Supplement to The Logic of Conditionals

Appendix: Proof of condition \((*)\) in Section 4 of Logic of Conditionals

For the sake of simplicity, we prove the version for acceptance of conditionals with respect to a premise set \(\Gamma\), which uses the following condition: \[\tag{PS\(_{acc}\)} \Gamma \Vdash_{acc} A>C \text{ iff for each } X \in \Gamma\bot |A|, \ \bigcap (X\cup |A|) \subseteq |C|. \] The version for truth at \(w\) and with respect to \(\Gamma_w\) (the premise set assigned to a world \(w\)) is analogous.

In the following, we assume that every proposition (subset of \(W\)) is expressible in our language.

Suppose that \(\Gamma\) is a (possibly infinite) set of premises (propositions). We denote by \(\Gamma\bot\lvert A\rvert\) the set of all subsets \(X\) of \(\Gamma\) that are maximally consistent with \(A\), i.e., are maximal in having a non-empty intersection \((\bigcap X) \cap \lvert A\rvert.\)

In the following, we suppose that \(\lvert A\rvert\) and \(\lvert B\rvert\) are non-empty.

Now suppose that \((A\vee B) >C\) is accepted w.r.t. \(\Gamma\), i.e., for all elements \(X\) of \(\Gamma\bot|A\vee B|\), it holds that \((\bigcap X)\cap |A\vee B| \subseteq \lvert C\rvert.\) Equivalently,

\[\tag{1} \left(\bigcup_{X\in \Gamma\bot|A\vee B|}\bigcap X\right)\cap |A\vee B| \subseteq \lvert C\rvert. \]

We first show that

\[\tag{2} \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot|A|\\ Z\in \Gamma\bot|B|} \bigcap (Y \cup Z)\right) \cap |A|\cap|B| \ \subseteq \ \bigcup_{X\in \Gamma\bot|A\vee B|}\bigcap X. \]

Take two arbitrary sets \(Y\in \Gamma\bot |A|\) and \(Z\in \Gamma\bot |B|\) and form the union \(Y\cup Z\). Every subset of \(\Gamma\) which is a superset of \(Y\cup Z\) is inconsistent both with \(A\) and with \(B\), so it is inconsistent with \(A\vee B\). Now if \(Y\cup Z\) is consistent with \(A\vee B\), then \(Y\cup Z\) is itself an element of \(\Gamma\bot |A\vee B|\), so it appears as an \(X\) on the right-hand side of (2). If, on the other hand, \(Y\cup Z\) is inconsistent with \(A\vee B\) (which may well be the case), then the intersection of \(\bigcap (Y \cup Z)\) with \(|A|\cap|B|\) will leave only the empty set. This proves (2).

From (1) and (2), we can infer

\[\tag{3} \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot|A|\\ Z\in \Gamma\bot|B|} \bigcap (Y \cup Z)\right) \cap |A|\cap|B| \ \subseteq \ |C|. \]

Now we make use of the following series of equations:

\[\begin{align}\tag{4} &\left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot|A|\\ Z\in \Gamma\bot|B|} \bigcap (Y \cup Z)\right) \cap |A|\cap|B| \\ &\qquad= \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot |A|\\ Z\in \Gamma\bot |B|} \left(\bigcap Y \cap \bigcap Z\right)\right) \cap |A|\cap|B| \\ &\qquad= \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot |A|} \bigcap Y\right) \cap \left(\bigcup_{Z\in \Gamma\bot |B|} \bigcap Z\right) \cap |A|\cap|B| \notag \\ &\qquad= \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot |A|} \left(\bigcap Y \cap |A|\right)\right) \cap \left(\bigcup_{Z\in \Gamma\bot |B|} \left(\bigcap Z \cap |B|\right)\right)\notag \end{align}\]

From (3) and (4), it follows that

\[\tag{5} \left(\bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot |A|} \left(\bigcap Y \cap |A|\right)\right) \cap \left(\bigcup_{Z\in \Gamma\bot |B|} \left(\bigcap Z \cap |B|\right)\right) \subseteq |C|. \]

Since we assume that every proposition is expressible in our language, we can choose two sentences \(D\) and \(E\) such that

\[\lvert D\rvert = \bigcup_{Y\in \Gamma\bot\lvert A\rvert} \left(\bigcap Y \cap \lvert A\rvert\right)\]

and

\[\lvert E\rvert = \bigcup_{Z\in \Gamma\bot\lvert B\rvert} \left(\bigcap Z \cap \lvert B\rvert\right).\]

(5) says that \(D\) and \(E\) together entail \(C\). By the acceptance condition (PS\(_{acc}\)) for conditionals, we also know that \(A>D\) and \(B>E\) are accepted with respect to \(\Gamma\). This proves \((*)\). \(\Box\)

Copyright © 2021 by
Paul Egré <paulegre@gmail.com>
Hans Rott <hans.rott@ur.de>

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