## Proof that 0 Falls Under Q

The proof that 0 falls under $$Q$$ is relatively straightforward. We want to show:

$$[\lambda y \, \mathit{Precedes}(y,\#[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,y)])]0$$

By $$\lambda$$-Conversion, it suffices to show:

$$\mathit{Precedes}(0, \#[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)])$$

So, by the definition of Predecessor, we have to show that there is a concept $$F$$ and object $$x$$ such that:

1. $$Fx$$
2. $$\#[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)] = \#F$$
3. $$0 = \#[\lambda u \, Fu\amp u\neq x]$$

We can demonstrate that there is an $$F$$ and $$x$$ for which (1), (2) and (3) hold if we pick $$F$$ to be $$[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)]$$ and pick $$x$$ to be 0. We now establish (1), (2), and (3) for these choices.

To show that (1) holds, we have to show:

$$[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)]0$$

But we know, from the definition of $$\mathit{Precedes}^{+}$$, that $$\mathit{Precedes}^{+}(0,0)$$, So by $$\lambda$$-abstraction, we are done.

To show that (2) holds, we need do no work, since our choice of $$F$$ requires us to show:

$$\#[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)] = \#[\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)],$$

which we know by the logic of identity.

To show (3) holds, we need to show:

$$0 = [\lambda u \, [\lambda z \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(z,0)]u\amp u\neq 0]$$

But, by applying $$\lambda$$-Conversion, we have to show:

(A)  $$0 = \#[\lambda u \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(u,0)\amp u\neq 0]$$

To show (A), it suffices to show the following, in virtue of the Lemma Concerning Zero (in our subsection on The Concept Natural Number in §4):

$$\neg\exists x ([\lambda u \, \mathit{Precedes}^{+}(u,0) \amp u\neq 0]x)$$

And by $$\lambda$$-Conversion, it suffices to show:

(B)  $$\neg\exists x (\mathit{Precedes}^{+}(x,0)\amp x\neq 0)$$

We establish (B) as follows.

When we established Theorem 2 (i.e., the fact that 0 is not the successor of any number), we proved that nothing precedes 0:

$$\neg\exists x \mathit{Precedes}(x,0)$$

From this, and Fact (4) about $$R^{*}$$ (in the subsection on the Ancestral of $$R$$, in §4), it follows that nothing ancestrally precedes 0:

$$\neg\exists x \mathit{Precedes}^{*}(x,0)$$

Now suppose (for reductio) the negation of (B); i.e, that there is some object, say a, such that $$\mathit{Precedes}^{+}(a,0)$$ and $$a\neq 0$$. Then, by definition of $$\mathit{Precedes}^{+}$$, it follows that either $$\mathit{Precedes}^{*}(a,0)$$ or $$a = 0$$. But since our reductio hypthesis includes that $$a\neq 0$$, it must be that $$\mathit{Precedes}^{*}(a,0)$$, which contradicts the fact displayed immediately above.