## Proof of the Lemma for Hume's Principle

[Note: We use $$\epsilon F$$ to denote the extension of the concept $$F$$.]

Let $$P,Q$$ be arbitrarily chosen concepts. We want to show:

$$\epsilon Q \in \#P \equiv Q\approx P$$

So, by definition of $$\#P$$, we have to show:

$$\epsilon Q \in \epsilon P^{\approx} \equiv Q\approx P$$,

where $$P^{\approx}$$ was previously defined as $$[\lambda x \, \exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\apprxclose F)]$$.

We prove this by appealing to the following instance of the Law of Extensions:

Fact: $$\epsilon Q\in\epsilon P^{\approx}\equiv P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)$$

$$(\rightarrow)$$ Assume $$\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}$$ (to show: $$Q \approx P$$). Then, by the above Fact, we know $$P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)$$. So by the definition of $$P^{\approx}$$:

$$[\lambda x \,\exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H\amp H\approx P)](\epsilon Q)$$

By $$\lambda$$-conversion, this implies:

$$\exists H(\epsilon Q =\epsilon H\amp H\approx P)$$

Suppose $$R$$ is an arbitrary such concept:

$\tag{1} \epsilon Q\eqclose \epsilon R \amp R\apprxclose P$

Then by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies $$\forall x(Qx\equiv Rx)$$. Since the material equivalence of two concepts implies their equinumerosity (Fact 1, subsection on Equinumerosity, in the main part of the entry), it follows that $$Q\approx R$$. So from this result and the second conjunct of (1), it follows that $$Q\approx P$$, by the transitivity of equinumerosity (Fact 4 in the subsection on Equinumerosity).

$$(\leftarrow)$$ Assume $$Q\approx P$$ (to show $$\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}$$). Then, by identity introduction, we know: $$\epsilon Q =\epsilon Q\amp Q\approx P$$. So, by existential generalization:

$$\exists H(\epsilon Q\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\approx P)$$

And by $$\lambda$$-Conversion:

$$[\lambda x \, \exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\approx P)](\epsilon Q)$$

Hence, by definition, $$P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)$$. So, by the above Fact, $$\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}$$.