Edith Landmann-Kalischer

First published Tue Mar 18, 2025

Edith Landmann-Kalischer (1877–1951) is the author of several significant studies on topics in the philosophy of art, aesthetics, value, mind, and knowledge in the first half of the twentieth century. Influenced by Franz Brentano, Georg Simmel, Carl Stumpf, and Stefan George, her studies were initiated at a time when the academic, often tendentious borders between psychology and philosophy, like those between aesthetics and art history, were still being drawn. While clearly also influenced by Edmund Husserl, she takes his phenomenology to task for its idealism and, in her view, its unfounded isolation from the sciences, especially psychology. Although neglected in subsequent years until very recently, her work in aesthetics and value theory and her numerous critical reviews were widely respected by her contemporaries, such as Max Dessoir and Alexius Meinong. So, too, students of Stefan George and his circle have long been indebted to her chronicles and studies of the poet. Following a review of her life, work, and influences, the present entry focuses principally on her contributions, early and late, to aesthetics.

1. Life, Work, and Influences

Born in Berlin in 1877, Landmann-Kalischer received her PhD in 1901 with a dissertation from the University of Zurich under the direction of Ernst Meumann on the “Analysis of Aesthetic Contemplation (Painting and Sculpture)”, based upon a combination of self-observation and art history (since, as she puts it, the subject matter exceeded the experiences of a single consciousness). During her graduate studies she took advantage of an arrangement that allowed her to attend lectures by Simmel and Stumpf in Berlin, to whom—along with Meumann—she pays special tribute in the dissertation. By her own account, “philosophy, specifically psychology, and art history” were her main scholarly interests and this description captures her own interdisciplinary approach to these subjects as well as the interwovenness of philosophy and psychology at this time. Two years after submitting her dissertation she married Julius Landmann, a Swiss economist, and over the next seven years she gave birth to three children. She and her children accompanied Landmann as he worked, first in Bern (1906–1910) for the Swiss National Bank, and then as he took up academic positions at the University of Basel (1910–1927) and at the University of Kiel (1927–1931).

During the first decade of the century, Landmann-Kalischer writes two important essays on topics in aesthetics: “On the Cognitive Value of Aesthetic Judgments” (1905a) and “On Artistic Truth” (1906), followed by the monograph Philosophy of Values (1910) which she prefaces with a critical review of Hugo von Münsterberg’s own 1908 Philosophy of Values. The first two essays are reviewed respectively in sections 2 and 3 below as part of the entry’s emphasis on Landmann-Kalischer’s contributions to aesthetics. However, her contributions to axiology are also noteworthy, as evidenced by her Philosophy of Values.

In the 1910 monograph she begins with a review of Münsterberg’s appeal to a world-affirming, “supra-personal” act of will—supposedly shared by all humans and ensuring coherence across human experience—as the source of value in general. Landmann-Kalischer dismisses this appeal as nothing more than an “arbitrary metaphysical assumption” (Essays 121). She also reviews Münsterberg’s “doctrine of four worlds”, i.e., the four autonomous domains of logical, aesthetic, ethical, and religious value, demonstrating how the doctrine departs from Windelband’s Neo-Kantian system of values. But she also contests Münsterberg’s Kant-inspired appeal to a principle of constitution to justify value-judgments’ claims of validity. On Landmann-Kalischer’s reading, Münsterberg mistakenly supposes that, just as logical judgments’ validity is based upon the fact that they constitute the world, “it must be possible to legitimize the good, the beautiful, and the holy in the same way” (Essays 118). By demonstrating the illegitimacy of this approach to the philosophy of value, Landmann-Kalischer sets the stage for her own approach. Rejecting the Kantian-styled project of locating “values in the construction of the world that the rationalist epistemology projects”, Landmann-Kalischer turns to the given, to values as we find them, namely, as the properties of things that we deem valuable “on the basis of an immediate feeling that they arouse in us” (Essays 143). In her view—building on her 1905a essay discussed in the section 2 below—we objectify feelings (‘x is beautiful’) just as we objectify sensations (‘x is red’) and with the same degree of legitimacy. Her elaboration of this view requires a differentiation of feelings from emotions; the former can be “pure” and “disinterested”, while the latter never are. With this reference to disinterestedness, the paradigmatic inspiration that Landmann-Kalischer draws from Kant’s analysis of aesthetic experience is apparent. But the immediate context is ongoing discussion in contemporary philosophy of mind about the status of feelings and emotions—for example, in the works of Stumpf and Alexis Meinong, among others—to which she contributes.

Mention has already been made of Landmann-Kalischer’s engagement with the work of philosophers like Simmel, Stumpf, and Windelband. But the reach of her research extends to several other prominent peers and immediate predecessors as well. Her correspondence, for example, with Alexius Meinong on the status of value is substantial, apparently prompting a change of mind on his part. Citing both “On the Cognitive Value of Aesthetic Judgments” and Philosophy of Value, he writes that, contrary to his first impressions, Landmann-Kalischer’s explanations seem to him today “the most important” for the establishment of the conception he is sketching (Meinong 1912: 10; although the degree of Landmann-Kalischer’s grasp of Meinong’s early value-theoretic views is disputed; see Reicher 2009: 116n8). Also worthy of note in this connection are Landmann-Kalischer’s critical reviews of works by such prominent scholars as Theodor Lipps and Emil Lask. Her work in epistemology (see below) is replete with references to the work of Heinrich Rickert and Wilhelm Dilthey, whom she credits with demonstrating that we can know, not only the universal, but the individual; yet she rejects the notion that knowledge of the latter is reserved for the humanities (TE 250–256, 277).

Another major influence on Landmann-Kalischer’s thinking is, as already noted, Edmund Husserl. She touts his exposition of the object of consciousness, building on studies by Bolzano and Brentano, as “the most encompassing and most emphatic” (TE 25). She leans on Husserl’s doctrine of fulfillment and, importantly, its limitations to craft her own view of the transcendence of knowing (TE 31, 34, 36, 91). More decisively than anyone else, he recognizes “seeing as the ultimate ground of all rational claims and perfect clarity as the measure of all truth” (TE 284). Still, she laments the fact that Husserl—“the very same scholar whom we have to thank above all for reestablishing transcendence as a fact of consciousness”—vehemently opposes any realistic, epistemological interpretation of transcendence (TE 47). She takes particular exception to Husserl’s insistence that an abyss separates consciousness and reality (TE 49). By stressing that transcendence can be attributed to objects of consciousness whether or not there is something transcendent, he shows that he does not take it [the transcendence of consciousness] “seriously” (TE 57). Both Husserl’s phenomenology and Cassirer’s Kantianism show their common modern, idealist stripes by taking knowing—not being—as primitive (TE 73).

As noted, Husserl’s influence on Landmann-Kalischer’s thinking is substantial in the ways that she appropriates his phenomenology as well as the ways that she distances herself from it. The same might be said for Franz Brentano’s arguably even more telling influence on her thinking. Brentano’s importance for her work is twofold: first, she regards him as the foremost advocate for the objective conception of values which she herself embraces (Essays 4) and second, in her view, it is “thanks to Brentano and since Brentano” that the latest research has become familiar once again with the phenomenon of intentionality (TE 8, 25). But she also develops her own philosophical position by setting it against Brentano’s approach in at least two respects. Brentano develops what is today deemed a “dispositionalist” approach where value is a quality of a higher order, dually dependent (like secondary qualities) on the subject as well as the properties of things. Landmann-Kalischer’s philosophy of value aligns with this dispositionalist approach, save in one crucial respect: she locates that disposition in feelings not desires (see Vendrell-Ferrarin 2014: 151–152). She shares with Brentano the notion that the ensuing judgments can be objective but she rejects Brentano’s appeal to a supposedly immediately evident judgment in this connection (akin to a judgment like the principle of noncontradiction that is clearly differentiable from a blind judgment); she rejects this appeal to intuition in favor of empirical experience and the work of identifying and removing errors. “Thus, Landmann-Kalischer understands the objectivity of sensory judgments and value-judgments not as a fact but as a task, …” (Vendrell-Ferrarin 2014: 153) or, as Landmann-Kalischer herself puts it, “The objectively valid values are not given, but have to be won” (Essays 163). On a more general, logical level, she rejects Brentano’s contention that axioms are “immediately true”, rejecting it because (a) judgments of outer perception are subjectively no less evident than those of inner perception and (b) the subjective evidence of judgments derived from the axioms is the same as that of the axioms themselves (Essays 177–181; on the influence of Brentano’s method and descriptive psychology on Landmann-Kalischer’s thinking in general, see Matherne 2023: 249–256 and Matherne’s Introduction to Essays xxvii–xxxii [Matherne 2024a]).

As a 22-year-old student, Landmann-Kalischer attended a seminar led by Max Dessoir at which Stefan George read his poetry (Karlauf 2007: 194). She later (1908) made the acquaintance of the poet who became an annual summer guest of the family in Basel from 1913 to 1927. During this time Landmann-Kalischer became a devoted, even ardent follower of the poet, keeping a regular diary of their conversations, later published as Gespräche mit Stefan George (Conversations with Stefan George); on her involvement in the George-Kreis (the circle of George’s admirers), see Raulff 2009: 139–157. Based upon a manuscript written to honor the poet on his 50th birthday in 1918, she publishes anonymously Georgika: Das Wesen des Dichters (Georgika: The Essence of the Poet) in 1920, followed by a reviewed edition in 1924. In 1923 she completed “Carl Spitteler’s Poetic Mission [Sendung]”, a study of the Nobel Prize-winning Swiss poet. Two further works on George would be published posthumously: Georges Wiedererweckung der Griechen (George’s Reawakening of the Greeks) (1955) and Stefan George und die Griechen. Idee einer neuen Ethik (Stefan George and the Greeks: Idea of a New Ethics) (1971).

Landmann-Kalischer’s work in the early part of the century was by no means confined to aesthetics, axiology, and poetology. By 1916 she completed the first draft of a major work in epistemology: Transcendenz des Erkennens (Transcendence of Knowing); the published version appears in 1923. This work presents a robust review of the different forms of transcendence, intra-mental and extra-mental transcendence, i.e., transcendence within consciousness and transcendence of something independent of consciousness, respectively. The review culminates in a potent defense of what she deems “transcendent realism” and “a realist epistemology”. The existence of the external world is, she submits, the Urphänomen, providing the very sense of consciousness. The notion of a subject not transcending itself is pure fiction, even though the intention of the existing, extra-mental object is “essentially unfulfillable” (TE 24, 31). Although we cannot help but represent [vorstellen] objects,

still we represent each object as unrepresented…The fact that the transcendent objects inevitably appear transcendent only to a consciousness cannot cancel the other fact that every consciousness attests to its transcendence. (TE 46)

These ruminations, it bears noting, echo unmistakably in Heidegger’s subsequent account of being-in-the-world, entailing the “transcendence” of Dasein that underlies its concerns and dealings, whether theoretical or practical, amidst innerworldly beings (Heidegger SZ 364). This echo is perhaps to be expected, given their common repudiation of Husserl’s idealism, and Landmann-Kalischer seems to have recognized as much (Wissen und Werten [Landmann 1930: 98]; Riedner 2002: 3).

Not surprisingly, Landmann-Kalischer takes both idealists and positivists to task, criticizing the former for countenancing only the contents of consciousness and the latter for countenancing only appearances—as though those contents and those appearances do not point to transcendent objects (TE 65f). In this very connection the Jesuit Scholastic philosopher, Erich Przywara, sees Transcendenz des Erkennens, with its insistence that transcendence is the a priori of knowing, as a departure from Kant and a return to a Scholastic position, albeit with the profile of the George-Kreis (Przywara 1924: 65). Korinna Schönharl similarly reads Transcendenz des Erkennens as the singular, unified presentation of the “epistemological intuitions” of the George-Kreis and concludes by noting the work’s influence on the economist Edgar Salin (Schönharl 2009: 446–448, 465, 471–475). Landmann-Kalischer herself acknowledges the influence of conversations with the poet on the work (Landmann 1963: 15). Indeed, drawing on aesthetics to make an epistemological point, she emphasizes the following analogy between the object of a painting and the object of consciousness.

Just as the means of the presentation [Darstellung] and its object are at once in the painting, so consciousness of the object and the transcendent object are at once in our knowledge. (TE 70)

The analogy holds, moreover, whether or not the object is the pure product of phantasy or a faithful imitation of something actual. So, too, the knowledge like the painting is only one of many means of portraying the object, each varying in its accuracy and what it accentuates.

We may believe again in what we see and how we see it: knowledge is a picture [Bild]. In the copy [Abbild] it shows us the original [Urbild]. (TE 71)

Landmann-Kalischer’s life is marked by tragedy on a personal level, particularly in the decade immediately following the publication of Transcendenz des Erkennens. In 1925 her daughter dies as a teenager from a rare form of tuberculosis, her husband commits suicide in 1931. Whether or not she suffered from not having her love for George requited, she experienced rejection by the George-Kreis that was clearly motivated in her mind by the mounting anti-semitism in Germany. At this point the personal and political tragedies of her life begin to merge. When she protested George’s sympathy for a movement that treated Jews with the brutality that National Socialism did, she reported him replying dismissively: “When I think of what Germany faces in the next fifty years, this whole Jewish thing in particular is not so important to me” (Norton 2002: 726; Karlauf 2007: 604f). As Landmann-Kalischer finally realized that it was impossible for Jews to remain in Germany, she dreamt of a Jewish ghetto in Namibia, before finally coming around to appreciate the approach of Zionists.

After Hitler came to power, Landmann-Kalischer spent most of the 1930s in Basel, befriending the painter Gertrud Kantorowicz and living with the philologist Renata von Scheliha (until the latter’s emigration to the United States in 1948). During this time she gave lectures at the Volkshochschule in Basel and explored various interpretations of the classics. But she also returned to central themes in aesthetics, completing Grundzüge einer Lehre vom Schönen (Fundamentals of a Doctrine of the Beautiful) in 1940, which was available in hectograph copies until its posthumous publication as Die Lehre vom Schönen (The Doctrine of the Beautiful) in 1952 (Schuster, 35). Following a short visit to von Scheliha in 1951, Landmann-Kalischer died of complications from an operation.

2. The Cognitive Value of Aesthetic Judgments

Landmann-Kalischer opens her 1905a essay on the cognitive value of aesthetic judgments by posing two leading questions, to be treated separately: (1) “whether the aesthetic judgment is a cognitive judgment” (in Kant’s sense, something Kant denies) and (2) “whether and to what extent aesthetic judgments can be credited with trans-subjective validity” (Essays 4). Her strategy to answer these questions is to elaborate analogies between sensory judgments and value judgments. These analogies demonstrate three theses: (i) that aesthetic valuation is the work of an “organ” functioning similarly to sense organs, (ii) that aesthetic judgment is on a par with sensory judgments in terms of their objective validity, and (iii) that beauty is a property of things in the same sense as sensory qualities are. Championing these theses, she notes, runs against the grain of most contemporary views of values, Brentano being the lone exception (as noted above). She runs through a list of proponents of the subjectivist view of values, who affirm that values are neither the properties of things nor the objects of cognitive judgments. She also notes the divergence among these proponents regarding the separate question of the objective validity of aesthetic judgments, their so-called “mandate” character, and how it connects with their subjectivist positions on values. “One looks in vain in the case of one author as in that of another,” she submits,

for a principled stance toward the question of the extent and the degree to which value judgments can be true and false and can accordingly mandate [fordern] our acknowledgment or rejection. (Essays 7; translation slightly revised)

If, without denying the subjectively conditioned character of values, one could show that value judgments are on a par with sensory judgments and their trans-subjective validity, “this explanation would have the advantage over the others of simplifying instead of complicating the picture of the world” (Essays 8). With this statement, Landmann-Kalischer introduces the project of the essay.

The first step in making her case is to establish the basic connection of values to feelings as opposed to desires (the will) or to an ideal (norm) of the subject. If anything, desires presuppose feelings and immediate value judgments are quite independent of an ideal (which is, in any case, itself already a value, thereby forfeiting any claim that it is what forms values). Having dismissed these two views of value, Landmann-Kalischer concludes that, “along with the majority of psychologists”, its content is to be seen in its connection to feeling. Here the paradigm is Kant’s “pure, disinterested judgment of taste”, based upon the connection of an object to the subject’s feeling of pleasure and displeasure (accordingly, the only values under consideration here are primary, unmediated values; excluded are economic and utilitarian values which alike presuppose other values.)

Having established the fundamental connection between values and feelings (a strategy already pursued by Brentano), Landmann-Kalischer probes whether this connection entails that value judgments are not really cognitive judgments, i.e., judgments designating a property of the object. Underlying the supposition of their non-cognitive status, Landmann-Kalischer points out, is the view that feelings are a purely subjective element, referring only to one’s own being (in contrast to sensations that relate to external objects). Throwing down the gauntlet at such views (and anticipating similar points made by Heidegger and Merleau-Ponty), Landmann-Kalischer asserts: “In my view, it is time to become skeptical of such purely subjective elements of consciousness” (Essays 13). Both phenomenologists reject the notion that sensations can be isolated from their worldly context or gestalt or that they are purely internal and, in that sense, purely subjective.

Pressing the point, she asks: Isn’t the separation of things’ sensory qualities from the feelings they elicit as incoherent as the separation of their primary qualities from their secondary qualities? Why should being red count as a property of a thing but being beautiful does not? Some would argue that the variability of feeling is one reason why. But Landmann-Kalischer counters that this sort of variability is also found in sensations and representations. Moreover, despite the variability and distortions, we have come to accept the law-governed dependency of some sensations on the object as well as the possibility of objective cognition through them. Hence, it would be arbitrary to rule out a similar prospect for feelings. To be sure, Landmann-Kalischer adds, in both cases, that of sensations as well as feelings, a distinction between subjective and objective conditions holds.

Landmann-Kalischer concedes that science traditionally purges cognizing of feelings both (a) because they did not enter into consideration for determining causes and (b) because animists and their kin often misread them into nature. Yet, in regard to (a), something similar holds for sensations. Thus,

for mechanics, the color of things is as irrelevant as thermal qualities are for optics. So, too, for the consideration of the anatomy of a flower, its aesthetic value is no less immaterial than its color. (Essays 16)

As for (b), cognition through feeling has little to do with this importation of feelings into things (which is itself a kind of philosophical or religious thesis). Someone might also object that the sensory properties of things play a fundamental role in the conceptual cognition of them, i.e., that color and touch aid us in recognizing things in ways that beauty does not. But, Landmann-Kalischer counters, while a color may aid in recognizing things, it is frequently set aside in the formation of concepts, whereas a thing’s value, while perhaps not much help in recognizing things, may be essential to concept-formation, e.g., that of an artwork. Landmann-Kalischer flags one final objection to placing values and sensory qualities on a par, namely, the dependency of the experience of beauty on the latter. But such dependency, she submits, does not entail that “a lesser degree of being [is] to be ascribed to it [beauty]” (Essays 17f).

Following these general reflections in support of the thesis of the parity of values and sensory properties, Landmann-Kalischer acknowledges that justification of the thesis turns on the question of whether and to what extent the same degree of objective validity can be ascribed to both sensory and aesthetic judgments. Both sorts of judgments are immediate and pre-reflective and they have subjective forms (e.g., ‘this pleases me,’ ‘I see blue’) as well as objective forms (‘this is beautiful,’ ‘this is blue’). Landmann-Kalischer begins with the subjective form, registering how they present themselves as judgments of inner perception. An aesthetic judgment can be subjectively unreliable due to the interference of a feeling, a distraction, or the influence of a concept on our attention, all of which is analogous to how we may ‘mishear’ or ‘overlook’ in the domain of the senses. Whereas subjective reliability in the case of the senses is measured by various tests, Landmann-Kalischer suggests that something similar is possible albeit yet to be achieved in the aesthetic domain. Still, in both cases, it is generally recognized that there is a more or less “maximal subjective reliability”, achievable through practice and education; psychology, too, can assist by determining what is extraneous and thus to be excluded.

Turning from the question of subjective reliability to objective reliability, Landmann-Kalischer notes that drawing out the analogy between sensory and aesthetic judgments in the latter sense runs up against an obvious difficulty. Whereas we can compare the adequate stimuli of the sensations with the sensations themselves, we lack anything of the sort in the aesthetic domain. Some regard this lack as a reason to reject the claim that the two sorts of judgment are on the same level, but Landmann-Kalischer points out that in no domain has the connection between stimulus and sensation been given from the outset (in fact it is still missing, she notes, in the case of smell). So the fact that this sort of connection has not been determined for the aesthetic domain is not a sufficient reason to reject the possibility. Given the present lack of means to test aesthetic judgments’ objective reliability, Landmann-Kalischer proposes a possible way of theoretically determining the conditions of such reliability. The proposal consists in

discussing the possible deceptions here in analogy with deceptions of the senses and pointing out such deceptions in the history of aesthetic judgments. For now the objectively correct judgment remains a presupposition, an ideal, imaginary point that we must hope to be able to find by setting aside all causes of deceptions. (Essays 25)

(Täuschung, the word translated ‘deception’ here, might be better rendered ‘illusion’ in some cases; we speak, for example, more commonly of an optical illusion than an optical deception.)

Landmann-Kalischer distinguishes three sorts of deceptions or illusions with respect to sensations: psychological (e.g., optical illusions due to attention straying from the optical object itself), physiological deceptions (e.g., deceptions due to an impaired receptive organ), and physical (e.g., illusions, like the bent stick in water, that are principally due to the physical stimulus). Under physical deceptions Landmann-Kalischer also includes deceptions that are about intensity, e.g., deceptions due to the stimulus exceeding upper or lower limits of sensation. Each of these sorts of deception has its analogue in the aesthetic domain: psychological deceptions (e.g., evaluating an artwork’s historical or political significance in place of its aesthetic value), physiological deceptions (e.g., a judgment colored by an emotion or disposition), or physical deceptions (e.g., deceptions due to lighting, arrangement, or a performance’s distortion of the aesthetic object).

Having drawn the analogy between sensory and aesthetic judgments’ reliability, Landmann-Kalischer argues that the same basic truth criterion applies to both sorts of judgment. That criterion is a judgment’s agreement with other judgments. To be sure, both sorts of judgment are immediate but, insofar as they lay claim to objective reliability, they

either are not made simply on the basis of the immediate impression or are nonetheless subjected to comparison after the fact and modified accordingly. (Essays 43)

Landmann-Kalischer identifies four groups of judgments expressing agreement, on which the validity of sensory judgments depends. These are agreements with: (1) other judgments of the same sense, (2) judgments of other senses, (3) other individuals’ sensory judgments, and (4) any other cognition, particularly scientific, that we have of the things in question. After elaborating these four groups with examples (differentiating universality and objectivity along the way), Landmann-Kalischer presents four similar groups for value judgments. These are agreements with

(1) judgments of the same individual about the same object at another time, (2) judgments by the same individual about other objects, (3) judgments by others, and (4) judgments that have universal, specifically scientific representations for their object. (Essays 49)

Just as the bearers of objective sensory judgments are not individual impressions but the sum of them,

so, too, what is decisive for the objective aesthetic judgment is not the individual feeling of pleasure but instead an entire series of impressions received from the object under different conditions. (Essays 49)

In this context, Landmann-Kalischer notes how placing aesthetic judgments on the same level as sensory judgments can seem to underrate them in one respect and unduly elevate them in another: to underrate them because they lay claim to a universal validity that is denied sensory judgments and to elevate them since they lack the universal agreement that it is possible to have for sensory qualities. But it seems to underrate them because aesthetic judgments are more profoundly associated with the essence of being human. In general, a person’s value judgments matter far more to us than their sensory judgments but this difference, Landmann-Kalischer adds, does “not justify any intrinsic contrast between these judgments” (Essays 52). As for the reason why the alleged parity seems to overrate aesthetic judgments, the explanation lies in the fact that they lack the “factual universality” of sensory judgments (Essays 52). But, in addition to pointing out structural reasons why many aesthetic judgments cannot be or cannot as yet be shown to be in agreement, Landmann-Kalischer notes that some elementary agreements (e.g., symmetry, thresholds, proportion, and contrast) are recognizable as are certain common rules (dealing, e.g., with perspective in painting, dramatic technique, musical composition, and the like). Also complicating matters for aesthetic judgments, in contrast to sensory judgments, is the fact that the former involves “the life of peoples”, while the latter typically concerns only an “individual life” (Essays 53). So, too, while aesthetic objects are present in nature and art, the latter are subject to the greatest changes—changes, Landmann-Kalischer adds, that are by no means based only on aesthetic viewpoints.

Universal agreement cannot be the criterion for the correctness of judgments since it would render contrary judgments unthinkable, ruling out the sense or purpose of the criterion. The criterion is instead the “individual truth” accorded “individually constant judgments about which no universal agreement reigns”, supplemented by the investigation—outlined in the essay—of investigating each judgment for “possible causes of its deceptiveness (or illusoriness)” (Essays 56f; translation slightly altered). Thus, Landmann-Kalischer submits, in conclusion, that the comparison of sensory and aesthetic judgments “in regard to their validity and the sources of deceptions in them” justifies the inference “that beauty is to be construed as a property of things in the same sense as sensory qualities are” (Essays 62).

The cognitivist and objectivist position that Landmann-Kalischer fashions in this, her first major essay, has significant ramifications for contemporary debates in aesthetics. These ramifications have been forcefully demonstrated in a recent study by Samantha Matherne. Relying precisely on the line of reasoning in “On the Cognitive Value of Aesthetic Judgments”, Matherne argues for the advantages of Landmann-Kalischer’s cognitivist and objectivist approach over hedonist and Kantian approaches to the question of aesthetic demarcation and normativity (Matherne 2020).

3. Artistic Truth

Having defended the cognitive value of aesthetic judgments a year earlier, Landmann-Kalischer argues in “On Artistic Truth” (1906) that artworks, while not judgments themselves, express contents that represent a specific sort of reality and thus can be judged to be true or false. While mental representations in general represent objective reality to varying degrees, art represents the reality of the mind, including those mental representations themselves. In other words, art relates to mental reality in the same way that mental reality relates to objective reality.

Art does not afford objective reality. It mirrors and portrays the mental world instead, and it is true insofar as it portrays that world faithfully, insofar as it succeeds in freeing the mental world from its entanglement with objective reality (which overreaches often enough precisely in naive consciousness) and in establishing it purely on its own terms… . Just as we would never see our face were it not for a mirror, so, too, we would never see our own inner life opposite us —were it not for the mirror of art. (Essays 70)

To be sure, art is not the only way of representing the reality of the mind; inner perception does as well. Still, art is in effect a mirror of the soul, our only means of seeing what is otherwise only available to “inner perception” (Essays 70). The emphasis here, moreover, is on “seeing” since art differs from psychology, precisely by making what is given to inner perception accessible to outer perception, whereas psychology translates what is so given into concepts (Essays 104). As Samantha Matherne puts it, an artist is for Landmann-Kalischer “someone who conveys truths about psychic reality through an artistic medium” (Matherne 2023: 254).

The forms of artistic truth correspond to three zones of consciousness (sensations/perceptions, memories, and phantasy), each of which exhibits in its own way three peculiarities of consciousness: its representation of only a segment of reality, while sporting a center and periphery, and being subject to conditions of the entire life of consciousness (e.g., feelings and interests, personal and public). Art’s mirroring of sensations or perceptions is true when it represents them

just as they are in consciousness, when they do not yet or no longer serve as a means of cognition, when the correction that thinking makes in them, for the purpose of the construction of objective reality, is not yet or no longer performed on them. (Essays 73)

In keeping with the pursuit of this sort of mirroring, painters are interested in more sorts of colors than typically come into consideration when the focus is on objective reality as such; something analogous holds for the musician’s palette of sounds. The painter and the musician give objective expression to these “surplus” sensations and their relations, and as they are found in consciousness before or after they serve as means of knowledge (consider, for example, a painting that captures the way a stick looks bent in water or perhaps Cezanne’s Montagne Sainte-Victoire). So, too, traditional painting epitomizes the way perception centers on an object against a background (e.g., Rembrandt’s The Three Trees).

The difference between mental reality and what serves the purposes of knowing is even starker in the case of memory-representations than perceptions, so much so that the memory-representations openly conflict with the latter. Our memories are typically selective and all too often we fill in gaps in our memory with familiar representations; so, too, we often remember only what we want to or at least have a strong motive to remember, all the while doing so in a manner that is little suited to afford “a faithful picture of reality”. But these features by no means make memory’s representations any less a subject for art to mirror faithfully. To be sure, an artwork—think of historical plays—may be considered untrue if it violates certain accepted views of its theme that govern memory’s representations. But it can nonetheless faithfully depict a memory of what happened or of a feeling that accompanied or allegedly accompanied what happened. Therein lies the “success”, i.e., the artistic truthfulness, of many a Shakespearean historical tragedy (Richard III, Troilus and Cressida).

Only a strong feeling, relative to a theme [Gegenstand], makes an artistically true portrayal of it possible since its representation lives in our memory only under the influence of such a feeling. (Essays 81)

Finally, just as a certain feeling makes a representation live on in our memory and thus in its mirroring by art, so, too, it is a feeling that principally drives phantasy’s representations and art’s mirroring of them. (Indeed, Landmann-Kalischer maintains that phantasy’s representations differ from memory’s only by degrees, albeit producing deliberately what the latter does nondeliberately.) This point is particularly evident in the case of the fairytale—the genre that is predominantly phantasy and “cultivates in the most perfect manner what every art lives from” (Essays 87). While we otherwise long “for surprises, for the extraordinary, for everything that breaks up the everyday and breaks through what is merely possible”, in the fairytale “everything goes on as we would like it to” (Essays 86). “In a fairytale”, Landmann-Kalischer continues, “we feel free because it plays freely with the things that we stand powerless against in life, the things that we have been delivered to without any hope of rescue” (Essays 86). Wishes are an essential part of the life of the soul and it is left to art to express these wishes, “rewriting the natural course of what happens and doing so in ways that flatter every longing (and to that extent are artistically true)” (Essays 90). But the rewriting must not exceed the bounds of what could happen, “the probable” in the sense of what must appear as capable of being true.

Having discussed the truth of art in terms of human sensation/perception, memory, and phantasy, Landmann-Kalischer turns to three ways of connecting their representations, two of which—the probable and the necessary—draw on the conjunction of objective reality, while the third—lyric poetry—remains “completely confined to the mental world”, dominated as it is by feelings. Beginning with the probable, so dominant in the history of aesthetics, Landmann-Kalischer notes that it is “what appears to be true”, a psychological truth that coincides with neither the real nor the phantastic (Essays 91f). But while this suffices for a fable, a tragedy demands more, not that one thing can but that it must follow another and, hence, overcomes our reluctance to accept it as true. This same tragic inevitability is necessary when the tragic makes up the content of epics in contrast to comedy which requires “only a very slight degree of probability” (Essays 93).

While the truths of tragedy and comedy correspond to different underlying feelings identifiable in terms of modalities of objective reality (the necessary and the possible respectively), Landmann-Kalischer notes that “all cognition aims at the necessary conjunction of the given”. But it is equally true that this necessity is “cognitively unattainable”.

And here art enters. We seek the sense and interconnectedness of what happens; reality does not supply it. We must first create it, but we must do so. Art supplies it. In art’s microcosms it feigns the unattained and unattainable ideal as something attained. Here it flatters the soul’s fundamental intellectual need, even as it flatters all of the soul’s most irrational inclinations. Although agreeing here in its orientation with the procedure of science, in its fulfillment it nonetheless goes so far beyond science that it expresses, again, an element of the mental world (directly opposed to outer reality). (Essays 94)

Landmann-Kalischer adds that it also satisfies an ethical need, once again expressing as an artistic truth, the truth of the soul, its wish for moral reassurance.

Comedy and tragedy combine representations that truthfully depict the reality of the mind in terms of (constrained by) the possibility and necessity of those combinations respectively. Lyric poetry, as noted, is different. In the case of lyric poetry, “the interconnectedness of the representations is not only dominated by the feeling but is frequently only intelligible at all on the basis of it” (Essays 96). So, too, the associations provided by simile and metaphor are said to “feel” true inasmuch as that truth is an artistic truth, expressing the mental reality of those associations and their grounding.

Landmann-Kalischer concludes her survey of the parts of the reality of the mind that art can represent by turning to feelings, a phenomenon that plays no part in cognition in the way that representations and their connections (possible, probable, necessary) do. Despite their inner-worldly status and despite being incapable of representing objective reality as do other basic mental phenomena (perception, memory, phantasy), feelings are nonetheless expressed in ways that art and in some cases art alone can represent. That is to say, feelings do not remain captive of the inner world but instead are expressed both in physiological-physiognomical ways and in actions. But the expression is never pure in life and is only adequate to some degree in art. For example, as Landmann-Kalischer puts it,

[c]ustom and ethical life, pride and shame hold us back a thousand times over from the action that would express our feeling adequately … the more the spontaneous expression of feeling in actions is inhibited by reinforced feelings of humanity, justice, self-respect and respect of others, and the less the demand for such expression can be satisfied in life, the more a people will be in need of art. (Essays 101)

4. The Doctrine of the Beautiful

Landmann-Kalischer’s posthumously published, four-chapter study, The Doctrine of the Beautiful (Die Lehre vom Schönen) begins with a chapter on “the place of beauty in the world”. Following Goethe’s lead, she recapitulates the Greek discovery of how beauty arises in nature as a harmony of countervailing forces, from the elemental to the vegetable to the animal to the supreme beauty and its “true, primal place” (wahre Urort): the human being, “the supreme creation of nature and the creator of art” (LS 11f). Beauty is all the greater, the more powerful and antagonistic the forces it combines: “Beauty would not be beautiful were it not difficult, were it not a victory” (LS 16). Nonetheless, the “paradox of beauty” is that its victory, while hard won, is non-violent, unforced, and free; an ordering that does not result in domination. Landmann-Kalischer identifies certain “basic forms” of harmony that underlie the different sorts of beauty and correspond to the different spheres of existence: (1) the formal harmony of measure and proportion, (2) the organic harmony of plant and animal, (3) human harmony, (4) cosmic harmony, (5) artistic harmony. Despite the obvious link between beauty and a certain robustness and vitality, she advises that we cannot expect, given the complexity of life’s conditions, that everything that achieves the capacity to live attains harmony and thus beauty in all its parts. Many a movement of an animal, for example, is merely the expression of “an unsatisfied urge”, leading Landmann-Kalischer to note, emending Schiller, that “the animal, too, is beautiful only when it plays” (LS 23).

Taking issue with some Christian and Oriental approaches to human beauty, Landmann-Kalischer extols the human body as no less integral to human beauty than the human soul. Nonetheless, “where no spirit animates it [the human body], no body is beautiful” (LS 28). What unfailingly beautifies a human being is a bearing of humility and respect towards the dignity of the spiritual world. Only the confusion that sometimes befalls the cultural world could lead to the mistake of deeming a human’s animal beauty higher than genuine human beauty. Indeed, “every beauty of an animal nature cannot make up for ugliness or insufficiency of the spiritual sphere” (LS 29f). But a strong and beautiful spirit can triumph over an ugly body; indeed, it can lend a human being a certain sublimity (think Socrates!).

From the general principle that beauty is always a property of a particular subject (e.g., the beauty of a boy is not that of a grown man), Landmann-Kalischer draws three other principles. The first such principle is that every species of being must agree with itself if it is to be beautiful. This principle entails the incomparability of one species with another (e.g., a birch is not more beautiful than an oak) and the aesthetic pleasure this self-agreement affords, including the “incongruous joy” where the elements are ugly (LS 31). The second such principle is that every exemplar of a certain species must correspond to the norm of that species—a principle heralding the tension between the contingent and law-governed. Thanks to this principle, individuals of the same species are comparable, e.g., the oak struck by lightning vs. the oak spared by the storm. The third principle following from the general principle that beauty is always a particular subject’s property is that the height of the beauty that something is capable of corresponds to its species. The higher and more complicated the level of life, the higher the beauty but also the greater the risk of ugliness. So, too, the fewer the successes (in contrast to the beauty of the lower levels), so much so that the humans appear in those cases as gods, exemplars of a different species altogether.

Although all human beauty is the beauty of the human spirit, this hardly means that every human expression is beautiful. That spirit itself and the soul as well must first be beautiful themselves and, as with the body, their beauty depends upon the harmony of all their functions and capacities, both cognitive and volitional, conscious and unconscious. The human spirit is a whole and the development of one side at the expense of others is uncomely. In this connection Landmann-Kalischer cites the loss, since Classicism and Romanticism, of the “true content” of the concept of the beautiful soul, as it is lumped together with sentimentality. In order to secure the concept, Landmann-Kalischer submits, we have to return to the “measure and harmony”, the unity of the good and the beautiful (καλοκἀγαθός) championed in the classical age of the ancient Greeks. Moreover, while clearly visible and stamping itself in fixed forms (paradigmatically expressed in Greek statuary), the “true unfolding of spiritual beauty” takes place in life, in what a human being does and omits doing, in the fate that the human being undergoes and shapes (LS 40).

Having explained (a) how the degree of beauty is a function of the disparateness and power of the forces that achieve harmony in it and (b) that the supreme, spiritual beauty stamps the beauty of the human being, Landmann-Kalischer completes the opening chapter by reviewing, with respect to human beauty, differences in age, gender, culture, and peoples. While countenancing the biologically based differences in the first two categories, Landmann-Kalischer notes how spiritual beauty rises above them. With respect to cultural differences, she contends that her conception of beauty as harmony countenances such differences—“There are as many types of beauty as there are types of human being” (LS 44). Yet in this variety there is also, she contends, “a more or less large approximation…to the absolute human beauty” (LS 45). To this end she compares favorably—and, at least by today’s standards, quite controversially—the Idolino with a bronze of the Chola dynasty, while reaffirming the homage paid to “the Greeks as the prototype of human beauty”, by all peoples who came in contact with them (LS 47).

In the second chapter of The Doctrine of the Beautiful, Landmann-Kalischer turns from “the place of beauty in the world” to “the creation of beauty in art”. Artists bring into being an even more complex harmony than otherwise surfaces in nature, as they express the beauty of the human spirit in sensory form. Echoing her early essay on artistic truth, Landmann-Kalischer observes: “Just as the nature surrounding [the human being] found a mirror in his spirit, so he creates a mirror of his own beauty in art” (LS 48). In the process, the artist works under two defining constraints: the use of some material (“the Urphänomen of art”) and the focus on a singular sense modality. In contrast to the usual fleeting representation of things via multiple sense modalities, “we are all eyes” when it comes painting, “all ears” in the case of music (LS 50ff).

Landmann-Kalischer identifies three equally essential elements of artistic [künstlerische] beauty: (1) formal beauty, i.e., the beauty of the forms and their organization (e.g., the symmetry of columns, the proportions of a human figure, the splendor and harmony of colors, the play of sounds and its rhythms, rhyme and meter), (2) artisanal beauty (artistische Schönheit), i.e., the artist’s artistry and technical mastery of the artistic means of portraying an object, and (3) the artistic content (Gehalt), i.e., the object portrayed by the artist and the artist’s expression “all in one” (LS 68). Just as the formal and artisanal beauty lose their sense when, instead of serving as a means to forming an artistic object, either becomes art’s ultimate purpose, so, too, an object portrayed in the artwork loses its artistic content when the artistic means (the first two elements) disappear into it. “The artistic object, which always signifies a unity of I and world, falls apart when the artistic means is left out of consideration”, mistakenly rendering art “either naturalistic or expressionistic, either mere imitation of nature or mere expression of the soul” (LS 72f). While artistic beauty is a whole made up of the union of these three elements, it is difficult to avoid confusing a part for the whole. Nonetheless, Landmann-Kalischer submits, as this whole beauty remains the “sense and essence of art” and all construals of art to the contrary—not least the timeworn views of art as imitation and as expression—are based upon that confusion. After making her case in this manner against these traditional views of art and citing the testimony of poets, she concludes this second chapter with a review of the beauty of particular arts (poetry, painting, sculpture, music, and architecture).

Shifting from artist to aesthetics in the third chapter (“the grasp of the beautiful in the sense for beauty”), Landmann-Kalischer elaborates the aesthetic intuition, the aesthetic state of mind (Zustand), and the aesthetic judgment. The aesthetic intuition is empathetic in the sense that its object is understood from within and what is given to our senses stirs up “the resonance of our soul” (LS 211). Aesthetic intuition grasps the simplest forms as meaningful expressions of the human. Thus, for example,

music’s effect is not connected to mere sounds; a melody is taken up as the song of a soul; we give to birds, even instruments, a heart analogous to the human. (LS 213)

Yet, while we see “our own feeling dwelling in the intuited object”, that feeling is no longer personal, surfacing as it now is in another medium (LS 216).

This feeling of the beauty of the object is an actual feeling and experiencing it can be our most important concern; but the joy or sorrow empathetically projected [eingefühlte] into the beautiful object is devoid of interest because it is no actual feeling, no feeling of our own, but merely a represented feeling. (LS 217)

Something analogous holds for the aesthetic object, removed as it is from any connection to the actuality surrounding it. Thus, the piece of canvas hanging on the wall is in no sense the reality of the artwork and “insofar as it is a work of art, it is not this little piece of canvas” (LS 218). As for the aesthetic state of mind, Landmann-Kalischer borrows extensively from Schiller, portraying that condition as playful but nonetheless deadly serious, since beauty alone “separates us from the inhuman” (LS 241). She refuses to distinguish the ethical from the aesthetic effect of art, not least since “the supreme human possibilities are nowhere more visible—and nowhere more impressively—than in the beautiful guise, the serious play of art” (LS 244). This third chapter concludes with a return to the arguments of her earlier essay on the cognitive value of aesthetic judgment (see above), namely, that aesthetic judgments, however fallible, are no less true or false than judgments of the senses. “Despite all the diverging judgments, we must assume ‘true’ beauty as objectively obtaining and knowable” (LS 249).

The fourth and final chapter of The Doctrine of the Beautiful addresses “the place of beauty in the realm of values”. In contrast to self-centered, subjective animal values (the pleasing, the useful), there are objectively valid, cultural values—the holy, the true, the good, and the beautiful—that obtain in themselves. Landmann-Kalischer regards the holy as the primeval form in which the consciousness of all these other cultural values is rooted; so, too, religion is “the cradle of all culture”, originally cultivating the other values (LS 270, 302). In this connection, while acknowledging the original unity of religious and political life, Landmann-Kalischer argues at length that “the state as such does not belong to the cultural values” (LS 277). At the same time, she contends that both religion and art stem from the “holy in the primal sense” and that, while reason “in ages of Enlightenment” vainly tries to replace the holy with the good or the true, “only art can give back the complete feeling of the holy” (LS 349f).

Before addressing how the values are essentially related to one another, Landmann-Kalischer discusses their relationship to one another in different eras. In a section entitled “the three ages of culture”, she distinguishes religious, rational, and artistic ages, where the holy, the-true-and-the-good, and the beautiful respectively held sway—albeit inevitably more or less, never exhaustively—over the other values. The three ages exhibit three sides and three stages of development of human existence, both individual and collective. While a one-sided pursuit of any such value sacrifices the completeness of a person’s humanity, the “measure” for that completeness is to be found only in the art, which presupposes the harmonious development of all human capacities (LS 282, 286). As one might expect, Landmann-Kalischer cites the Middle Ages as the paradigmatic religious age and the Enlightenment as the pre-eminently rational age, although she is quick to add that these different ages seldom coincide with specific chapters of human history. Among artistic ages, short-lived and rare as they are, she counts the age of the Pre-Socratics (the supreme if not the sole instance), the Italian Renaissance, Elizabethan England, and German classicism (the era of Goethe and Schiller)—each with a prefiguring and an afterlife of their own.

As noted above, art owes its origins, as do the other values, to the experience of the holy. Yet while metaphysical, ethical, or political motives shaped the great world religions, the only poetic religion is that of the Greeks, whose poets gave them their gods, fashioning them as sublime human beings and characterizing the Muses themselves as gods. The Greeks—“the people of art”—assimilated religion and poetry to one another, to the enhancement of both. The contrast with “the ethical-philosophical religions” could hardly be starker and here Landmann-Kalischer includes ethical religions that inherit the Mosaic law (make no images of God—a law that drives pictorial art into the ornamental and impoverishes poetic fantasy) as well as ascetic-philosophical religions where love of the earthly and the human, the presupposition of the sense of beauty, perishes. Any religion that centers its doctrine on another world runs the sizable risk of sacrificing art and the sense of beauty to contempt for this “earthly vale of tears” (LS 296).

Landmann-Kalischer acknowledges the fear of the “unknown” and the anxiety over powers beyond our senses and control as the primal human experience (Urerlebnis) on which religion rests (LS 287, 298). While religion reaches for some “means of coercion” (Zwangsmitteln) to quell those fears and fulfill human wishes, art makes no promises and only those not swamped by fears can approach it. If art grants some measure of redemption, it consists, not in the promised fulfillment of wishes but in “opening up a new world, the world of beauty, in which wishes grow silent” (LS 298). While religion overcomes the lack of harmony with the promise of another world, the piety of art is directed at this world, overcoming disharmony “through the beauty of the world that it shows”; so, too, while a certain anxiousness ­– “trembling between fear and hope” reigns in religion, the artist, by contrast, bravely “trusts his own feelings” (LS 299). Still, it remains difficult for art, “the higher zone of consciousness”, to maintain itself over against religion, “since the negative, the fear from which all religion proceeds, is always stronger than the positive, the joy from which all art stems” (LS 301).

Following this account of the relationship of beauty and art to the holy and religion, Landmann-Kalischer concludes the book with two sections on “beauty and the values of reason: the good and the true”. The first section reviews the beautiful’s fate under the dominance of the rational; the second elaborates beauty’s overturning of the rational. In that first section Landmann-Kalischer relates how, along with religion, art is called before the tribunal of reason. But while this process is typically identified with the Enlightenment, Landmann-Kalischer discusses its complex prefiguring in antiquity (Hesiod, Plato, and Aristotle), art’s subsequent decline into matters of amusement and instruction, form and content (among Stoics, Epicureans, and Plutarch), the relegation of beauty to an expression of the good (Plotinus, Augustine), and finally “the Christian era’s complete contempt for beauty, along with all other worldly goods” and “the battle that truth wages against beauty” (LS 315).

In late antiquity religion and poetry were inseparable means of education and, hence, reason’s battle against poetry at the time was also a battle against religion. In the seventeenth century, by contrast, poetry and art originally made common cause with the Enlightenment’s turn to this world and its battle against the otherworldliness of religion. Yet the more reason extended its own realm, the more it alienated itself from a sense for the beautiful. Aesthetic feelings are said to grope vainly for what the intellect can grasp clearly and distinctly; art becomes nothing more than “children playing, delectatio puerilis”, permission for which must first be fetched from reason, while anyone who indulges in aesthetic pleasures cannot help but have a “guilty conscience”—a sentiment exploited by Rousseau (LS 317–320).

While Landmann-Kalischer identifies a host of German writers who contribute to overcoming reason’s revolt against the muses, the “rebirth” of art and the value of beauty is epitomized by Goethe’s poetic genius and registered unmistakably in Schiller’s aesthetic letters. Yet while Schiller’s demonstration of the supremacy of the beautiful over the good is airtight in her opinion, the same cannot be said for his and Goethe’s convictions about beauty’s supremacy over the true. To the extent that Goethe conceives truth as the source of beauty and Schiller conceives art as the means to truth, their thinking continues to fall in line with the Enlightenment. But Landmann-Kalischer notes how Goethe and Schiller alike come to recognize art as a way of taking up the world that is not a stepping-stone to clearer knowledge but an organ of its own that stands “not beneath but above reason” (LS 323). She relates how philosophers at best approximate this realization, beginning with Kant’s identification of a pure, aesthetic feeling alongside the understanding and willing, allowing for the beautiful’s co-ordination with—not its subordination to—the true and the good. By contrast, both Hegel and Schelling, with all their profound aesthetic insights, ultimately champion the Enlightenment’s subordination of art to philosophy. If we are to rise above speculative philosophy’s claims about the limitedness of the sphere of art and “find new points of departure for overcoming the true through the beautiful”, it is necessary, Landmann-Kalischer submits, to go back to the continuation of the Goethean spirit in the likes of Schopenhauer, Nietzsche, and George.

In making the case for this move, Landmann-Kalischer reviews Hegel’s “unproven” contention that a certain “interiority” (Innerlichkeit), a Stoic and Christian legacy, “towers over all other spheres of the spirit” and thus serves as the “existential presupposition” that philosophizing is superior to the sphere of art (LS 328). Landmann-Kalischer charges Hegel in this regard with “absolutizing” a particular historical consciousness. When she demonstrates how the rational is overturned by the beautiful, she has in mind a beauty that realizes the true in concrete, intellectual intuitions rather than dwelling on abstractions. Echoing her work on epistemology, she insists that knowing by itself is an incomplete capacity; “it cannot grasp the things that it shows” and, from the standpoint of the human being as a whole, it is “the activity of a part” (Teiltätigkeit) that is instrumental in the transition from drive to action (LS 329). The person who knows exercises only one element of the soul, the person who acts—and, with a nod to the artist, she adds, the person who displays or shapes (darstellt oder bildet)—encompasses them altogether.

Reason’s highest value is truth and it is essentially fixed on finding the truth. “But what truth it should seek…is not subject to its jurisdiction alone” (LS 330f). In other words, if truth is supposed as the supreme value, there is no value that can determine what truth matters. By signaling the limits of truth (its dependency upon other values) in this way, Landmann-Kalischer repeats that she is not proposing that humanity should step back from the heights that the development of reason has helped it achieve. She only opposes reason “insofar as it proposes to posit the truth (that is its own supreme value) as the value giving direction over our entire life” (LS 332).

Referring back to her work in epistemology, Landmann-Kalischer reviews the transcendent character of knowledge. Knowledge “transcends” (transzendiert) in one sense by being directed at “objects that can never be given to it” (LS 333). Every function of knowing also transcends in the sense of always referring to another function (e.g., the perception of the present moment to the memory of the moment that has just passed). From transcending in both senses, Landmann-Kalischer infers that every cognitive function is by itself less than self-sufficient, dependent not only upon one another but ultimately (in their interdependence) on intuition.

The intuition here is an essential, higher form of knowing that refers to a whole, whether it be the world as a whole or a concrete, existing thing as a whole. This intuition is intellectual and sensory (Landmann-Kalischer also dubs it “artistic” and “aesthetic”); it is, in the words of Schopenhauer,

the supremely attainable cognition [Erkenntnis]; not in abstract knowing [Wissen] but in the correct and profoundly intuitive grasp of the world lies the source of all wisdom. (LS 337–339)

Moreover, precisely at this “highest point of knowledge”, the thinker gives way to the artist since in the end truth lies, not in what is universal but what is concrete and concrete truth is found in poetry alone. Thus, Landmann-Kalischer submits, “Poetry is not only more philosophical than history, it is more philosophical than philosophy itself” (LS 339).

In Landmann-Kalischer’s treatment of the beautiful and the good (the final section of the study), she takes her bearings from Schiller’s writings, particularly in the ways it moves critically and, in her view, trenchantly beyond the fundamental conflictedness of Kantian moral thinking. Presenting only the “minimum” that separates the morally sane from the “morally insane”, Kant’s determination of willing by reason alone can hardly do justice to the virtue and goodness that are the mark of human excellence when viewed in—and only in—its entirety.

Once again, beauty’s holistic character gives it the edge over the limitedness of a conception of a purely rational good that is not incorporated in beauty. Beauty perfects human sensuality and rationality, without suppressing one on the other’s account; in beauty, the celebration of the reconciliation and harmony of these two sides of the human condition, the path to human freedom, is on display. Stressing the affinity between Schiller’s concept of the beautiful soul (with its sublime disposition) and the ancient doctrine of virtue, Landmann-Kalischer declares: “If we make a human good from within, he becomes beautiful; if we make him beautiful on the inside, he becomes good” (LS 347).

Landmann-Kalischer concludes with a resounding rejection of the view that beauty is merely the means to the other values, as though appearance is something accessible without what appears—and vice versa. An entire system of values appears in beauty and only in it is the system in its inner interconnectedness visible.

It is with a view to beauty that all other values are first rightly understood, first rightly applied, rightly dosed, controlled, limited, etc. All other values are abstracta, values only of properties that become concrete solely through the value that attaches to the whole, i.e., through beauty. (LS 349)

Bibliography

A. Works by Landmann-Kalischer

A.1 Abbreviations

  • [Essays] Essays on Art, Aesthetics, and Value (Oxford New Histories of Philosophy), Samantha Matherne (ed.). Daniel O. Dahlstrom (trans.), New York: Oxford University Press, 2024. doi:10.1093/oso/9780197682043.001.0001
  • [LS] Die Lehre vom Schönen [The Doctrine of the Beautiful], Vienna: Amandus, 1952.
  • [TE] Die Transcendenz des Erkennens [Transcendence of Knowing], Berlin: Bondi, 1923.

A.2 Works (in German)

  • Kalischer, Edith, 1902, Analyse der ästhetischen Contemplation (Malerei und Plastik) [Analysis of Aesthetic Contemplation (Painting and Sculpture)], Barth: Leipzig.
  • –––, 1903, “J. Cl. Kreibig, Über den Begriff ‘Sinnestäuschung’”, Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Physiologie der Sinnesorgane, 120(2): 197–203.
  • Landmann-Kalischer, Edith, 1905a, “Über den Erkenntniswert ästhetischer Urteile. Ein Vergleich zwischen Sinnes- und Werturteilen” [On the Cognitive Value of Aesthetic Judgments], Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 5(3): 263–328. Translated in Essays.
  • –––, 1905b, “Theodor Lipps, Grundlegung der Ästhetik. Ästhetik. Psychologie des Schönen und der Kunst. Erster Teil” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 5: 213–227.
  • –––, 1906, “Über künstlerische Wahrheit” [On Artistic Truth], Zeitschrift für Ästhetik und Allgemeine Kunstwissenschaft, 1: 457–505. Translated in Essays.
  • –––, 1907, “Die moderne Ästhetik. Jonas Cohn, Konrad Lange, Karl Groos, Theodor Lipps, Witasek, Volkelt, Dessoir”, Preussische Jahrbücher, 130: 410–430.
  • –––, 1907, “Max Dessoir, Ästhetik und allgemeine Kunstwissenschaft” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 9(1): 50–61.
  • –––, 1909, “Theodor Lipps, Grundlegung der Ästhetik. Ästhetik. Psychologie des Schönen und der Kunst. Zweiter Teil” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 14: 172–189.
  • –––, 1910, “Philosophie der Werte” [Philosophy of Values], Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 18: 1–93. Translated in Essays.
  • –––, 1910, “Kunstschönheit als ästhetischer Elementargegenstand”, In Beiträge zur Ästhetik und Kunstgeschichte, Edith Landmann-Kalischer, Gertrud Kuehl-Claassen, and Gertrud Kantorowicz (eds), Berlin: Moeser.
  • Landmann-Kalischer, Edith, Gertrud Kuehl-Claassen, and Gertrud Kantorowicz (eds), 1910, Beiträge zur Ästhetik und Kunstgeschichte, Berlin: Moeser.
  • Landmann-Kalischer, Edith, 1911, “Jacob Segal, Psychologische und normative Ästhetik” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 20(4): 162–163.
  • –––, 1911, “Käte Friedemann, Die Rolle des Erzählers in der Epik” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 20(4): 163–164.
  • –––, 1911, “Erich Becher, Die Grundfrage der Ethik”, Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 20(4): 164.
  • –––, 1912, “W. M. Urban, Valuation, The Nature and Laws, Being an Introduction to the General Theory of Value” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 25(1): 31.
  • –––, 1913, “Emil Lask, Die Logik der Philosophie und die Kategorienlehre und Die Lehre vom Urteil” (Review), Archiv für die gesamte Psychologie, 29: 21–37.
  • Landmann, Edith, 1915, “Heinrich Friedemann, Platon. Seine Gestalt” (Review), Preussische Jahrbücher, 161: 331–341.
  • –––, 1920, Georgika. Das Wesen des Dichters Stefan George [Georgika: The Essence of the Poet], Heidelberg: Weiss; reviewed edition, 1924.
  • –––, 1923, Die Transcendenz des Erkennens [Transcendence of Knowing], Berlin: Bondi.
  • –––, 1923, “Carl Spittelers poetische Sendung” [Carl Spitteler’s Poetic Mission], Schweizerische Monatshefte für Politik und Kultur, 3(7): 334–352.
  • –––, 1930, “Wissen und Werten”, Schmollers Jahrbuch für Gesetzgebung, Verwaltung und Volkswirtschaft im Deutschen Reich, 54(2): 95–111.
  • –––, 1931, “Stefan George. Das Neue Reich”, Logos, 20: 88–104.
  • –––, 1934, “Die Menschengestalt der Homerischen Götter”, Festschrift für Karl Joel, Basel, pages 165–184.
  • –––, 1944, “George und Nietzsche”, Die Tat, 2./3.12.
  • –––, 1945, “Mensch und Erde”, Neue Schweizer Rundschau, 13: 624–632.
  • –––, 1947, “Interpretation eines Gedichtes. Ursprünge von Stefan George”, Trivium, 5: 54–64.
  • –––, 1952, Die Lehre vom Schönen (The Doctrine of the Beautiful), Vienna: Amandus.
  • –––, 1955, “Georges Wiedererweckung der Griechen” [George’s Reawakening of the Greeks], in M. Landmann 1955: 7–33.
  • –––, 1958, “Erinnerung an Simmel von Edith Landmann”, In Buch des Dankes an Georg Simmel. Briefe, Erinnerungen, Bibliographie, Kurt Gassen and Michael Landmann (eds), Berlin: Duncker und Humboldt, 208–210.
  • –––, 1957, “Wem Du dein licht gabst bis hinauf zu dir”, Castrum Peregrini, 35: 35–39.
  • –––, 1963, Gespräche mit Stefan George [Conversations with Stefan George], Düsseldorf: H. Küpper, vormals G. Bondi.
  • –––, 1971, Stefan George und die Griechen. Idee einer neuen Ethik [Stefan George and the Greeks: Idea of a New Ethics], Amsterdam: Castrum Peregrini.
  • Landmann-Kalischer, Edith, 1975, “Eine Aufzeichnung aus dem Jahr 1948 über Assimilation und Zionismus”, Emuna. Horizonte zur Diskussion über Israel und das Judentum, 10: 45–48.
  • Landmann, Edith and Renata von Scheliha, 2022, Eine Freundschaft im Zeichen Stefan Georges: Briefe aus den Jahren 1934–1951, Marianne von Heereman, Christiane Kuby, and Herbert Post (eds), Berlin: Hentrich und Hentrich Verlag.

See also the bibliography in Michael Landmann 1955: 123–128.

A.3 Works (English translation)

  • Landmann-Kalischer, Edith, 2024, Essays on Art, Aesthetics, and Value (Oxford New Histories of Philosophy), Samantha Matherne (ed.). Daniel O. Dahlstrom (trans.), New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780197682043.001.0001

B. Secondary Sources

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  • Dahlstrom, Daniel O., 2024, “Edith Landmann-Kalischer (1877–1951)”, in Gjesdal and Nassar 2024: 242–259 (ch. 11). doi:10.1093/oxfordhb/9780190066239.013.12
  • Dutt, Carsten, 2010, “Edith Landmann—oder der poetologische Essentialismus des George-Kults”, in Frauen um Stefan George, Ute Oelmann and Ulrich Raulff (eds), Göttingen: Wallstein Verlag, 233–251.
  • Egypten, Jürgen, 2006, “Schwester, Huldin, Ritterin. Ida Coblenz, Gertrud Kantorowicz, and Edith Landmann. Jüdische Frauen im Dienste Stefan Georges”, in Zions Töchter. Jüdische Frauen in Literatur, Kunst und Politik, Andrea M. Lauritsch (ed.), Wien: Edition Mnemosyne, 149–184.
  • Gjesdal, Kristin and Nassar Nassar (eds.), 2024, The Oxford Handbook of Nineteenth-Century Women Philosophers in the German Tradition (Oxford Handbooks), Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oxfordhb/9780190066239.001.0001
  • Harada, Tetsushi, 2009, “Die Anschauliche Theorie als Fortsetzung der historischen Schule im George-Kreis: Edgar Salin unter dem Einfluss Edith Landmanns”, in Köster, Plumpe, Schefold, and Schönhärl 2009: 195–210. doi:10.1524/9783050061757.195
  • Hartung, Gerald, 2021, “Edith Kalischer”, in Simmel-Handbuch: Leben – Werk – Wirkung, Jörn Bohr, Gerald Hartung, Heike Koenig, and Tim-Florian Steinbach (eds), Stuttgart: J.B. Metzler, 441–442. doi:10.1007/978-3-476-05760-0_48
  • Heidegger, Martin, SZ 1967, Sein und Zeit, Tübingen: Niemeyer. [Originally published 1927.]
  • Hillman, Susanne, 2011, “Wandering Jews: Existential Quests Between Berlin, Zurich, and Zion”, PhD thesis, University of California, San Diego.
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  • Köster, Roman, Werner Plumpe, Bertram Schefold, and Korinna Schönhärl (eds), 2009, Das Ideal des schönen Lebens und die Wirklichkeit der Weimarer Republik: Vorstellungen von Staat und Gemeinschaft im George-Kreis (Wissenskultur und gesellschaftlicher Wandel, Bd. 33), Berlin: Akademie Verlag. doi:10.1524/9783050061757
  • Landmann, Michael (ed.), 1955, Edith Landmann, Amsterdam: Castrum Peregini.
  • ––– (ed.), 1980, Erinnerungen an Stefan George. Seine Freundschaft mit Julius und Edith Landmann, Amsterdam: Castrum Peregrini.
  • Lewin, Wera, 1955, “Edith Landmann in Memoriam”, in M. Landmann 1955: 64–68.
  • Matherne, Samantha, 2020, “Edith Landmann-Kalischer on Aesthetic Demarcation and Normativity”, The British Journal of Aesthetics, 60(3): 315–334. doi:10.1093/aesthj/ayaa007
  • –––, 2023, “Are Artists Phenomenologists? Perspectives from Edith Landmann-Kalischer and Maurice Merleau-Ponty”, in Horizons of Phenomenology: Essays on the State of the Field and Its Applications (Contributions to Phenomenology 122), Jeff Yoshimi, Philip Walsh, and Patrick Londen (eds), Cham: Springer, 247–263. doi:10.1007/978-3-031-26074-2_13
  • –––, 2024a, “Introduction”, to Landmann-Kalischer’'s Essays 2024, xviii–lix.
  • –––, 2024b, “Trends in Aesthetics”, in Gjesdal and Nassar 2024: 579–602 (ch. 25). doi:10.1093/oxfordhb/9780190066239.013.25
  • Meinong, Alexius, 1912, “Für die Psychologie und gegen den Psychologismus”, Logos. Internationale Zeitschrift für Philosophie der Kultur, 3(1): 1– 14.
  • Meumann, Ernst, 1919, Einführung in die Ästhetik der Gegenwart, third edition, Leipzig: Quelle & Meyer.
  • Meyer, Ursula, 1994, “Edith Landmann-Kalischer”, in Philosophinnen-Lexikon, Ursula I. Meyer und Heidemarie Bennent-Vahle (eds), Paderborn: FACH-Verlag, 331–333.
  • Norton, Robert Edward, 2002, Secret Germany: Stefan George and His Circle, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Oestersandfort, Christian, 2012, “Landmann, Edith (geb. Kalischer)”, in Stefan George und sein Kreis. ein Handbuch, Band 3, Achim Aurnhammer, Wolfgang Braungart, Stefan Breuer, and Ute Oelmann (eds), Berlin: de Gruyter, 1506–1510.
  • Philipp, Michael, 2001, “Die Thematisierung des ‘Judischen’ im George-Kreis vor und nach 1933”, in “Verkannte brüder”? Stefan George und das deutsch-jüdische Bürgertum zwischen Jahrhundertwende und Emigration, Gert Mattenklott, Michael Philipp, and Julius H. Schoeps (eds), Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag, 201–218.
  • Przywara, Erich, 1924, “Rezension zu ‘Die Transcendenz des Erkennens’”, Stimmen der Zeit, 54(106/107): 65–69.
  • Raulff, Ulrich, 2009, Kreis ohne Meister: Stefan Georges Nachleben, München: Beck.
  • Reicher, Maria E., 2009, “Value Facts and Value Experiences in Early Phenomenology”, in Values and Ontology: Problems and Perspectives (Phenomenology & Mind 13), Beatrice Centi and Wolfgang Huemer (eds), Frankfurt: Ontos, 105–136. doi:10.1515/9783110325522.105
  • –––, 2016, “Ästhetische Werte als dispositionale Eigenschaften. 1905–2014”, Deutsches Jahrbuch Philosophie, 8: 961–974. doi:https://doi.org/10.5840/djp2016872
  • Reicher-Marek, Maria E., 2017, “Dispositionalist Accounts of Aesthetic Properties in Austro-German Aesthetics”, Paradigmi, 3: 71–86. doi:10.3280/PARA2017-003006
  • Riedner, Johannes, 2002, “Edith Landmann als philosophische Interpretin und Zeugin Stefan Georges. Zu Problemen der Assimilation im George-Kreis”, Marburger Forum, 3(4): 1–14.
  • Schiewer, Gesine Lenore, 2009, “Das Problem des Politischen in der Philosophie Edith Landmanns. Diskussionen im Umfeld von Wertphilosophie, Gestalttheorie und Wissenssoziologie”, in Köster, Plumpe, Schefold, and Schönhärl 2009: 77–94. doi:10.1524/9783050061757.77
  • Schönhärl, Korinna, 2009, “Transcendenz des Erkennens: Erkenntnistheoretische Grundlagen der wissenschaftlichen Methodendiskussion im George-Kreis”, Archiv für Kulturgeschichte, 91(2): 445–476. doi:10.7788/akg.2009.91.2.445
  • –––, 2010, “‘Wie eine Blume die erforen ist ’—Edith Landmann als Jüngerin Stefan Georges”, in Stefan George. Dichtung—Ethos—Staat. Denkbilder für ein geheimes europäisches Deutschland, Bruno Pieger und Bertram Wschefold (eds), Berlin: Verlag für Berlin-Brandenburg, 207–242.
  • Schuster, Margaret, 1955, “Edith Landmann als Philosophin”, in M. Landmann 1955: 34–48.
  • Singer, Kurt, 1955, “Erinnerung an die Georgika”, in M. Landmann 1955: 50–57.
  • Vendrell Ferran, Íngrid, 2014, “Tatsache, Wert und menschliche Sensibilität: Die Brentanoschule und die Gestaltpsychologie”, in Feeling and Value, Willing and Action: Essays in the Context of a Phenomenological Psychology (Phaenomenologica 216), Marta Ubiali and Maren Wehrle (eds), Cham: Springer, 141–162. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-10326-6_9
  • –––, forthcoming, “On the Analogy between the Sensing of Secondary Qualities and the Feeling of Values: Landmann-Kalischer’s Epistemic Project, Its Historical Context, and Its Significance for Current Meta-Ethics”, in Philosophy of Value. The Historical Roots of Contemporary Debate: An Overview, Beatrice Centi, Faustino Fabbianelli, and Gemmo Iocco (eds), Berlin: De Gruyter.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

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