x and y coordinates. Note the values of the coordinates are only to indicate relative position and have no intrinsic meaning.

Examples with quadrant and coordinates
example quadrant x-coordinate y-coordinate
albatross mates first 6 16
Melipona bee first 3 23
honeybee first 22 26
Botryllus first 31 15
brain fluke in ant first 28 6
man of war first 37 24
anglerfish mates first 32 22
coral first 37 18
social aphid first 36 7
chimpanzee second −22 7
African wild dog second −11 8
naked mole rat second −3 14
barn swallow mates second −16 13
Polistes wasp second −6 15
human band second −5 22
human city second −19 32
Drosophila mates third −15 −4
bedbug mates third −22 −7
gull colony third −23 −10
sage grouse lek third −32 −17
male fig wasp third −33 −22
strawberry clone fourth 38 −12
aphid clone fourth 33 −20
dandelion clone fourth 20 −30

Copyright © 2024 by
Robert A. Wilson <rwilson.robert@gmail.com>
Matthew J. Barker <matthew.barker@concordia.ca>

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