## Strategies for the Iterated Prisoner's Dilemma

Name Abbreviation Description
Unconditional Cooperator Cu Cooperates unconditionally.
Unconditional Defector Du Defects unconditionally.
Random Random (=C.5 or R(.5,.5,.5) or S(.5,.5,.5,.5) below) Defects unconditionally.
Probability p Cooperator Cp for $$0\le$$p$$\le 1$$ Cooperates with fixed probably $$p$$.
Tit for Tat TFT (=R(1,1,0) or S(1,0,1,0) below) Cooperates on the first round and imitates its opponent's previous move thereafter.
Suspicious Tit for Tat STFT (=R(0,1,0) below) Defects on the first round and imitates its opponent's previous move thereafter.
Generous Tit for Tat GTFT (=R(1,1,g(R,P,T,S)) below) Cooprates on the first round and after its opponent cooperates. Following a defection,it cooperates with probability $$g(R, P, T, S)= \min\{1-\frac{T-R}{R-S}, \frac{R-P}{T-P}\}$$, where $$R,$$ $$P,$$ $$T$$ and $$S$$ are the reward, punishment, temptation and sucker payoffs.
Gradual Tit for Tat GrdTFT TFT with two differences: (1) it increases the string of punishing defection responses with each additional defection by its opponent (2) it apologizes for each string of defections by cooperating in the subsequent two rounds.
Imperfect TFT ImpTFT Imitates opponent's last move with high (but less than one) probability.
Tit for Two Tats TFTT (or TF2T) Cooperates unless defected against twice in a row.
Two Tits for Tat TTFT (or 2TFT) Defects twice after being defected against, otherwise cooperates.
Omega Tit for Tat ΩTFT Plays TFT unless measures of deadlock or randomness exceed specified thresholds. When deadlock threshold is exceeded it cooperates and resets the measure. When randomness threshold is exceded, it switches to unconditional defection. For full specificiation see Slaney and Kienreich, p184. ΩTFT finished second in the 2005 reprise of the Axelrod IPD tournament.
GRIM (or TRIGGER) GRIM (= S(1,0,0,0) below) Cooperates until its opponent has defected once, and then defects for the rest of the game.
Discriminating Altruist DA In the Optional IPD, cooperates with any player that has never defected against it, and otherwise refuses to engage.
Pavlov (or Win-stay, Lose-shift) WSLS ( =P1 below) Cooperates if it and its opponent moved alike in previous move and defects if they moved differently.
n-Pavlov Pn Adjusts its probability of cooperation in units of $$\tfrac{1}{n}$$ according to its payoff on the previous round. More specifically it cooperates with probability $$p_1=1$$ on round 1 and probability $$p_{n+1}$$ on round $$n+1$$, where
 $$p_{n+1}=$$ $$p_n\,[+]\tfrac{1}{n}$$ if payoff on last round was Reward $$(R)$$ $$p_n\,[-]\tfrac{1}{n}$$ if payoff on last round was Punishment $$(P)$$ $$p_n\,[+]\tfrac{2}{n}$$ if payoff on last round was Temptation $$(T)$$ $$p_n\,[-]\tfrac{2}{n}$$ if payoff on last round was Sucker $$(S),$$
$$p_n$$ is the probability of cooperation on round n, $$x[+]y = min(x+y,1)$$ and x[-]y=max(x-y,0).
Adaptive Pavlov APavlov Employs TFT for the first six rounds, places opponent into one of five categories according to its responses and plays an optimal strategy for each. Details described in Li pp 89-104. APavolv was the highest scoring strategy in the 2005 reprise of Axelrod's IPD tournament.
Reactive (with parameters y,p,q) R(y,p,q) Cooperates with probability y in first round and with probabilities p or q after opponent cooperates or defects
Memory-one (with parameters p,q,r,s) S(p,q,r,s) Cooperates with probabilities probabilities p,q,r or s after outcomes (C,C), (C,D), (D,C) or (C,D).
Zero Determinant ZD A class of memory-one strategies that guarantee that a player's long-term average payoff in the infinitely repeated, two-player prisoner's dilemma (2IPD) will be related to his opponent's according to a fixed linear equation.
Equalizer (or dictator) SET-n (for P≤n≤R) A ZDstrategy that guarantees the opponent's long term average payoff is n. As it turns out, in a PD with payoffs 5,3,1 and 0, SET-2=S(¾¼½¼).
Extortionary Extort-n An extortionary strategy is a ZD strategy that guarantees that an opponent's average payoff can exceed the punishment payoff only if one's own long term average payoff is greater. Extort-n guarantees that one's gain over punishment is n times one's opponent's. As it turns out, for a PD with the payoffs above, EXTORT-2=S(78, 716,38,0)).
Generous Gen-n A generous strategy is a ZD strategy that guarantees that an opponent's average payoff can be lower than the reward payoff only if one's own long term average payoff is even lower. GEN-n guarantees that one's loss relative to the reward is n times one's opponent's. As it turns out, for a PD with the payoffs above, GEN-2=S(1, 916,12,18)).
Good GOOD A good strategy for the infinitely-repeated, two-player PD is a strategy with the following properties: (1)its use by both players ensures that each gets reward as long-term average payoff, (2)it is a nash-equilibrium with itself, and (3)if it is employed by both, any deviation by one that reduces the average payoff of the other will also reduce its own average payoff. Aikin, 2013 provides a simple characterization of the memory-one strategies that are good.