Friedrich Hayek

First published Sat Sep 15, 2012; substantive revision Fri Feb 28, 2025

Friedrich Hayek was born in Vienna in 1899 into a family steeped in academic life and scientific research. He worked as a statistician from 1927–31, became a Lecturer in Economics at the University of Vienna in 1929, then moved to the University of London in 1931, the University of Chicago in 1950, and the University of Freiburg in 1962, retiring in 1967 and moving back to Freiburg. He kept writing into the 1980s, dying in 1992.

Hayek worked in the areas of philosophy of science, political philosophy, the free will problem, and epistemology. Hayek saw himself as more fox than hedgehog, yet for all that his life’s work, for which he won a Nobel Prize in Economics in 1974, was spent exploring the nature and significance of spontaneous order. The concept seems simple, yet Hayek spent six decades refining his idea, evidently finding elusive the goal of being as clear about it as he aspired to be.

This essay concentrates mainly on this enduring theme of Hayek’s work, and on a question: why would the scholar who did more than anyone in the twentieth century to advance our understanding of price signals and the emergence of spontaneous orders also be driven to claim “that social justice is a mirage” (Hayek 1978b, 57)?

1. Price Signals and Spontaneous Order

1.1 Order Without Design

Over hundreds of millions of years, order emerged in the natural world. How? It is only human to wonder. In contemplating the order of nature and of society, and moving from observation to explanation, “design arguments” come to mind, but like most philosophers, Hayek deems it fallacious to argue that we need to posit a designer to explain the emergence of order in nature. (See the entry on teleological arguments for God’s existence.) Hayek, however, was frustrated to find an analogously fallacious argument from design leading people to treat the emergence of order in society as requiring a designer (Hayek 1960, 59). Just as no one had to invent natural selection, no one had to invent the process by which natural languages evolve. A language is a massively path-dependent process of unending mutual adjustment. Language evolves spontaneously.

It would be no exaggeration to say that social theory begins with—and has an object only because of—the discovery that there exist orderly structures which are the product of the action of many men but are not the result of human design. In some fields this is now universally accepted. Although there was a time when men believed that even language and morals had been invented by some genius of the past, everybody recognizes now that they are the outcome of a process of evolution whose results nobody foresaw or designed (Hayek 1973, 37).

Crucially, it would make no sense to call any language optimally efficient, yet it makes perfect sense to see languages as highly refined and effective adaptations to the evolving communication needs of particular populations (Hayek 1945, 528).

1.2 Order Can Be Unpredictable

Natural selection operates on mutations, making the path of natural selection unpredictable, regardless of how well we understand the underlying principles. To Hayek, social and cultural evolution are much the same: driven by innovation, fashion, and shocks that “mutate” people’s plans in unpredictable ways with unpredictable results. The system may be more or less logical. Most things seem in retrospect to have happened for a reason.

Yet, however logical the system may be, its logic does not render the system deterministic. We can make predictions in the broadest sense, such as when we say that increasing the money supply causes prices to rise, other things equal. However, we have no basis for predicting the fine details. The system is technically chaotic, to such a degree that even something as straightforward as prices on next week’s stock exchanges will always remain a matter of guesswork even for experts. (See the entry on chaos.)

1.3 Order Can Embody Essentially Decentralized Information

To Hayek, prices are like languages. How do we know how much people are willing and able to pay for our product? We might hold an auction and allocate our product to the highest bidder. Alternatively, we might simply post a price. Then, if revenues are high enough to sustain our business, then all is well and we do not need to know whether we are maximizing profit.

The crucial Hayekian idea: To think that an authority needs to decide what the price of rice ought to be is like thinking that an authority needs to decide what sound people ought to make when they want to refer to rice.

It is a mundane yet intriguing fact that price signals induce people to respond to information they do not possess: such as the changing cost of drilling, or the discovery of a cheap substitute, or that political unrest has made a key input harder to acquire. Having no inkling of those variables, buyers nevertheless respond to them in a rational way, because they know the one thing they need to know: namely, the price (Hayek 1978a, 4).

Assume that somewhere in the world a new opportunity for the use of some raw material, say, tin, has arisen, or that one of the sources of supply of tin has been eliminated. It does not matter for our purpose—and it is very significant that it does not matter—which of these two causes has made tin more scarce. All that the users of tin need to know is that some of the tin they used to consume is now more profitably employed elsewhere and that, in consequence, they must economize tin (Hayek 1945, 526).

1.4 Communities Tend To Be Spontaneous Orders

What emerges from the haggling is not only a deal, but something larger: a community. There was no central decision about who should produce tin, or whether anyone should; no central decision about who should consume tin, or whether anyone should; no central decision about what should be given in return for tin. All that happened is that some people guessed that if they were to produce tin and bring it to market, it would be worth something to customers—enough to make the venture worthwhile. When some of these guesses prove correct and trades get consummated, a market in tin emerges and becomes part of what is bringing people together as partners in mutually beneficial ventures.

Price signals thus economize on information. In the process, prices induce emerging expectations and patterns of cooperation that involve multitudes. Cooperation evolves among people who need not share a language, need not be aware of each other’s existence, and need not be aware of their mutual dependence. They are only vaguely aware of the thousands of jobs that need doing so as to supply inputs that enable them to have a finished product to sell. Particular agents may never have more than a glimpse of the big picture, yet they manage to come together to form a community, and almost all are vastly better off as a result.

2. Progress

Technological progress extends the frontiers of the possible. To Hayek, it is the freedom of the few to do something novel that matters most, not the freedom of the many to do something familiar. Accordingly, the freedom I exercise myself need not be the freedom that has the most bearing on my future (Hayek 1960, 32). Early adopters, for example, finance research that brings down production costs, in the process financing a dispersion of products and services at falling prices that eventually enable late adopters like me to access the market. I may never trade with early adopters, yet I depend on them to finance the invention and ongoing re-invention of products whose marginal cost eventually falls to a point where I can afford them.

Often, technological progress consists of innovations that lower transaction cost: steam boat, railroad, air travel, telegraph, telephone, internet, bar code reader, “apps” that make possible such businesses as Uber and AirBnB, along with innovative organizational structures and business models such as Federal Express or container ships (which, after a ten-year legal battle with trade unions, reduced from days to minutes the time that a truck’s contents would spend at the dockyard before being transferred to a ship). In many cases, the cost of transacting concerns the cost of information. As the frontier of knowledge expands, the slice of information that a given individual can grasp inevitably becomes a smaller fraction of the whole. Prices become an increasingly indispensable window to a world of tacit knowledge.

But technological innovation shocks economies. Formerly profitable investments become relics of a bygone age and must be liquidated. Workers get laid off until they find some other way to produce goods wanted by today’s customers. Transitions are tough and miscalculations abound, even as we grope toward heights made possible by a given innovation. Innovative ways of lowering transaction cost spread throughout a community, and failures (including once-useful but now obsolete innovations) are discarded. More precisely, failures are discarded if and when decision makers are innovators on the ground, learning to avoid wasting more of their own money on ideas whose time has passed.

Hayek denies that resources will ever be used at theoretical peak efficiency (1945, 527). Humans being what they are, waste is ubiquitous. Mistakes are ubiquitous. The “marvel” of markets is not that market agents act with exquisite efficiency but rather that they make mistakes, get burnt, learn fast, and make corrections. If our customers are not willing to pay what it costs us to get our product to them, then we are wasting resources. Prices give us a timely and reliable source of information about this most crucial question.

Unfortunately, when decision makers are not principals but bureaucrats in large organizations, they are not subject to this immediate discipline. Their interest is not in providing a better service so much as in avoiding budget cuts. If they make a mistake, what cuts their budget is not the mistake so much as supervisors discovering the mistake. Bureaucratic structure makes new information a threat that needs to be suppressed or smothered in propaganda (1944, 126ff, 153ff). Bureaucrats and their expert advisors experience mistakes not as events from which they need to learn but rather as events that they need to cover up. The mistakes they make are with other people’s money, so bureaucrats learn to say, when confronted, that their budget was not large enough, or that things would have been worse if they had acted differently.[1] They may even believe what they are saying, but they do not know and have every incentive to avoid learning.

3. Planned Orders Are Systematically Inferior

If we understand the principles that drive any given system’s logic, we may have a basis for prediction. Thus, it may be predictable that a population of insects will evolve resistance to a pesticide. Beyond the question of what we can predict, then, Hayek has a further and more precise target: however much we can predict, there is a drastic limit to what we can simply decide.[2] No one can decide against buyers and sellers responding in predictable ways to a central plan’s perverse incentives, in the same way that no one can decide against insects evolving resistant to an insecticide.

This problem may sound obvious but as Adam Smith observed, it evidently is not. Technocrats will not see it coming. Hayek quotes Smith approvingly. The “man of system”

seems to imagine that he can arrange the different members of a great society with as much ease as the hand arranges the different pieces upon a chess-board. He does not consider that the pieces upon the chess-board have no other principle of motion besides that which the hand impresses upon them; but that, in the great chess-board of human society, every single piece has a principle of motion of its own, altogether different from that which the legislature might choose to impress upon it. If those two principles coincide and act in the same direction, the game of human society will go on easily and harmoniously, and is very likely to be happy and successful. If they are opposite or different, the game will go on miserably, and the society must be at all times in the highest degree of disorder (Smith 1790, 234).

The system has a logic. Planners cannot change that logic, but they can decide whether to work with or against it (which Smith regards as a choice between harmony and misery). Smith holds that planners who disregard economic logic are deciding in effect to sacrifice their “pawns,” something that a person of true benevolence would not do.

When Hayek explains the obstacle to effective central planning, his claim is not merely the Smithian point that information is widely dispersed and therefore hard to acquire. Rather, it is impossible to acquire (Hayek 1973, 51). The issue is not computational complexity so much as information’s inherently contextual nature. Prices are not revealed by ongoing processes of market exchange so much as continuously created by them. If prices are instead set periodically by a central planner, rather than instantaneously by consumers and producers who are the first and typically the only people to have information in reliable and timely form, prices inevitably can no longer be creating reliable, timely information about which offers are being accepted and which are being rejected. As Hayek notes,

If we possess all the relevant information, if we can start out from a given system of preferences, and if we command complete knowledge of available means, the problem which remains is purely one of logic. That is, the answer to the question of what is the best use of our available means is implicit in our assumptions. This, however, is emphatically not the economic problem which society faces. And the economic calculus which we have developed to solve this logical problem, though an important step toward the solution of the economic problem of society, does not yet provide an answer to it. The reason for this is that the “data” from which the economic calculus starts are never for the whole society “given” to a single mind which could work out the implications and can never be so given (Hayek 1945, 519).

Soviet central planners made decisions by checking prices on international markets, but suppose planners did not have even that sort of information. Suppose there is no information about supply and demand to be had anywhere. Suppose you are a planner, but all you know is that you face demands for wire and for jewelry. How do you decide whether to direct factories to make wire out of copper or platinum, or whether smiths should make jewelry out of gold or silver? How do you decide who should get silver jewelry and who should get gold? How do you decide whether anyone at all should get jewelry, as opposed to reserving all such metals for use as wire?

When consumers are not paying for what they receive, their demand is effectively infinite. Inevitably, a central planner’s task becomes one of cost containment. Worse yet, a planner with no measure of cost has little basis for deciding what should count as containing cost. If a given ton of steel can make one car or ten refrigerators, which way of using steel is economical? How does a planner decide whether to invest in upgrading water supplies or nuclear reactors? If all you know as a producer is that people are asking for infinitely more than you can give, then eventually you turn a deaf ear, deliver your quota, and learn to ignore whether demands from below (from customers) are being met. The only demands with consequences are demands from above (that is, what your supervisors demand).

A central planner could have the world’s most powerful computer, beyond anything imagined when Hayek published “Use of Knowledge” in 1945. No computer, however, could solve the problem that Hayek was trying to articulate. The problem is not lack of processing power so much as a lack of access to the information in the first place. That much seems clear enough, but the problem has a deeper level. The problem is not merely lack of access to information; rather the information does not exist. There is no truth about what prices should be, accessible or otherwise, except to the extent that sellers are learning what customers want, deciding prices at which they are willing to sell, while buyers are deciding how much they want to buy at a given price, or (if prevailing norms allow haggling) deciding on a counter-offer. When this is the process that culminates in prices, sellers are learning how to provide a range of affordable services to buyers and buyers are learning what it takes to finance the provision of such services. This is what prices can be, and this is how prices can serve a community (1944, 51–52; see also Boettke and Candela 2023).

Hayek says with a thought more characteristic of neoclassical economists: “Only prices determined on the free market will bring it about that demand equals supply” (Hayek 1960, 63). Price controls—floors and ceilings—make buyers and sellers less able to respond to the signals they would send each other if they could raise their offer or lower their asking price. If price cannot rise, then buyers cannot signal producers that demand has increased and that producers would sell more if they were to increase supply. And if producers do not increase supply, rising demand results in shortages rather than economic growth. (See especially Zwolinski 2008 for further elaboration.)

By contrast, under central planning, if a product is readily available on official markets, it must be because it has been over-priced by the central planner. The only exception occurs when planners are so inhumanly well-informed or inhumanly lucky that they set a price exactly where the market would set it if the planner had left it alone. A more likely result: when the official price is too high, consumers stop buying. Then producers sound the alarm: no one wants their product! Central planners respond with price supports, buying an unwanted product themselves, then giving it away at subsidized prices to peole (foreign or domestic) who do not want the product at its official price. But citizens ends up paying the official price anyway, involuntarily, in the form of the taxes that underwrite the price supports. As consumers they are thwarted. As taxpayers they are impoverished (Hayek 1945, 527).

By contrast, under a regime of free-floating prices, suppose a manufacturer figures out how to make an “epipen” that can save the lives of consumers otherwise at risk of a fatal allergic reaction to bee stings. Suppose the manufacturer can produce a limited supply of epipens for a little less than a hundred dollars each, does so, then proceeds to offer them for sale for a hundred dollars. Suppose the manufacturer finds buyers lining up by the thousands wanting to buy the pens, and suppose that there emerges a group of “scalpers” willing to stand in line for weeks, who buy all the pens for a hundred dollars each, then resell the pens for two hundred dollars, then three hundred, then four, and demand remains strong. Hayek would predict that if we let the price signals be the marvels that they are, then other producers will jump in and begin to manufacture pens for one or two hundred dollars each. Eventually the demand is met, and the scalpers go away. Meanwhile, new producers drawn by the spike in profitability invent a new process that enables them to produce the pens for ninety dollars, then eighty, and again the price will fall, as competition leads the price signal to track the falling cost of production. Of course, if we devise a patent or a licensing scheme or some other way to choking off competition, then this will not occur. By the same token, if we impose a price ceiling of a hundred dollars, then no signal is sent to would-be competitors unless scalpers send that signal via the back market. Or, if some other constraint makes it impossible to increase the supply, then prices may drift up toward the limits of a customer’s willingness to pay. Barring this, there are many ways for kings, legislators, or other planners to interfere, yet price signals, if left alone, are an incomparably rapid and incomprehensibly vast generator of information: supply and demand tend to equilibrate, and to converge on a price in the neighborhood of the cost of production. To a uniquely reliable degree, a product will tend to end up in a consumer’s hands just in case that particular consumer wants the product enough to pay what it cost to produce it.

Although computers cannot solve the problem, Hayek thought radically dispersed decision making by buyers and sellers observably does solve the problem, so far as it can be solved. Sellers who charge too much end up without customers; they learn to be more efficient or else find some other line of work.[3] Buyers who want x but consider it overpriced stay home for a while, waiting for the price to fall. Then they see x flying off the shelves and learn something about themselves: namely, they would rather have the product at that price than not have it at all. To Hayek, only a price mechanism can process changing information almost instantaneously.

Ironically, the most efficient thing a central planner can possibly do is to set a price exactly where it would have been without the planner’s intervention.

3.1 Trucking, Bartering, Community

Insofar as society is a cooperative venture for mutual advantage, learning to survive—not just physically but as full members of a community—will involve learning to cooperate. Learning to cooperate involves learning to become a trading partner. In other words, cooperation begins with having something to offer: a way of making people better off.

Clearly in Smith, who inspired Hayek, but also in Hayek himself, the driving motivation is not greed or even well-being so much as a propensity to truck and barter, where this deal-making is not only a means to an end but somehow also what we do for its own sake, because making deals is what our kind of social animal was born to do. Neither, Hayek thought, is the objective for buyers and sellers to coordinate on a price that a central planner might stumble on, but to coordinate per se. Mutually satisfying coordination, the ongoing equilibration of supply and demand, constantly evolving in response to changing conditions, is itself the achievement. There is no need for that coordination to be tracking anything beyond itself. To Hayek, the value we hope to see realized in a marketplace is not that the correct volume of goods gets exchanged at the correct price. Rather, the point is trade per se. The valued result is buyers and sellers responding to each other, becoming more attuned to what people around them want, and helping to create a community in which their role in an important one.

Such sensitivity is good, but there is little that central planners can do to encourage it. Central planners replace what could be a complex, decentralized network of interdependence and mutual responsibility with something more like a society of spokes whose only connection is to a dominating central distributor at the hub. It is no substitute for real community.

3.2 Law As An Ecological Niche

In nature, for biological adaptation to culminate in better-adapted populations over time, the niche to which a population is adapting must be relatively stable. Likewise, under a rule of law, the aim of government is not to win but to provide a stable ecological niche that enables the game’s true players to evolve strategies apt for success within that niche. Analogously, an elaborate crystal structure cannot form unless the medium in which crystals form is left undisturbed. Hayek’s ideal is a legal “medium” of society, liberal enough to permit creativity, stable enough to reward creativity, and constraining enough in ways that steer people toward wealth creation and away from wealth capture.

Here, then, in a few sentences, is one way of understanding Hayek’s point. Not everything that happens in an evolving community is foreseen or intended. Actions have more than one consequence. They also have more than the intended consequence. This is especially so when there is more than one decision maker. No one follows a planner’s plan simply because the planner intends that they do so. People adjust to a planner’s plan in service of their own plans rather than those of the planner, and the result is too chaotic to be safely predictable. Further, the rule of law itself is an evolving product of ongoing decision making, so the framework itself takes a shape not intended by any legislator. Does this mean that every order is tautologically a spontaneous order? The answer: it is a universally true empirical generalization, not a tautology, that every social organization, even a dictatorship, is partly an ongoing product of ordering processes that are to some degree spontaneous. However, while the degree to which outcomes are unintended is a continuum, there remains a point in categorizing communities as centrally planned versus spontaneous. A central plan is designed to yield an end-state. A central plan aims to bring about particular outcomes—what roles people will play, what they will achieve in those roles, and what they will win by so achieving. By contrast, in what we should call spontaneous order, government provides a stable and known framework of rules, aiming not to realize a particular outcome so much as to realize a particular process (Hayek 1944, 113). Although this ideal can never be fully achieved in practice, a government under rule of law acts as referee and provider of the rule book (Hayek 1960, 114) and operates as much as possible by an ideal of “letting the players play.”

Is letting the players play good? Necessarily good? Adam Smith might have said no, as might Hayek. A praiseworthy rule of law—a praiseworthy market process— facilitates mutually beneficial trade by internalizing externalities, by minimizing transaction cost (especially when it comes to acquiring information), by minimizing opportunities to acquire people’s goods without their consent (thereby encouraging people to trade on agreeable—thus typically beneficial—terms), and by being extremely cautious about trying to do more than that. When the hubris of central planners leads them to imagine that their mandate is not to simply let the players play but to pick winners, entrepreneurship becomes the province of clandestine politics, economies grind to a halt, and civil society quite generally breaks down.

Hayek had no particular complaint about providing public education or the minimal elements of a welfare state, but not because such institutions are essential, and certainly not because only central planners can provide such instituions. Hayek would simply have said that societies providing themselves with basic infrastructure need not devolve into central planning and thus need not be antithetical to a free society. Issuing vouchers to subsidize education, for example, or the purchase of epipens, would distort markets to some extent but not to the extent that price controls do.

4. Justice as Impartiality, Politics As Entrepreneurship Without Restraint

Hayek, like Adam Smith, theorized about what works rather than what to do. Neither was a moral theorist in the 20th century sense. (That is, they did not follow Sidgwick in attempting to articulate “methods of ethics.”) That makes Hayek, like Smith, appear to be a consequentialist of sorts, and yet Hayek’s defense of economic freedom hints at a deontological moral sensibility that regards the separateness of persons as morally fundamental. Thus, for example, Hayek says, “the test of the justice of a rule is usually (since Kant) described as that of its universalizability” (Hayek 1969, 168). As John Gray sees it, Hayek commended the laws of justice “as being the indispensable condition for the promotion of the general welfare” but Hayek held, at the same time, that “an impartial concern for the general welfare is itself one of the demands of universalizability” (Gray 1984, 65).

In service of the overall project of fostering the general welfare, the point of law and legislation is to craft a framework within which a market order will be a history of pareto-improving trades.[4] A primary role of law and (when necessary) legislation is to narrow people’s options so as to limit opportunities to get rich at other people’s expense.[5] So long as the rule of law can internalize external cost and thereby steer innovation in mutually beneficial rather than parasitic directions, an evolving order will be an order of rising prosperity.

No such confidence is warranted under a central planner. In a planned order, even astute and conscientious decisions by men of system are damaging in a particular way. Namely, to the extent that men of system become micro-managers, they are players rather than umpires. If bureaucrats start playing the game—responding to ephemeral events with centralized fine tuning—then even if they play as cleverly as bureaucrats could possibly play, the fact remains that in consequence, the dispersed and tacit knowledge of ordinary buyers and sellers ends up on the sidelines watching. People who would have been innovators (or at least whistle-blowers) become mere spectators, waiting to see what the plan is going to be.

Government provides the framework for interaction. Ideally, as mentioned, government operates only within a stable and known framework of rules (Hayek 1944, 113). This is Hayek’s vision of good government. Is it realistic? Could the kind of politician who has enough ambition to do what it takes to acquire government power realistically be expected to be content with subsequently serving as an impartial referee—with no agenda of his or her own? Hayek saw the rule of law as the market’s exogenous ecological niche, and thought that this niche, that is, the rule of law, must be properly constructed if the process of spontaneous order is be a good thing. However, Hayek seemingly came to doubt there could be any such thing as properly constructed rule of law. Why? Because law-making is a process driven by a logic more or less indistinguishable from market process except that benefits to legislators of their law-making are concentrated while costs are dispersed across the population, that is to say, cost is systematically externalized, and at best only dimly understood even after the fact.[6]

This is not only a moral hazard but an information problem. A piece of legislation may be thousands of pages. No one intends the bill as a whole. Indeed, there is no overall point to the bill, known or otherwise, because prior to passage literally no one knows what is in the bill. No one has even read more than a few pages of it, not even the hundreds of legislators who each added a few pages of earmarks as the price of securing their vote. After passage, it will fall to unelected operatives of the executive branch’s regulatory agencies to mull over the bill’s inevitable contradictions and decide what to count as complying with the legislation’s overall intent.

Common law, by contrast, is a body of practice and tradition. It sometimes needs to be supplemented by legislation. Crucially, however, by virtue of passing the test of time as a device for settling disputes, common law will not be mere prejudice or superstition. On the contrary, it will have a decisive advantage over ongoing legislation. Namely, it will have become what people expect. It will be shaping what people expect from each other. It will have become part of the plans of the community’s members, part of what they take into account, part of their basis for knowing what to do. Hayek never doubted the need for legislation but lamented our propensity to be oblivious to its inevitably unintended consequences and unseen cost (Hayek 1973, 86).

Moreover, the liberty thus undermined is political as well as economic, as a society’s energy increasingly shifts away from a positive-sum economic arena and into an arguably zero-sum arena of wrestling for political power to control the agenda of never-ending legislation aimed at undoing the mistakes, misdeeds, and disagreeable visions of political rivals.

5. Hayek Against Justice

To Hayek, it matters far more that the law be a framework for coordination than exactly what the coordination points are (Hayek 1960, 118). Hayek could see that coordination points have distributive implications, leading Hayek to lament our tendency to evaluate distributions by asking whether they are just. Yet, Hayek concedes, at least in principle, the legitimacy of a minimum income or welfare safety net of some sort. See Tebble (2015) for a sympathetic yet acute argument that this concession on Hayek’s part is a “fatal ambivalence.” In fact, Tebble argues, Hayek’s repudiation of social justice leaves him with no room to make any such concession (but for a contrary view, see Yadav, 2023).

Hayek says, “one of my chief preoccupations for more than 10 years” has been coming to terms with the idea that social justice is a mirage (Hayek 1978b, 57).[7] By social justice, Hayek means distributive justice, and more specifically what Nozick called end-state principles of distributive justice, which treat justice as about engineering outcomes rather than managing commercial traffic.

Why would justice so conceived be a mirage? Hayek says, “there can be no distributive justice where no one distributes” (Hayek 1978b, 58 or 1976, 68–69). In Hayek’s words, “considerations of justice provide no justification for ‘correcting’ the results of the market” (1969, 175). So long as traders are voluntarily making pareto-superior moves, there is nothing else that can be said or needs to be said by way of justification.

Why would Hayek resist applying conceptions of justice and injustice to situations where no one distributes? What is haunting Hayek here is not the idea that one person might be more deserving than another, but rather that a “merit czar” might presume to intervene to correct markets that fail to give people what a czar thinks they deserve. Merit czars presume not only to make sure that traffic is moving smoothly and therefore every driver is getting a turn; they also want to make sure every driver is heading in the right direction (Schmidtz, 2023, 17).

Fearing the invitation to tyranny, Hayek argues not that markets are just but that they are not the kind of thing that can be just or unjust. Where no one distributes, there may be something lamentable about the result, but the result will not be unjust in the way that engineering such a result would be. Outcomes that would have been unjust if deliberately imposed (such as being born with a cleft palate) sometimes simply happen. Rawls seems to agree with Hayek when he says, “The natural distribution is neither just nor unjust; nor is it unjust that persons are born into society at some particular position. These are simply natural facts” (Rawls, 1971, 102). Rawls, however, immediately adds what Hayek would call a non sequitur: “What is just and unjust is the way that institutions deal with these facts” (ibid), where resigning ourselves to the facts is the paradigmatically unjust way of dealing with them (ibid). If Rawls is right to deem the natural distribution neither just nor unjust, then when institutions “deal with natural facts,” they are, to Hayek, not undoing wrongs.

Hayek would never deny that cleft palates are bad. He would not resign himself to letting cleft palates go unrepaired. Hayek would, however, insist that if a problem is not an injustice, then fixing it cannot, contra Rawls, count as rectifying an injustice. If we feel called upon to help children with cleft palates, it will be because having a cleft palate is bad, not because having a cleft palate is unjust. When we help, we are not fixing an improper distribution of cleft plates. We are simply fixing cleft palates. When we respond to the problem, we take a stand not against injustice but against blameless suffering (Hayek 1976, 87).

If there is no injustice needing rectification, then the improvement we have a right to strive for is pareto-improvement, or in any case, improvement by mutually acceptable means. By contrast, if (contra Rawls) the natural distribution were unjust, that would open the field to the avalanche of zero-sum and negative-sum moves that people feel invited to impose on each other under the guise of rectifying injustice. The right to make such moves with other people’s money becomes an overwhelmingly lucrative political football, luring a society’s entrepreneurial talent into politics, where instead of creating new social capital, entrepreneurs spend their time inventing clever new ways of capturing it. Hayek would never deny the plain fact that people can and often do treat other people’s possessions as a political football, or the plain fact that people never tire of inventing theories according to which they are philosopher-kings who have a mandate to do so. Hayek is observing the actual empirical cost of never-ending political football. Hayek seems to worry that our sense of justice can make it harder for us to live together, and make progress together. It can make us feel righteous when we seek to use political power against fellow citizens who see things differently.

In that respect, Hayek was profoundly a constitutional democrat. He understood that a free society does what it can to take the spectre of a tyranny of the majority off the table. In ramping down the threat that shifting majorities can pose to minorities, constitutional democracy has the potential to make politics an alternative to war rather than a form of it.

As Hayek knew, he was profoundly at odds with much thinking about social justice. He expected to be vilified (1944, vii) and he was. He was as responsive to misfortune as anyone, and seemed to embrace the same package of duties to children as any social justice theorist would. Yet, he also saw the free world at a crossroads between a defeasible presumption that normal adults have agreed to share each other’s fate (Rawls, 1971, 102) and a defeasible presumption that normal adults have the right and the responsibility to play the cards that nature has dealt.

What Hayek saw as a mirage was not justice as such so much as a particular way of conceiving justice. Hayek was on board with justice as normal adults striving to live well, free from gratuitous interference by those whose conception of justice seems to license them to treat fellow citizens as mere means.

In Hayek’s mind, we should want a system of justice to be a framework for avoiding and resolving conflict that leaves us all with mutual expectations with which we can be at peace and which help us stay out of each other’s way as we each set a course for our individually chosen destinations. If we operated by end-state principles of justice (Nozick 1974), we would need to justify every move that bore on how goods would be distributed in the evolving end-state, which is to say we would need to justify virtually every trade we contemplate, which would gridlock us rather than facilitate our inventing new ways of making ourselves more valuable to the people around us.

On Hayek’s conception, no principle of justice would pick our destination for us. Neither would it require us to justify our destination to others. Indeed, there is a premium on people not needing to justify themselves.

Perhaps Hayek is overreacting here. In any case, some philosophical interpretation is unavoidable, but arguably this accounts for Hayek’s seemingly dogmatic dismissal of end-state principles of justice. For reasons reminiscent of Nozick’s, Hayek finds such principles unaffordable and incompatible with autonomous agents minding their own business in a free society. Indeed such principles make it hard to imagine what could count as minding one’s own business. In that respect, in trying to carve out a coherent realm of individual autonomy, Hayek paradigmatically is, as he often claimed, a liberal, not conservative.

5.1 Input, Output, and What It Means To Economize

Merit, as Hayek understands it, concern the inputs one brings to a process, not the output. (Hayek 1960, 94). Hayek speaks as if merit has everything to do with trying hard, and nothing to do with achieving excellence. In Hayek’s mind, nothing good can come of that. In a free society, by contrast, we are rewarded for our output, not our input (Hayek 1960, 98). Among Hayek’s core concerns is the “mirage” of thinking that justice requires rewarding people for supplying inputs, not for supplying outputs. Admittedly, if we leave customers to their own devices, output is what they will reward, which is what Hayek wants.

By the same token, when customers left to their own devices choose to reward us for our output, their behavior plainly is not altogether insensitive to merit. The tendency of market rewards to track merit will be merely a tendency, but meritocracy being merely a tendency is not the same as meritocracy being a mirage. A key element of a system’s success in promoting prosperity will be that in rewarding excellent output, customers are at the same time rewarding the hard work, courage, alertness, and commitment that makes for excellence. To be sure, customers will be rewarding luck too, but typically not sheer random fluke. Customers reward entrepreneurs for what they do with their lucky breaks, not for the bare fact of having had lucky breaks.[8]

Hayek says we want to economize on merit (Hayek 1960, 96). This is true. But even so, saying we economize on hard work is another way of saying hard work is important. It is not evidence that we are in the grip of a mirage when we imagine that we have reason to reward the hard work and other dimensions of merit that have robust tendencies to culminate in excellent output.

In sum, a merit theorist would be well-advised to concede to Hayek that rewards ought to track actual performance, not inner merit. Customers can judge your product’s merits without needing to know whether you were lucky. The crucial point is that wherever it is more rewarding to work hard than not, more rewarding to do excellent work than not, more rewarding to be alert to customer needs than not, a system is tending to reward the right things. In that system, output will tend to be increasingly excellent over time. Products will tend to work as advertized. People will tend to prosper, and will tend to aim at being meritorious to boot.

5.2 The Right To Distribute

As noted, Hayek’s critique of social justice is more specifically a critique of centrally planned distribution according to merit. Hayek thinks a merit czar would be intolerable. However, when Hayek rejects the idea of a merit czar, what bothers him most is the idea that justice requires central planning, not the idea that it would be good to have a way of rewarding merit. If Hayek is right that there is no place for centralized decisions about meritoriousness in a good society, then, contra Hayek, the implication is not that merit doesn’t matter but precisely that it does (Hayek 1976, 64). The problem with a merit system, to Hayek, is that if you cannot prove you deserve G, that licenses merit czars to redistribute from the less to the more deserving. The point is crucial not because it refutes Hayek but because it reveals the precise nature of Hayek’s real concern. Hayek’s core concern is not the mirage of thinking merit does matter, but the mirage of thinking entitlement doesn’t.[9]

5.3 Fair Practices

Note the similarity between Hayek’s view and the view expressed by John Rawls in “Two Concepts of Rules” (1955). Both Hayek and Rawls understood, as few have, what is involved in a practice having utility. To use Rawls’s example, the practice of baseball is defined by procedural rules rather than by end-state principles of distributive justice. To have a practice at all, we must be dogmatic (Hayek would say) about how many strikes a batter should get.

Imagine changing the concept of the game so that the umpire’s job is to make sure the good guys win. What would that do to the players? What would become of their striving? The result would not be baseball. If we end up with a game where the umpire is making sure the annointed team wins, allocating extra opportunities to the hometown hero as required “so that we get the desired solution” (Rawls, 1971, 141), then the players are sitting on the sidelines watching, hoping to be annointed. Hayek’s insight (and Rawls’s insight at that stage of his career) is that genuine fairness is not about making sure prizes are properly distributed.[10] Fairness is not even about making sure outcomes are not unduly influenced by morally arbitrary factors such as how well the players played or how hard they worked to prepare themselves. True fairness is about being impartial, nonpartisan—proverbially, “letting the players play.”

One of Hayek’s problems with the kind of justice that amounts to making sure the good guys win is that it tends to turn society’s basic structure into a political football, which tends to squander gains from trade. To Hayek, again, true justice is about letting the players play, to the same extent that pareto-improving economic coordination is about letting the players play.[11]

5.4 Just Price

Whether we realize gains requires only that we trade on mutually agreeable terms, not that we trade at any particular price. Thus, we don’t want to focus on price when the wealth of nations has everything to do with gains from trade and nothing to do with price.

Indeed, Hayek observes, being obsessed with just price makes trade less likely, which results in failing to realize some of the cooperative surplus. Much of Hayek’s aversion to justice stems from a sense that (for thousands of years) talk of justice has had a way of turning into talk of just price (Hayek 1976, 73). This makes prices appear morally important, which to Hayek is a mirage.[12] Of Adam Smith’s butchers and bakers, Hayek says,

Precisely because they were interested only in who would offer the best price for their products, they reached persons wholly unknown to them, whose standard of life they thereby enhanced much more than they could have that of their neighbors… (Hayek 1978b, 60).

Hayek’s dismissal of social justice as a mirage is a gratuitously tendentious way of packaging his actual view. However, Hayek’s motive is clear: namely his dread of the prospect of licensing a justice czar to intervene to make sure prices are fair, thus derailing the wealth-creating spontaneous trading of a free society within the rule of law. Paraphrasing Michael Munger (2013), the closest thing we have to an omniscient social planner are the twin forces of supply and demand, but those forces speak to people through changing prices. When the state makes it a crime to charge what the market will bear, that can set in motion a process that makes it illegal for insulin users to respond to a power failure by outbidding beer drinkers for insulin-preserving ice as the supply of ice (in the absence of refrigeration) runs short.

In a case like that, the law has struck dumb the only voice that can give people reliable, timely advice on how they need to allocate resources right now. This is the ultimate concern throughout Hayek’s writings and underlying his otherwise ill-fitting polemic against social justice. To Hayek, it is a mirage to think fairness has anything to do with stopping the price mechanism from notifying us about where our services are most in need.

Hayek never doubts that we sometimes need legislation, but thinks the aim of legislation should be to make things better, not fairer; to make things more productive, not more level; to channel innovative thinking away from wealth capture and toward wealth creation. Hayek in fact endorses norms of pure procedural justice, and would agree that there is such a thing as fairness. True fairness, he would say, is about letting players play on a more or less level playing field but it is not about making sure everyone gets the same prize. Hayek saw a free society as one where people stand or fall on the basis of how well they perform, not how hard they try—what they produce, not what they intend.

6. The Austrian School and the Open Society

Hayek grew up in a glorious age of Viennese culture only to see it evaporate before his eyes with WWI, the Great Depression, the rise of socialism and fascism, WWII, and the Cold War. Hayek fought in WWI. He was among those who left Vienna in the early 1930s never to return. He experienced WWII in his adopted home of Great Britain (Caldwell and Klausinger, 2022). Like others of his generation, these experiences were pivotal. He saw totalitarianism distorting science and scholarship, as did two of his philosophical friends: Michael Polanyi and Karl Popper. Despite their differences, Hayek drew inspiration from and helped promote the work of Polanyi and Popper. (See Lewis 2016, Gaus 2021) Totalitarian systems inevitably end up being hostile to the critical attitude at the heart of scientific inquiry, and Hayek, Polanyi and Popper saw them for what they were from the start. In their separate ways, they sought to articulate and defend the science of a free society.

Hayek’s economic education at the University of Vienna was within the law faculty. Hayek’s degrees were in political science, jurisprudence, and economics. His dissertation work was on the technical topic of the imputation of value in a capital-using economy, and his early professional work focused on monetary theory and business cycle statistics. As with other scholars of the Austrian School of Economics, the institutional framework within which economic activity takes place was never far from the foreground, and was not to be obscured by technical economic analysis. Law, politics, and social norms all are critical to the way Austrian economists see economic forces playing out in the real world.

Hayek’s growing frustration with the conversation among elite economists during the 1930s and 1940s was born out his utter surprise that the institutional wisdom passed down from classical political economists to the early neoclassical economists was being lost. He wanted to know why. He explored the rise of formalism and an emerging shift toward macro-theory emphasizing relationships between aggregate variables unconnected to individual choice. These shifts were technical in part, but Hayek saw the technicality masking (and partly driven by) a deeper philosophical shift from seeing the human condition as complex to seeing it as as a relatively simple machine that a good mechanic could tinker with and fine-tune. The idea of studying the human condition as a complex spontaneous order came to seem unscientific. Thus, in “The Use of Knowledge in Society”, Hayek says maximizing and equilibrium models of mathematical economics “habitually disregard” essential dimensions of the phenomena to be explained, and in so doing “mislead some of our leading thinkers” (1944, 91).

Critical to the Austrian examination of the competitive market process is the primacy placed on property rights, relative prices, and profit-and-loss accounting. The emphasis on institutional infrastructure informed Austrian perspectives on price theory and the market system, on monetary and capital theory, and on obstacles to socialist economic planning in particular and interventionism more generally. To Hayek, the idea of prices without property is a grand illusion, and efforts to regulate economic activity are plagued by unintended consequences and unforeseen costs.

Hayek’s concern in The Counter-Revolution of Science was the wrong turn in the history and philosophy of ideas that was confusing a generation of scholars and public servants about the social sciences, institutions of liberalism, and principles of justice. His sustained explorations of legal philosophy and political theory sought to counter excessive formalism, excessive aggregation, and a naïve empiricism that in his mind conspired to produce the intellectual dead-end of scientism: that is, an inappropriate and uncritical application of the methods of the natural sciences to the problems of social science.

6.1 Subjectivism

As a student of the Austrian School of Economics, Hayek was both a subjectivist and a marginalist in his approach to studying human decision making. The value of goods and services inheres in the judgment of the individual chooser, not in the goods and services as such. Neither are prices posted in the market merely a summation of costs of production. Consider that owners of gas stations may hike gasoline’s retail price upon hearing news of a supply problem in the Middle East. The news obviously does not affect how much they paid for gas already in their storage tanks. However, it does affect what it is likely to cost them to restock as current supplies run out. Retail customers see the hike as gouging because they are oblivious to the fact that revenue from current sales has to cover the purchase of future supply, so vendors have to set current retail price with a view to future wholesale prices.

Accordingly, when Hayek calls valuation subjective, valuing may require guesswork but it is not merely a matter of opinion or taste. Rather, he is talking about prices as reflecting distributed and situated perspectival awareness of reality. “To employ a useful metaphor,” Hayek argued, “while in the world of nature we look from the outside, we look at society from the inside; while, as far as nature is concerned, our concepts are about the facts and have to be adapted to the facts, in the world of society at least some of the most familiar concepts are the stuff from which the world is made” (1948, 76). We are what we study. [13]

Hayek’s mentor, Ludwig Mises, stated the argument as follows in his treatise of economics, Human Action (1949, 92): “Economics is not about things and tangible material objects; it is about men, their meanings and actions. Goods, commodities, and wealth are all functions of human meaning and conduct. He who wants to deal with them must not look at the external world; he must search for them in the meaning of acting man.” A favorite example among Austrian School economists was to imagine a scientist from Mars studying the New York subway. Our scientific Martian observes bodies and boxes at 8am. The boxes swallow the bodies and move. At 5:00pm, boxes return to the same places and bodies are disgorged. The Martial observer may develop a theory of boxes and bodies and offer predictions. But can our observer truly understand the observed phenomena without acknowledging that the observed bodies are moving purposively? The point is that, rather than seeing boxes and bodies, we understand the just-mentioned patterns as people commuting to work. Fritz Machlup was capturing this idea when he penned an essay under the title: “What if Matter Could Talk?” The social sciences are indeed scientific inquiry, but the subject of study is radically complex. To study the human condition is not to be studying inert pawns with no principle of motion of their own but to instead be studying self-conscious originators of plans and purposes. Economic science begins with purposeful human action. As social scientists we can interpret human action in terms of beliefs, desires, and intentions.

6.2 Complexity

The Austrian School of Economics also emphasized the passage of time and uncertainty inherent in human decision making as part of the complexity of the economic order. The emphasis on complexity is not new to the Viennese economists. It can be seen at the beginning of The Wealth of Nations in Adam Smith’s discussion of division of labor, specialization, and economies of scale culminating in the reliable availability of such mundane things as a worker’s woolen coat. The number of exchanges, Smith states, exceeds all computation. To this computational complexity, the Austrian School added the idea of ceaseless change that requires constant adaptation and adjustment to shifting circumstances, including changes in tastes, technology and resource availability. Menger and Bohm-Bawerk developed an understanding of price theory and the market system that Mises and Hayek extended by arguing that a proper object of economic theory is not efficiency properties of end-states so much as adaptive and learning aspects of the market process.

Hayek’s intellectual adversaries shifted somewhat in the second half of his career. German Historicism and Collectivist Positivism were no longer the animating forces they were in the first half of the 20th century. Logical positivism was also transformed. To Hayek, however, a failure to come to grips with the social world’s essential complexity was an enduring cost of the scientism latent in those traditions. Thus, Hayek’s methodological writings in the 1960s and 1970s tend to stress not subjectivism and the human sciences so much as differences between the sciences of simple phenomena versus the sciences of essential complexity.

6.3 Contemporary Views of Hayek

To Hayek, markets have no telos. A market has no particular objective. It has no intention. It is merely an arena in which goals are pursued within market constraints, which is to say that market transactions involve buying, selling, choosing, negotiating, settling, and ultimately consenting. Amartya Sen (1992) argues contra Hayek that even under ideal conditions market outcomes are not necessarily just outcomes. The deeper and more interesting underlying disagreement here is whether justice pertains to the market process or to the market outcome. It is “justice as outcome” that Hayek sees as a mirage, not “justice as process.” However, Sen is not merely talking past Hayek here, because Sen also sees Hayek as underestimating the role that public institutions play in cultivating capabilities. Phillip Pettit (1997) argues that Hayek does not pay sufficient attention to using institutional safeguards to protect against relations of domination. Spontaneous order, according to Pettit, does not guarantee freedom from domination as reflected in corporate power, concentrations of wealth and exploitation of labor. Hayek is adamant that outcomes are not the kind of thing that can be guaranteed, but here, too, Pettit is not merely talking past Hayek because Pettit's critique can be interpreted as a critique of the market process as much as the market outcome. Elizabeth Anderson (2017) considers how market-based hierarchies undermine workplace democracy. The capitalist workplace, according to Anderson, is a form of private government where the workers have little autonomy or voice. As such, the spontaneous order that Hayek celebrates, in practice fails to respect the democratic values of equality and participation. It seems likely that Hayek would have some sympathy for this concern. For people to be free, according to Hayek, is for there to be a limit to what the Other is at liberty to do to them, even when the Other is a majority.

More recently, Daniel Luban (2020) has argued that an emerging order is not guaranteed to be just or desirable. Hayek should and would acknowledge that caste systems and institutions of slavery have evolved by a process that was spontaneous in some respect, and needless to say Hayek denounced them (1944, 10). One might ask whether Hayek thought that there is something in the very idea of spontaneous order that is inherently justifying; or, rather, did he think that there is something in the very idea of imposed order that stands in need of justification? Clearly, Hayek thought the latter, although Luban finds Hayek’s epistemic critique of constructivism to be overstated. Ben Jackson (2020) similarly argues that Hayek’s critique of social justice does not necessarily follow from Hayek’s own economic analysis. In particular, spontaneous order does not produce a level playing field. Jackson also sees Hayek as underestimating the role of the state in making possible modern economic growth and development. But, as noted in Section 6 above, Hayek was influenced by living through times when centralized government power was used to perpetrate genocidal horror.

Bibliography

Primary Literature: Work by Hayek

  • 1944, The Road to Serfdom, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1945, “The Use of Knowledge in Society,” American Economic Review, 35: 519–30.
  • 1948, Individualism and Economic Order, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1952, The Counter-Revolution of Science, Glencoe, IL: Free Press.
  • 1958, “Freedom, Reason, and Tradition,” Ethics, 68: 229–45.
  • 1960, The Constitution of Liberty, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1969, Studies in Philosophy, Politics, and Economics, London: Routledge.
  • 1973/76/79, Law, Legislation, and Liberty, in 3 volumes, Chicago: University of Chicago Pres).
  • 1978a, “Coping with Ignorance,” Imprimis, 7: 1–6.
  • 1978b, New Studies in Philosophy, Politics, Economics, and the History of Ideas, London: Routledge.
  • 1988, The Fatal Conceit: The Errors of Socialism, W. W. Bartley III (ed.), Volume 1 of The Collected Works of F. A. Hayek, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

Secondary Literature

In addition to the sources below, as a general reference, see the Review of Austrian Economics.

  • Anderson, Elizabeth. 2017. Private Government: How Employers Rule Our Lives and Why We Don’t Talk about It. Princeton University Press
  • Boettke, Peter J., 1995. “Hayek’s Road to Serfdom Revisited: Government Failure in the Argument Against Socialism,” Eastern Economic Journal, 21: 7–26.
  • Boettke, Peter J., 2018. F.A. Hayek: Economics, Political Economy, and Social Philosophy, London: Palgrave MacMillan.
  • Boettke, Peter J., and Rosolino Candela, 2023. “On the Feasibility of Technosocialism,” Journal of Economic Behavior and Organization, 205: 44–54.
  • Buchanan, James M., and Gordon Tullock, 1962. A Calculus of Consent, University of Michigan Press.
  • Burczak, Theodore, 2009. Socialism After Hayek, University of Michigan Press.
  • Caldwell, Bruce J., 1991. “Clarifying Popper,”Journal of Economic Literature, 29: 1–33.
  • Caldwell, Bruce J., 2004. Hayek’s Challenge: An Intellectual Biography of F.A. Hayek, University of Chicago Press.
  • Caldwell, Bruce J., and Hansjoerg Klausinger, 2022. Hayek: A Life, 1899–1950. University of Chicago Press.
  • Critical Review, 1997. Special Issue on F. A. Hayek, 11: 1.
  • Feser, Edward (ed.), 2006. The Cambridge Companion to Hayek, Cambridge University Press.
  • Gaus, Gerald, 2021. The Open Society and its Complexities, Oxford University Press.
  • Gray, John, 1984. Hayek on Liberty, Basil Blackwell.
  • Jackson, Ben, 2020. “Putting Neoliberalism in Its Place.” Modern Intellectual History, 17: 567–589
  • Lewis, Paul, 2016. “The Emergence of ‘Emergence’ in the Work of F.A. Hayek: A Historical Analysis,” History of Political Economy, 48: 111–150.
  • Luban, Daniel, 2020. “What Is Spontaneous Order?” American Political Science Review, 114: 90–102
  • Machlup, Fritz (ed.), 1976. Essays on Hayek, Hillsdale College Press.
  • Mises, Ludwig, 1949. Human Action, Yale University Press.
  • Munger, Michael, 2013. “They Clapped: Can Price-Gouging Laws Prohibit Scarcity?” See below, under “Other Internet Resources”
  • Nozick, Robert, 1974. Anarchy, State, and Utopia, Belknap.
  • Pennington, Mark, 2011. Robust Political Economy, Edward Elgar.
  • Pettit, Phillip. 1997. Republicanism: A Theory of Freedom and Government. Oxford University Press
  • Polanyi, Michael, 1958. Personal Knowledge, University of Chicago Press.
  • Popper, Karl, 1945. The Open Society and Its Enemies, Princeton University Press.
  • Rawls, John, 1955. “Two Concepts of Rules,” The Philosophical Review, 64: 3–32.
  • –––, 1971. A Theory of Justice, Harvard University Press.
  • Schmidtz, David, 2023, Living Together: Inventing Moral Sciencee, Oxford University Press.
  • Sen, Amartya. 1992. Inequality Reexamined. Oxford University Press, 1992
  • Shearmur, Jeremy, 1996. Hayek and After: Hayekian Liberalism as a Research Programme, Routledge.
  • Smith, Adam, 1790. Theory of Moral Sentiments, Liberty Fund, 1984.
  • Tebble, Adam, 2015. Epistemic Liberalism: a Defense, Routledge.
  • Yadav, Vikash, 2023. Liberalism’s Last Man: Hayek in the Age of Political Capitalism, University of Chicago Press.
  • Zwolinski, Matt, 2008. “The Ethics of Price-Gouging,” Business Ethics Quarterly, 18: 347–78.
  • Zwolinski, Matt, and John Tomasi, 2023. The Individualists, Princeton University Press.

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Thanks to the Georgetown Institute for the Study of Markets and Ethics at Georgetown’s McDonough School of Business for hosting the first author in the fall of 2016 and again in the fall of 2023. Support from the John Templeton Foundation made the latter visit possible, but opinions expressed here are those of the authors and do not necessarily reflect views of the Templeton Foundation. For encouragement and advice, the authors thank Mark Budolfson, Suzi Dovi, David Friedman, Jerry Gaus, Michael Gill, Pete Leeson, Elijah Millgram, Mark Pennington, Jeremy Shearmur, Ionut Sterpan, Virgil Storr, Adam Tebble, John Thrasher, and audiences at the Southern Economic Association, George Mason University’s Political Economy seminar, Bucharest School of Social Science and Philosophy, and the Arizona Center for Philosophy of Freedom. Heartfelt thanks also to reviewers for the Stanford Encyclopedia.

Copyright © 2025 by
David Schmidtz <dschmidtz01@gmail.com>
Peter Boettke <pboettke@gmu.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free