## Proof of Fact 6 Concerning the Weak Ancestral

Fact 6 concerning the weak ancestral $$R^{+}$$ of $$R$$ asserts:

Fact 6:
$$R^{*}(x,y)\rightarrow \exists z[R^{+}(x,z) \amp Rzy]$$

To prove this, we shall appeal to Fact 3 concerning the strong ancestral $$R^{*}$$ of $$R$$:

Fact 3:
$$[R^{*}(x,y)\amp \forall u(Rxu\rightarrow Fu)\amp \textrm{Her}(F,R)]\rightarrow Fy$$,

for any concept $$F$$ and objects $$x$$ and $$y$$:

Now to prove Fact 6 about the weak ancestral, assume $$R^{*}(a,b)$$. We want to show:

$$\exists z[R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzb]$$

Notice that by $$\lambda$$-Conversion, it suffices to show:

$$[\lambda w\, \exists z[R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzw]]b$$

Let us use ‘$$P$$’ to denote this concept under which $$b$$ should fall. Notice that we can prove $$Pb$$ by instantiating Fact 3 (above) concerning the strong ancestral to $$P$$, $$a$$, and $$b$$ and establishing the antecedent of the result. In other words, by Fact 3, we know:

$$[R^{*}(a,b)\amp \forall u(Rau\rightarrow Pu)\amp \textrm{Her}(P,R)]\rightarrow Pb$$

So if we can show the conjuncts of the antecedent, we are done. The first conjunct is already established, by hypothesis. So it remains to show:

(1)   $$\forall u(Rau\rightarrow Pu)$$
(2)   $$\textrm{Her}(P,R)$$

To see what we have to show for (1), we expand the definition of $$P$$ and simplify by using $$\lambda$$-Conversion. Thus, we have to show:

(1)   $$\forall u[Rau\rightarrow \exists z(R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzu)]$$

So assume $$Rau$$, to show $$\exists z(R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzu)$$. But it is an immediate consequence of the definition of the weak ancestral $$R^{+}$$ that $$R^{+}$$ is reflexive. (This is Fact 4 concerning the weak ancestral, in Section 4, “The Weak Ancestral of $$R$$”.) So we may conjoin and conclude $$R^{+}(a,a)\amp Rau$$. From this, we may infer $$\exists z(R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzu)$$, by existential generalization, which is what we had to show.

To show (2), we have to show that $$P$$ is hereditary on $$R$$. If we expand the definitions of $$\textrm{Her}(P,R)$$ and $$P$$ and simplify by using $$\lambda$$-Conversion, then we have to show, for arbitrarily chosen objects $$x,y$$:

(2)   $$Rxy\rightarrow [\exists z(R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzx)\rightarrow \exists z(R^{+}(a,z) \amp Rzy)]$$

So assume

(A)   $$Rxy$$
(B)   $$\exists z(R^{+}(a,z)\amp Rzx)$$

to show: $$\exists z(R^{+}(a,z)\amp Rzy)$$. From (B), we know that there is some object, say $$d$$, such that:

$$R^{+}(a,d)\amp Rdx$$

So, by Fact 3 about the weak ancestral (Section 4, “The Weak Ancestral of $$R$$”), it follows that $$R^{*}(a,x)$$, from which it immediately follows that $$R^{+}(a,x)$$, by definition of $$R^{+}$$. So, by conjoining (A), we have:

$$R^{+}(a,x) \amp Rxy$$

But since $$x$$ was arbitrarily chosen, it follows that:

$$\exists z(R^{+}x(a,z) \amp Rzy)$$,

which is what we had to show.