## Proof of the General Principle of Induction

Assume the antecedent of the principle, eliminating the defined notation for $$\mathit{HerOn}(F,{}^{a}R^{+})$$:

$$Pa\amp \forall x,y(R^{+}(a,x)\amp R^{+}(a,y)\amp Rxy\rightarrow (Px\rightarrow Py))$$

We want to show, for an arbitrary object $$b$$, that if $$R ^{+}(a,b)$$ then $$Pb$$. So assume $$R^{+}(a,b)$$. To show $$Pb$$, we appeal to Fact (7) about $$R^{+}$$ (in our subsection on the Weak Ancestral in §4):

$$Fx\amp R^{+}(x,y)\amp \mathit{Her}(F,R)\rightarrow Fy$$

Instantiate the variable $$F$$ in this Fact to the property $$[\lambda z \, R^{+}(a,z)\amp Pz]$$ (that there is such a property is guaranteed by the Comprehension Principle for Relations), and instantiate the variables $$x$$ and $$y$$ to the objects $$a$$ and $$b$$, respectively. The result (after applying $$\lambda$$-Conversion) is therefore something that we have established as true:

$$R^{+}(a,a)\amp Pa\amp R^{+}(a,b)\amp \mathit{Her}([\lambda z \, R^{+}(a,z)\amp Pz], R)\rightarrow$$
$$R^{+}(a,b)\amp Pb$$

So if we can establish the antecedent of this fact, we establish $$Pb$$. But we know that the first conjunct is true, by the definition of $$R^{+}$$. We know the second conjunct is true, by assumption. We know that the third conjunct is true, by further assumption. So if we can establish:

$$\mathit{Her}([\lambda z \, R^{+}(a,z)\amp Pz], R)$$,

we are done. But, by the definition of heredity, this just means:

$$\forall x,y[Rxy\rightarrow ((R^{+}(a,x)\amp Px) \rightarrow (R^{+}(a,y)\amp Py))]$$.

To prove this claim, we assume $$Rxy$$ and $$R^{+}(a,x)\amp Px$$ (to show $$R^{+}(a,y)\amp Py$$). But from the facts that $$R^{+}(a,x)$$ and $$Rxy$$, it follows from Fact (3) about $$R^{+}$$ (in our subsection on the Weak Ancestral) that $$R^{*}(a,y)$$. This implies $$R^{+}(a,y)$$, by the definition of $$R^{+}$$. But since we now have $$R^{+}(a,x), R^{+}(a,y), Rxy$$, and $$Px$$, it follows from the first assumption in the proof that $$Py$$.