Notes to Latin American Philosophy: Metaphilosophical Foundations

1. Henceforth biographical information of this sort will be provided only for historical figures. For living authors, for whom such information is often unavailable, it will be omitted.

2. His compatriot, philosopher of science Mario Bunge, shows a similar universalist position in his response to an interview question: “I don’t think that Latin America constitutes a distinct area of philosophy. Latin America is philosophically just as pluralistic as North America, Western Europe, India, or Japan” (Gilson 2006, p. 10).

3. In fact, whether ‘Latin America’ faces this pragmatic problem is a matter of dispute. For example, Arturo Ardao disputes the claim that the term resulted from the imperialistic agenda of the French in 1861, which he regards as a mistake made by U.S. historian John L. Phelan. On Ardao’s account, the term was introduced about five years earlier as a result of an anti-imperialist reaction in “defense of our Latin heritage [that was] threatened in our own lands by Anglo-Saxon America, during the heyday of their aggression in Central America…” (Ardao 1991, p. xxvi, my translation).

4. A direct-reference account of the semantics of nouns such as ‘Latin America’ and ‘Iberoamerica’ can be found in Nuccetelli 2001 and 2004. For a survey of controversies on these terms, see Nuccetelli and Stewart 2009.

Copyright © 2021 by
Susana Nuccetelli <snuccetelli@stcloudstate.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free