1. For the use of the term fu 婦 and nü 女 in the Book of Songs (Shijing), see Song 1, 9, 17, 23, 39, 42, 51, 58, 59, 107, 154, 189, and 218. By and large, nü 女 signifies daughters, young maidens, or new brides, and fu married women. But in a few songs, the term nü 女 is also used to denote a married woman as well; see Song 69, 82, 211, 237, and 247.

2. For more on the differences between humans and animals, see Mozi, Ch. 6: “人情也, 則曰男女; 禽獸也, 則曰牡牝雄雌也”; Xunzi 5.9: “夫禽獸有父子,而無父子之親,有牝牡而無男女之別”; Liji, “Jiaotesheng” chapter: “無別無義, 禽獸之道也”. The term xiong-ci (male-female animals) also appears in the Daodejing, ch. 28 and ch.10 where the distinction between humans and animals is less explicit.

3. For more on the commonality between sage and commoner, see Mencius 2A2: “聖人之於民, 亦類也”, 4B32: “堯舜與人同耳”, 6A7: “故凡同類者, 舉相似也, 何獨至於人而疑之? 聖人與我同類者”, 6B2: “人皆可以為堯舜”, and 7A16: “舜之居深山之中, 與木石居, 與鹿豕遊, 其所以異於深山之野人者幾希”; Xunzi 23.10: “凡人之性者, 堯舜之與桀跖, 其性一也. 君子之與小人, 其性一也”. More on the slight distinction between human and beast, see Mencius 3A4: 人之有道也, 飽食, 煖衣, 逸居而無教, 則近於禽獸“; Xunzi 1.8: ”故學數有終, 若其義則不可須臾舍也. 為之人也, 舍之禽獸也 Liji, “Qulishang” chapter: “鸚鵡能言, 不離飛鳥; 猩猩能言, 不離禽獸. 今人而無禮, 雖能言, 不亦禽獸之心乎”.

4. The earliest references of the ruler as fumu 父母 (father and mother) of the people can be found in both the Shijing and Shujing. The two songs from the Shijing (i.e., Song 172 “Nanshan youtai” and Song 251 “Jiongzhuo”), in particular, are widely quoted in later texts, including Liji, Daxue, Xunzi, Xiaojing, Shuoyuan, Hanshi waizhuan, Baihutong, Xinshu, and Lienü zhuan. The term “weiminfumu 為民父母” in reference to the benevolent ruler can also be found in the Mencius as well (1A4, 1B7, 3A3). It is clear that the reference of the ruler as the father and mother of the people indicative of parental parity is part of the normative political discourse in Confucian philosophy.

5. In the Baihutong, “Sangangliuji” chapter, the marriage rite of having the groom perform the job of a servant by untying the bride’s hair ribbon after the ceremony (夫親脫婦之纓) is also meant to honor the commitment of the wife; for more, see H. Wang 2016.

6. For the synonymy of you 友 and you* 游, see Mozi, Ch. 2: “Xiushen”:

One who has wealth but is unable to share it with others is not worth befriending (友). One whose adherence to the dao is not thoroughgoing, whose view of things is partial and not broad…is not worth having as a companion (游); for other trans, see Johnston (2010). Also see Liji, “Qulisan” chapter,

Those friends who are his fellow-officers will proclaim him respectful (僚友稱其弟也); those friends who are his subordinate will proclaim him benevolent (執友稱其仁也); and his peer friends will proclaim him trustworthy (交游稱其信也).

7. For more on the ritual demarcation of nei-wai as the proper gender spheres for women and men respectively, see Liji, “Qulishan” chapter: “男女不雜坐…外言不入於梱, 內言不出於捆”, and “Neize” chapter: “男不言內, 女不言外”, “禮, 始於謹夫婦, 為宮室, 辨外內. 男子居外, 女子居內, 深宮固門, 閽寺守之. 男不入, 女不出”; Xunzi 17.10: “內外無別, 男女淫亂”; Kongzi jiayu, “Wenyu” chapter: “正男女內外, 序親踈遠近, 莫敢相踰越者”.

8. For an extended account of the encounter between Confucius and Nanzi, see Shiji, “Kongzi shijia” chapter: “靈公夫人有南子者, 使人謂孔子曰:「四方之君子不辱欲與寡君為兄弟者, 必見寡小君. 寡小君願見.」孔子辭謝, 不得已而見之. 夫人在絺帷中. 孔子入門, 北面稽首. 夫人自帷中再拜, 環珮玉聲璆然. 孔子曰:「吾鄉為弗見, 見之禮答焉.」子路不說. 孔子矢之曰:「予所不者, 天厭之! 天厭之!」”

9. For more on sancong 三從, see Lienü zhuan 1.11: “以言婦人無擅制之義, 而有三從之道也. 故年少則從乎父母, 出嫁則從乎夫, 夫死則從乎子, 禮也”; Kongzi jiayu, “Benmingjie” chapter: “女子者, 順男子之教而長其理者也. 是故無專制之義, 而有三從之道: 幼從父兄, 既嫁從夫, 死從子”; Baihutong, “Jue” chapter: “婦人無爵何? 陰卑無外事, 是以有「三從」之義: 未嫁從父, 既嫁從夫, 夫死從子” and “Jiaqu” chapter: “女者, 如也, 從如人也. 在家從父母, 既嫁從夫, 夫歿從子也.《傳》曰:「婦人有三從之義也”; Dadai liji, “Benming” chapter: “婦人, 伏於人也. 是故無專制之義, 有三從之道: 在家從父, 適人從夫, 夫死從子, 無所敢自遂也”.

10. Since Woman Liu 劉氏 of Ming (1368–1644CE)—the last author of the Nüsishu—is not from a prominent family, there is not much biographical information that we have of her, other than what is prefaced by her son, Wang Xiang, who is also the compiler of this anthology. We don’t have a historical record of Woman Liu’s given name; what we know is that she was married to Wang Jijing 王集敬 and was widowed for 60 years and for which she was granted the honorific title of Chaste Widow Wang (Wang Jiefu 王節婦). As noted earlier, women by and large are nameless; they are usually remembered as someone’s daughters, wives, or mothers. For instance, in many of the exemplary women’s biographies, we don’t even have those women’s madam names; women are simply referred to by their husbands’ or fathers’ family names followed by their familial roles of daughter, wife, or mother, as in Mengnu 孟母 (mother of Mengzi) or Wanfu 王婦 (wife of Wang). We are indeed fortunate to have at least a record of her madam name of Liu. For more on Wang Xiang’s preface to his mother, Woman Liu’s Nüfan jielu, see Pang-White, 2018: 218–219.

11. The seven reasons for expelling a wife are: not getting along with the fathers- and mothers-in-law, childless, promiscuity, jealousy, incurable disease, gossip, and theft; from the above list of reasons it is clear that the first thing in order for the new bride to secure her place in this new patrilineage is to get the hearts of the in-laws before the heart of her husband. The three reasons for not expelling a wife are: has nowhere else to return to, has already partaken in the three-year mourning for the in-laws, and has been through poverty and hardship with the husband before the family becomes wealthy and noble; see Kongzi jiayu, “Benmingjie” chapter: “婦有七出, 三不去; 七出者: 不順父母出者, 無子者, 婬僻者, 嫉妬者, 惡疾者, 多口舌者, 竊盜者. 三不去者: 謂有所取無所歸一也, 與共更三年之喪二也, 先貧賤後富貴者三也”. Also see Dadai liji, “Benming” chapter.

12. For a more complex reading of footbinding, see Blake (1994); Ebrey (1999); Ko (2005); Rosenlee (2006); Zito (2007).

13. For a brief discussion of Confucianism in the context of an array of ways in which care ethics has been linked and discussed, see Tronto (2013: 24); Collins (2015: 2, 6). For a rare lengthier discussion on Confucianism from a care ethicist outside the sino-comparative communities, see Groenhout (2014: 494–499).

14. Akin to the Greek concept of philia, the term you 友 is used to cover a wide range of associations from kinship, civil/political alliance, to erotic attachment in various classics; see for instance, Shujing, “Dagao”, “Shaogao”, “Mushi”, “Kanggao” and “Junchen” chapters; Shijing, Song 1 “Guanju” and Song 165 “Famu”.