Notes to Inheritance Systems
1. More broadly, a trait is hereditary if offspring have a higher probability of resembling the corresponding trait of the parent (e.g., eye color) than would otherwise be the case, or if similarity between parent and offspring is caused by inheritance processes. This sidesteps various complications, for example the effects of sexual reproduction and phenomena such alternation of generations, which are handled differently by the various conceptual frameworks discussed below. For a useful recent discussion of the notions of heredity and reproduction, see Godfrey-Smith (2009).
2. The tables below provide a detailed comparison of the inheritance systems of Jablonka and Lamb. These tables are reproduced with permission from Eva Jablonka and Marion J. Lamb (2005/2014).
| Inheritance system | Organizations of information | Dedicated copying system? | Transmits latent (nonexpressed) information? | Directions of transmission | Range of variation |
| Genetic | Modular | Yes | Yes | Mostly vertical | Unlimited |
| Epigenetic | |||||
| Self-sustaining loops | Holistic | No | No | Mostly vertical | Limited at the loop level, unlimited at the cell level |
| Structural templating | Holistic | No | No | Mostly vertical | Limited at the structure level, unlimited at the cell level |
| RNA silencing | Holistic | Yes | Sometimes | Vertical and sometimes horizontal | Limited at the single transcript level, unlimited at the cell level |
| Chromatin marks | Modular and holistic | Yes (for methylation) | Sometimes | Vertical | Unlimited |
| Organism-level developmental legacies | Holistic | No | No | Mostly vertical | Limited |
| Behavioral | |||||
| Behavior-affecting substances | Holistic | No | No | Both vertical and horizontal | Limited at the single behavior level, unlimited for lifestyles |
| Nonimitative social learning | Holistic | No | No | Both vertical and horizontal | Limited at the single behavior level, unlimited for lifestyles |
| Imitation | Modular | Probably | No | Both vertical and horizontal | Unlimited |
| Symbolic | Modular and holistic | Yes, several | Yes | Both vertical and horizontal | Unlimited |
Table 1. The reproduction of information
| Inheritance system | Variation is targeted (biased generation)? | Variation subject to developmental filtering and modification? | Variation constructed through direct planning? | Variation can change the selective environment? |
| Genetic | Generally not, except for the directed changes that are part of development and the various types of interpretive mutation | Usually not, although expressed genetic changes may have to survive selection between cells prior to sexual or asexual reproduction | No | Only insofar as genes can affect all aspects of epigenetics, behavior, and culture |
| Epigenetic | Yes, a lot of epigenetic variations are produced as specific responses to inducing signals | Yes, selection can occur between cells prior to reproduction; epigenetic states can be modified or reversed during meiosis and early embryogenesis | No | Yes, because the products of cellular activities can affect the environment in which a cell, its neighbors, and its descendants live |
| Behavioral | Yes, because of emotional, cognitive, and perceptual biases | Yes, behavior is selected and modified during the animal’s lifetime | No | Yes, new social behavior and traditions alter the social and sometimes also the physical conditions in which an animal lives |
| Symbolic | Yes, because of emotional, cognitive, and perceptual biases | Yes, at many levels, in many ways | Yes, at many levels, in many ways | Yes, very extensively, by affecting many aspects of the social and physical conditions of life |
Table 2. Targeting, constructing, and planning transmitted variation