Realism and Anti-Realism about Metaphysics

First published Mon Feb 10, 2025

This entry surveys the literature surrounding certain kinds of views about metaphysics. In particular, the central concern here will be with critiques of metaphysics and responses to those critiques. And so the views under discussion can be thought of as metametaphysical views, or metaontological views.

Section 1 distinguishes the views to be discussed—namely, realist and anti-realist views about metaphysics—from views of another kind (namely, realist and anti-realist views in metaphysics). Then the survey of views begins in section 2.

The survey is organized around anti-realist views—i.e., views that offer critiques of metaphysics—and realist responses to the anti-realist critiques. This mirrors how the literature in this area has gone. Most of the work done in support of realism about metaphysics has been aimed at simply defending metaphysics against anti-realist critiques, rather than developing positive realist views. This is perhaps because realism about metaphysics is something like the “default view” in metaphysics.

Lots of philosophers seem to have an intuitive feeling that there’s something wrong with certain kinds of metaphysical questions. One might jokingly put the thought here like this:

When two grown-ass adults with PhDs and genius-level IQs are arguing at length about whether tables exist—employing sophisticated, often very technical arguments—something has gone badly wrong.

But while it’s easy to poke fun, it’s much harder to produce cogent arguments for the claim that there’s something wrong with metaphysics. This entry surveys a few anti-realist attempts to produce such arguments, as well as some realist responses to these arguments.

It’s important distinguish global critiques of metaphysics in general from local critiques of specific metaphysical questions. The history of philosophy has seen many critiques of the first kind—from people like Hume (1748), Kant (1781/87), Wittgenstein (1921, 1953), and the logical positivists of the first half of the twentieth century. But this entry covers works that were written later than this—the era covered can be thought of as beginning in 1950, with the publication of Carnap’s “Empiricism, Semantics, and Ontology”—and much of this later work is profitably thought of as being driven by local critiques. Thus, most of this entry (section 2 and section 3) will be concerned with local critiques of specific metaphysical questions. In particular, section 2 will cover a variety of local anti-realist views; and section 3 will cover realist responses to these local critiques. But then in section 4, we will consider a few anti-realist views that are more global, or more general.

1. Realism and Anti-Realism About Metaphysics vs. Realism and Anti-Realism In Metaphysics

The terms ‘realism’ and ‘anti-realism’ will be used to denote the two main kinds of views that will be discussed. But since these terms can be used to mean very different things, even within the confines of the literature on a single metaphysical question, some care is needed to clarify the kinds of views that will be under discussion here. For reasons that will become clear shortly, it makes sense to start with anti-realism, rather than realism.

Very roughly, if MQ is a metaphysical question, then to endorse an anti-realist view of MQ, in the sense at issue in this entry, is to maintain that there’s something wrong with MQ. So, for example, an anti-realist about MQ might claim that MQ is trivial, or non-factual, or that debates about MQ are merely verbal. Indeed, these three kinds of anti-realist views—i.e., trivialist views, non-factualist views, and mere-verbalist views—will be the main kinds of views discussed in this entry. And more precise definitions of these three kinds of views will emerge in section 2.

To endorse a realist view of MQ, on the other hand, is, very roughly, to maintain that no such anti-realist view of MQ is true. So, at the very least, realism about MQ implies that trivialist, non-factualist, and mere-verbalist views of MQ are all false. But realist views of MQ also typically imply other claims as well—e.g., that MQ is a deep and important question about the nature of reality (in particular, the mind-and-language-independent part of reality).

It’s important to distinguish realist and anti-realist views of this kind from realist and anti-realist views of another kind. To this end, consider the following metaphysical question:

The composite-object question: Are there any such things as composite objects—i.e., objects that have proper parts—like tables and cats and rocks?

On one very standard way of speaking, we can say that those who answer this question in the affirmative—i.e., those who say that there are composite objects—are realists about composite objects; and those who answer the above question in the negative are anti-realists about composite objects—or nihilists, as they’re often called. But this entry is not centrally concerned with these kinds of realism and anti-realism; it isn’t (centrally) concerned with realism and anti-realism about composite objects; rather, the central concern is with realism and anti-realism about metaphysical questions—e.g., the composite-object question. And, to repeat, anti-realist views of this kind might say that the composite-object question is trivial, or non-factual, or merely verbal.

It’s important to note that these two kinds of realist/anti-realist divides can cut across each other. For example, realists about composite objects (i.e., those who believe that there do exist composite objects, e.g., tables or cats or whatever) can be anti-realists about the composite-object question—for, e.g., they might claim that the composite-object question is entirely trivial (and that it’s an utterly obvious and trivial fact that tables exist).[1] And anti-realists about composite objects (i.e., nihilists) can be realists about the composite-object question—for, e.g., they can claim that the composite-object question is a deep and important question about the nature of reality (and that nihilism is a deep and important fact about mind-independent reality).[2]

It’s plausible to think of these two kinds of realist/anti-realist divides as arising at different levels of inquiry. For example, the dispute between realists and anti-realists about tables is a first-order dispute. And the dispute between realists and anti-realists about the composite-object question is a second-order dispute. This is why the latter dispute is often characterized as a dispute in metametaphysics, or metaontology.

2. Local Anti-Realist Views

In this section, we will consider three different kinds of local anti-realist views, namely, trivialism, mere-verbalism, and non-factualism.

2.1 Trivialism

The first kind of local anti-realist view that we’ll consider is the following:

Trivialism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that (a) there’s a fact of the matter about the answer to MQ, but (b) it’s an utterly trivial fact—along the lines of the fact that all bachelors are unmarried, or the fact that there are no married bachelors. More specifically, the facts that settle MQ are not substantive metaphysical facts at all; on the contrary, they’re just semantic facts (i.e., facts about the meanings or truth conditions of our sentences), together perhaps with ordinary empirical facts that are entirely uncontroversial.

Consider, e.g., the composite-object question. We can think of this question as being about the truth values of sentences like the following:

[Table]
There exist tables.

Those who believe in composite objects will say that [Table] is true, and those who don’t believe in composite objects—i.e., nihilists—will say that [Table] is false. It’s important to note, however, that nihilists don’t think we’re hallucinating when we think we’re seeing tables; they just think that what we’re actually seeing in these situations aren’t tables. For instance, according to one popular version of nihilism, what we’re seeing in these situations are huge pluralities of tiny simples—where a simple is an object that doesn’t have any proper parts. More specifically, according to this version of nihilism, what we’re actually seeing (when it seems like we’re seeing tables) are huge pluralities of simples that are arranged in a table-type way—or, in the lingo of the composite-object debate, what we’re seeing are simples arranged tablewise.

Given all of this, one way to be a trivialist about the composite-object question is to endorse the following view:

Trivialist Tableism: (i) [Table] is obviously true because (a) the existence of simples arranged tablewise is already sufficient for the truth of [Table]—where, again, a simple is an object with no proper parts—and (b) it’s entirely obvious (from, e.g., a cursory glance at people’s dining rooms) that there are simples arranged tablewise. And (ii) likewise for other sentences like [Table].[3]

The really important claim in this view is claim (a). But let’s start by saying a few words about claim (b). The idea behind claim (b) is that whatever we end up saying about the existence of composite objects like tables, we should all agree that there are simples arranged tablewise. Even philosophers who reject the existence of composite objects like tables (e.g., van Inwagen (1990), Merricks (2001), Rosen and Dorr (2002), and Sider (2013)) will still admit that there are simples arranged tablewise. After all, to repeat, these philosophers don’t think we’re hallucinating when we think we’re seeing tables; they just think that what we’re actually seeing in these situations are huge pluralities of simples arranged tablewise.

Now, you might object that some people—namely, mereological monists—will deny that there are simples arranged tablewise. More specifically, you might object here by saying something like the following:

Let mereological monism be the view that there exists exactly one concrete object, namely, the entire universe. On this view—which has been endorsed by, e.g., Horgan and Potrč (2000) and Builes (2021, 2023)—the universe is just a great big simple that doesn’t have any proper parts. So this view is a version of nihilism—i.e., it entails that there are no such things as composite objects. But it also seems to imply that there aren’t any simples arranged tablewise—because, according to this view, there are no objects smaller than the universe. And so the claim that there are simples arranged tablewise isn’t as uncontroversial as the above trivialist tableist view implies that it is.

But we can sidestep this worry by just defining ‘simples arranged tablewise’ so that if mereological monism is true (and if, otherwise, things are as they actually are), then the universe counts as a simple that’s arranged tablewise. If we define our terms in this way, then all parties to the dispute will agree that there are simples arranged tablewise, and so we can treat the claim that there are simples arranged tablewise as trivial in the relevant sense of the term.

(Actually, there will still be some people who would resist the claim that there are simples arranged tablewise—e.g., people who think that all objects are gunky (i.e., that all objects have proper parts). We could bring these people into the fold by switching from ‘simples arranged tablewise’ to ‘objects arranged tablewise’, but we needn’t bother with this here.[4])

Let’s move on now to claim (a) in the definition of trivialist tableism. The idea behind claim (a) is essentially this: We can derive the existence of tables (and, hence, composite objects) from a trivial claim that virtually all of us agree on (namely, that there are simples arranged tablewise) together with a semantic claim about the truth conditions of [Table] (namely, that the existence of simples arranged tablewise is already sufficient for the truth of [Table]). And it’s important to note that the controversial part of trivialist tableism is the second claim here—i.e., the claim about the truth conditions of sentences like [Table]—and so it’s a claim about language. And this is a general feature of trivialist views; the controversial claims in these views are claims about meaning, or truth conditions, or some such thing.

How might trivialists go about arguing for their semantic claim about [Table]? The most obvious way to do this is to take their semantic claim to be a claim about what [Table] means in ordinary English, and to then argue for this claim by (a) presenting empirical evidence for the thesis that ordinary speakers assent to sentences like ‘There’s a table here’ when presented with simples arranged tablewise, and (b) arguing for a principle of charity that, together with the empirical evidence just mentioned in point (a), implies that, in ordinary language, the existence of simples arranged tablewise is sufficient for the truth of sentences like [Table]. (See Hirsch 2009 for an argument of this kind.)

(Trivialist views of the kind discussed in this section should be distinguished from Moorean views. Mooreans about the composite-object question might claim that we have an immediate intuition that tables exist and that we’re more certain of this claim than we are of any of the premises that appear in any of the arguments against the existence of tables.[5] But, by itself, this isn’t a trivialist view. In order to count as trivialists, Mooreans would need to claim that the question of whether tables exist is settled by semantic facts, i.e., by facts about the meanings (or truth conditions, or some such thing) of our sentences, together with uncontroversial empirical facts. In other words, in order to count as trivialists, Mooreans would need to commit to a trivialist semantic theory of the kind discussed above—and, again, semantic theories of this kind are extremely controversial. If Mooreans don’t commit to a trivialist semantic theory, then their view won’t count as an anti-realist view at all. Indeed, their view will be compatible with a rather strong kind of realism—a kind that implies not just that there are substantive metaphysical facts about the existence of composite objects, but that we can access these facts by means of a mysterious faculty of intuition.)

2.1.1 Actual Trivialists

Trivialist views have been endorsed by numerous philosophers in connection with numerous metaphysical questions.

Carnap (1950) can be interpreted as endorsing a trivialist view of the abstract-object question, i.e., the question of whether there are any such things as abstract objects like numbers (where an abstract object is an object that’s non-physical, non-mental, and non-spatiotemporal[6]). On Carnap’s view, the sentence ‘Numbers exist’ is trivially true—indeed, analytic—in what he calls the linguistic framework of numbers. And Carnap thinks that our linguistic framework includes the framework of numbers. And so, on Carnap’s view, ‘Numbers exist’ is trivially true in our language.

Thomasson (2007, 2009, 2015) endorses trivialist views of multiple ontological questions, most notably, the composite-object question, the abstract-object question, and the coincident-object question (i.e., the question of whether there are any statue-lump-style coincident objects). In particular, on Thomasson’s view, the application conditions for predicates like ‘is a table’ and ‘is a number’ are trivially satisfied. E.g., on her view, the existence of simples arranged tablewise is already sufficient for the truth of ‘There are tables’.

Hirsch (2002, 2009) endorses trivialist views of the composite-object question and the perdurantism-vs-endurantism question (i.e., the question of whether ordinary objects have temporal parts). We’ll see below that he also endorses mere-verbalist views of these two questions, but as we’ll see in section 2.2.3, these two kinds of views (i.e., trivialist views and mere-verbalist views) are compatible with one another. In a nutshell, Hirsch’s view is that (a) debates about these two questions are merely verbal, and (b) ordinary English is a composite-object-realist language and an endurantist language, and so, in ordinary English, endurantism and composite-object realism are true—indeed, they’re trivially true, in the relevant sense of the term.

Rayo (2013) endorses trivialist views of the abstract-object question and the composite-object question. On his view, the sentences ‘The number of witches is 0’ and ‘There are no witches’ say the same thing—or, as he puts it, for the number of witches to be 0 just is for there to be no witches—and so the claim that numbers exist follows trivially from the claim that there are no witches. And likewise, on Rayo’s view, ‘There are tables’ and ‘There are some things arranged tablewise’ say the same thing—or, again, in Rayo’s lingo, for there to be tables just is for there to be some things arranged tablewise.

Also, Schiffer (2003) endorses a trivialist view of the abstract-object question; most notably, on Schiffer’s view, the existence of propositions is entirely trivial. And Hale and Wright (2001, 2009) endorse a trivialist view of the question of whether numbers exist. And Van Fraassen (2002) endorses a version of trivialism about the composite-object question.

Hofweber (2016) develops a non-standard sort of trivialist view about the question of whether there are numbers, as well as a wide variety of other ontological questions. We’ll consider his view in more detail in section 4.

One might interpret Unger (2014) as endorsing trivialist views of various metaphysical questions, e.g., the composite-object question; but he’s probably better interpreted as endorsing mere-verbalist views.

Finally, Warren (2020) endorses a trivialist (and conventionalist) view of the question of whether there are any such things as numbers.

2.2 Mere-Verbalism

Let’s turn now to anti-realist views of another kind, namely, mere-verbalist views. Very roughly, mere-verbalist views of a metaphysical question MQ say that debates about MQ are merely verbal. We’ll get a more careful formulation of this view in section 2.2.2, but first, we need to get clear on what the term ‘merely verbal debate’ will mean in this entry.

2.2.1 Merely Verbal Debates

Sometimes people get into debates that are, in an important sense, merely verbal—and not really factual. To take an example from Bennett (2009), suppose that you’re at a bar, and two of your friends—Jack and Jill—get into a debate about whether your drink is a martini. But suppose that (a) Jack and Jill agree about the relevant worldly facts about your drink—namely, that it’s a mixture of vodka and green apple liqueur in a V-shaped glass—and (b) they disagree about whether your drink is a martini only because they mean different things by ‘martini’ (Jill means drink made of gin and a splash of vermouth, and Jack means alcoholic drink in a V-shaped glass). Then, intuitively, this debate is merely verbal.

We can make this more precise with the following definition:

Let D be a debate (or a dispute—we can use these two words interchangeably) between two people, P1 and P2, over the truth value of a sentence S, in which P1 says that S is true and P2 says that S is false; then D is merely verbal if and only if (a) P1 and P2 mean different things by S—or, more precisely, S expresses different propositions in the languages of P1 and P2—and (b) S is obviously true (or trivially true, or some such thing) in P1’s language, and S is obviously false (or trivially false, or some such thing) in P2’s language.

So, e.g., on this definition, the above dispute between Jack and Jill counts as merely verbal. For (a) Jack and Jill mean different things by ‘That drink is a martini’, and (b) that sentence is obviously true in Jack’s language, and obviously false in Jill’s language.

(You might worry that if P1 and P2 are speaking the same public language (e.g., English), then they mean the same thing by S—namely, whatever S means in English.[7] E.g., you might think that if Jack and Jill are both speaking English, then in both of their utterances, the word ‘martini’ means whatever it means in English—and so, in fact, Jack and Jill mean the same thing by ‘That drink is a martini’. But we can sidestep this worry by giving a stipulative definition of the expression ‘the language of person P’. Following Hirsch (2009), we can say that the language of P—or P’s language—is the language that would be spoken by a community of people just like P. Given this, the above worry just goes away; e.g., according to this definition, the word ‘martini’ clearly has a different meaning in Jack’s language than it does in Jill’s language.)

It’s important to note that the above definition of ‘merely verbal debate’ is not intended to capture the ordinary notion of a merely verbal debate, or all and only the debates that seem to us (intuitively) to be merely verbal. Rather, the intent here is to provide a stipulative definition of a concept that will be helpful in characterizing a certain kind of anti-realist view about metaphysical questions.

But even granting that the above definition is stipulative, you might wonder why we’re defining ‘merely verbal debate’ in precisely this way. In particular, you might consider clause (b) from the definition:

(b)
S is obviously true in P1’s language, and S is obviously false in P2’s language.

and wonder why it requires the truth values of S to be obvious in the two languages; more specifically, you might wonder why we don’t replace clause (b) with the following alternative clause:

(b*)
S is true in P1’s language and false in P2’s language.

The answer is that we need to require obviousness (or something like obviousness) to get the result that the debate is merely verbal. To appreciate this, consider the following debate between Luna and Althea:

Luna says that ‘God exists’ is true, and Althea says that ‘God exists’ is false; but Althea uses the word ‘God’ to refer to the God of Christianity (if that God exists), and Luna uses it to refer to a supernatural force of love that’s at work in the universe (if that force exists).

This debate is surely partly verbal; but insofar as the sentence ‘God exists’ is controversial in both languages—i.e., in Luna’s language and in Althea’s language—the debate doesn’t seem to be merely verbal. Now, to this, you might respond as follows:

Whether the debate between Luna and Althea is merely verbal depends on facts about Luna and Althea. If they both agree that (a) there is no Christian God, but (b) there is a supernatural force of love at work in the universe, then their debate is merely verbal.

If you like this response, then you might want to replace clause (b), in the above definition of ‘merely verbal debate’, with the following:

(b**)
P1 and P2 would agree that S is true in P1’s language and false in P2’s language.[8]

We could proceed in this way—defining ‘merely verbal debate’ in terms of what P1 and P2 believe, instead of what seems obvious or trivial to us—and for some purposes, this definition would be very useful. But in the present context—i.e., the context of discussing mere-verbalist critiques of metaphysics—it’s better to use the definition given above (i.e., the definition that employs clause (b) instead of (b**)). For if we use (b**), then the claim that some metaphysical debate is merely verbal will be compatible with the claim that there are two different substantive metaphysical questions at issue in connection with the given debate. And that doesn’t seem like much of a critique. In short—and this will become clear in subsection 2.2.2—if we use the above definition (i.e., the one containing clause (b) instead of (b**)), it will be easier to use the notion of a merely verbal debate to articulate a kind of mere-verbalism about metaphysical questions that counts as a kind of anti-realism about metaphysical questions.

2.2.2 Mere-Verbalism About Metaphysical Questions

In this section, we’ll articulate a kind of mere-verbalism that one can endorse of a metaphysical question. We’ll focus on the temporal-ontology question—i.e., the question of whether past and future objects exist—and to make things easy, we’ll assume that either (a) past and future objects both exist or (b) neither of them exist.[9] Given this simplifying assumption, the temporal-ontology question is equivalent to the question of whether presentism or eternalism is true—where, roughly speaking, presentism is the view that only present objects exist, and eternalism is the view that past, present, and future objects all exist.[10] (For more precise definitions of presentism and eternalism, see the entries on time and presentism.)

We can think of the temporal-ontology question as being about the truth values of sentences like the following:

[Dinosaur]
There exist dinosaurs.

Eternalists claim that sentence like [Dinosaur] are true, and presentists claim that they’re false. But one might think that when presentists and eternalists make these claims, they’re speaking different languages. More specifically, one might think that sentences like [Dinosaur] are obviously true in the language of eternalists and obviously false in the language of presentists. To see how one might develop a view of this kind, consider the following two languages:

Presentese is a language in which (a) [Dinosaur] is a present-tense sentence that expresses the (obviously false) proposition that dinosaurs exist at the present time, i.e., in the twenty-first century; and (b) likewise for other sentences like [Dinosaur].

Eternalese is a language in which (a) [Dinosaur] is a tenseless sentence that expresses the (obviously true) proposition that either there were dinosaurs, or there will be dinosaurs, or there are dinosaurs at the present time; and (b) likewise for other sentences like [Dinosaur].

Given this, one might endorse the following view:

View V: Typical debates about the temporal-ontology question—i.e., typical debates between mainstream philosophers who are actually debating the temporal-ontology question in print—are merely verbal. For Eternalese is the language of typical mainstream eternalists, and Presentese is the language of typical mainstream presentists, and so sentences like [Dinosaur] are obviously true in the language of eternalists and obviously false in the language of presentists.

Now, of course, you might doubt that this view is true; in particular, you might doubt that typical presentists and eternalists really do speak these languages. We’ll return to this issue in section 3, but the more important point to note here is that View V is not an anti-realist view of the temporal-ontology question—on the way that ‘anti-realism’ is being used in this entry—because it doesn’t imply that there’s something wrong with the temporal-ontology question. To appreciate this, notice that View V is perfectly compatible with the claim that the temporal-ontology question is a deep and important question about the nature of mind-independent reality that’s both factual and non-trivial. View V is a critique not of the temporal-ontology question, but of a group of actual philosophers—namely, the philosophers who have actually been debating the temporal-ontology question in print.

But while View V isn’t an anti-realist view, it’s easy to define a kind of mere-verbalism that is a kind of anti-realism. To get at this kind of view, we need to define three more kinds of debates, in addition to merely verbal debates:

  • A debate about meaning is a debate about the truth value of a sentence of the form ‘Word W means X in language L’ (or ‘In L, the sentence S is true if and only if p’, or something along these lines). (So, e.g., if we got into a debate about what the word ‘martini’ means in folk English, we would be having a debate about meaning.)
  • A conceptual-engineering debate (or an ameliorative debate) is a debate about the truth value of a sentence of the form ‘We should use word W to mean X’ (or ‘We should employ a language in which the sentence S is true iff p’, or something along these lines). (So, e.g., if we got into a debate about how we should use ‘martini’ in our language, we would be having a conceptual-engineering debate (or an ameliorative debate).)[11]
  • A non-verbal debate is a debate that’s neither merely verbal nor about meaning nor a conceptual-engineering debate.

Given these definitions, we can define mere-verbalism as follows:

Mere-verbalism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that there is no non-verbal (metaphysical[12]) debate to be had about MQ. (In other words, on this view, any (metaphysical) debate about MQ would have to be either merely verbal or about meaning or a conceptual-engineering debate.)[13]

Unlike View V, mere-verbalism about MQ involves a critique of MQ—it entails that there’s something wrong with MQ. For it entails that there is no debate about reality—or, rather, about the non-linguistic part of reality—to be had in connection with MQ. And insofar as MQ is supposed to be a metaphysical question, that seems like a critique of MQ.

But you might wonder how a mere-verbalist view could be true; you might wonder how it could be the case that there’s no non-verbal debate to be had about a metaphysical question. To see how this could be the case, let’s start with the following two definitions:

  • Let’s say that a language L is initially relevant to a metaphysical question MQ just in case it’s at least initially plausible that L is a language that matters vis-à-vis MQ.
  • And let’s say that L matters vis-à-vis MQ just in case it’s the language (or one of the languages) that the relevant people do speak or should speak in trying to answer MQ.[14] (The language that these people do speak might be the relevant public language (e.g., English); or it might be a special language (which we might call “Ontologese”) that’s spoken by the philosophers who are actually debating MQ in print.)

Given these definitions, we can define the following kind of view:

Type-2 mere-verbalism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that (a) there are at least two languages that are initially relevant to MQ, call them L1 and L2 (there might be more than two languages that are initially relevant here, but the important thing is that L1 and L2 are initially relevant to MQ); and (b) in all of these languages (and, in particular, in both L1 and L2), the answer to MQ is obvious (or trivial, or some such thing); and (c) in L1, we get one answer to MQ, and in L2, we get another answer to MQ.

For example, one could endorse type-2 mere-verbalism about the temporal-ontology question by claiming that (a) the only two languages that are even initially relevant to the temporal-ontology question are Presentese and Eternalese, and (b) sentences like [Dinosaur] are trivially true in Eternalese and trivially false in Presentese. And if this were true, it would presumably entail mere-verbalism about the temporal-ontology question—i.e., it would entail that there is no non-verbal (metaphysical) debate to be had about the temporal-ontology question.

Mere-verbalism, as it was defined above, doesn’t strictly entail type-2 mere-verbalism; but the two views fit together very well, and if type-2 mere-verbalism about MQ is true, it seems to more or less explain why mere-verbalism about MQ is true.

2.2.3 Actual Mere-Verbalists

Other philosophers haven’t defined mere-verbalism in the exact way that it was defined in section 2.2.2. But there are numerous philosophers who would endorse mere-verbalist views—or something very much like mere-verbalist views—of a variety of metaphysical questions. For starters, Carnap (1950) can be interpreted as endorsing a view of this kind of the abstract-object question—and, in particular, the question of whether numbers exist. For Carnap thinks that (i) in the linguistic framework of numbers, the sentence ‘Numbers exist’ is trivially true (and, indeed, analytic); and (ii) there are alternative linguistic frameworks, which we could reasonably employ, in which ‘Numbers exist’ is obviously not true.

(In section 2.1.1, we saw that Carnap can be interpreted as endorsing a trivialist view of the abstract-object question. But mere-verbalism about a metaphysical question MQ is perfectly compatible with trivialism about MQ. You can endorse both of these views by claiming that (a) there are exactly two languages that are initially relevant to MQ, namely, L1 and L2; and (b) the answer to MQ is obviously (or trivially) ‘Yes’ in L1 and obviously (or trivially) ‘No’ in L2; and (c) L1 is our actual language (i.e., English), and so trivialism about MQ is true. Carnaps’s view of the abstract-object question is an example of this. For in addition to endorsing (i) and (ii) from the preceding paragraph, Carnap also thinks that (iii) the sentence ‘Numbers exist’ is true (and analytic) in English.)

There are other philosophers as well who can be interpreted as endorsing mere-verbalism (or something very much like that view) about various metaphysical questions. Perhaps most notably, Hirsch (2002, 2009) endorses views of this kind in connection with the composite-object question and the perdurantism-vs-endurantism question (i.e., the question of whether ordinary objects have temporal parts). In particular, Hirsch endorses a quantifier-variantist view according to which the word ‘exist’ (and the quantifier ‘∃’) mean different things in the language of the perdurantist and the language of the endurantist (and in the language of the mereological nihilist and the language of the person who believes in composite objects like tables). (We saw in section 2.1.1 that Hirsch also endorses trivialist views of the composite-object question and the perdurantism-vs-endurantism question; but as we just saw, mere-verbalism about a metaphysical question is compatible with trivialism about that question. And like Carnap, Hirsch’s view is an example of this; he thinks that debates about the composite-object question and the perdurantism-vs-endurantism question are merely verbal, but he also thinks that ordinary English is a composite-object-realist language and an endurantist language, and so he thinks that, in ordinary English, endurantism and composite-object realism are (trivially) true.)

Like Hirsch, Putnam (1987, 1994), Sidelle (2002, 2007), Button (2013), Unger (2014), and Warren (2015, 2020, 2022) can all be interpreted as endorsing mere-verbalist views (or something like mere-verbalist views) of the composite-object question (and Putnam claims that Carnap also endorses a view of this kind of the composite-object question). Moreover, all of these philosophers very likely endorse mere-verbalist views of various other ontological questions; e.g., Sidelle explicitly endorses a view of this kind in connection with the coincident-object question—i.e., the question of whether there are any such things as statue-lump-style coincident objects—and the question of whether we should endorse mind-brain identity theory or some sort of functionalist view in the philosophy of mind.

In addition, Parfit (1995) endorses a mere-verbalist view in connection with questions of personal identity. And Dennett (2013) seems to endorse something like mere-verbalism in connection with various metaphysical questions, although he’s not very clear about which questions he has in mind. He talks mostly about weird objects like sakes and holes, but perhaps he would endorse a mere-verbalist view of the question of whether there are any numbers.

Sosa (1999), on one reading, endorses something in the ballpark of a mere-verbalist view of the composite-object question and the coincident-object question. But one might also read Sosa as endorsing a realist view of these questions (and of composite objects and coincident objects).

Cortens (2000) develops, but doesn’t endorse, a general sort of mere-verbalism about ontological questions, and he interprets Putnam as endorsing this view.

Hume (1748) endorses a mere-verbalist view of the free-will question, and by that, he seems to mean the question of whether human beings have free will.

Chalmers (2011) endorses a mere-verbalist view of the question of whether compatibilism or incompatibilism about free will is true. And Balaguer (2010) endorses a similar view, although he claims that this question is more charitably interpreted as being about meaning. Moreover, in his 2021 book, Balaguer takes this stance further, arguing that all conceptual-analysis questions—e.g., ‘What is free will?’, ‘What is knowledge?’, ‘What is a person?’, etc.—are best interpreted as being about meaning. In particular, on his view, these questions are about the meanings of the words ‘free will’, ‘knowledge’, ‘person’, and so on.

Finally, Thomasson (2017) and Belleri (2017) argue that ontological disputes (e.g., disputes over the existence of composite objects and abstract objects and 4-dimensional objects and so on) can be thought of as conceptual-engineering disputes—or as they put it, metalinguistic negotiations. Moreover, Carnap (1950) can be interpreted as endorsing a view of this kind as well. For while Carnap is a trivialist about what he calls internal questions, he thinks that what he calls external questions are pragmatic questions about what language to adopt.

(Flocke (2021) endorses a kind of anti-realism about ontological questions that she calls ontological expressivism; according to this view, ontological sentences like ‘Abstract objects exist’ and ‘Composite objects don’t exist’ express noncognitive mental states. This view is similar in certain ways to mere-verbalism, but it’s also importantly different.)

2.3 Non-Factualism

The final kind of local anti-realist view that we will consider can be defined as follows:

Non-Factualism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that there’s no fact of the matter about the answer to MQ; i.e., it’s the view that no answer to MQ is true.

So, e.g., non-factualism about the temporal-ontology question is the view that there’s no fact of the matter whether past and future objects exist. And non-factualism about the composite-object question is the view that there’s no fact of the matter whether composite objects like tables exist. And non-factualism about the abstract-object question is the view that there’s no fact of the matter whether abstract objects (e.g., numbers or propositions or whatever) exist.

We’ll see below that there are versions of non-factualism that are compatible with mere-verbalism. But we’ll start by considering some non-mere-verbalist versions of non-factualism. These kinds of non-factualism differ from mere-verbalist views and trivialist views in an important way. Trivialist and mere-verbalist views (of a metaphysical question MQ) all imply something like the following claim: In all of the languages that matter vis-à-vis MQ, the answer to MQ is obvious, or trivial, or some such thing. But non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views of MQ don’t imply anything like this; on the contrary, they imply that the languages that matter the most to MQ are not trivialist languages—i.e., they’re not languages in which the answer to MQ is obvious.

We can define non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views as follows:

Non-Mere-Verbalist Non-Factualism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that there’s no fact of the matter what the answer to MQ is because, in the language that matters vis-à-vis MQ, the sentences that state the competing answers to MQ are so imprecise that they don’t have truth values.

Consider, e.g., the composite-object question—and, more specifically, the question of whether there are any tables. Non-mere-verbalist non-factualism about this question says that (in the language that matters vis-à-vis the composite-object question) sentences like ‘Tables exist’ and ‘Tables do not exist’ are so imprecise that they lack determinate truth values.

One way to argue for this view would be to argue for the following two claims: (i) The language that matters vis-à-vis the composite-object question is a substantialist language; more specifically, in this language, the truth of the sentence ‘Tables exist’ requires there to be an extra fact, on top of the existence of simples arranged tablewise, and the truth of the sentence ‘Tables do not exist’ requires it to be the case that this alleged extra fact doesn’t exist; and (ii) it’s catastrophically imprecise what the alleged extra fact could even be (or what the lack of this extra fact could amount to).

(Balaguer constructs an argument of this kind in his 2021 book; he also argues there that (a) if there were a fact of the matter about whether ‘Tables exist’ was true or false in the language that matters vis-à-vis the composite-object question, then it would have to be either a contingent fact or a necessary fact, and (b) it’s neither. Finally, he argues (in his 1998 book, as well as his 2021 book) for an analogous view of the abstract-object question, and he suggests (in his 2021 book) that similar arguments can be run in connection with other metaphysical questions, e.g., the coincident-object question and the question of whether there are any non-natural moral facts.)

A second way to argue for a non-mere-verbalist non-factualist view is based on the idea that there’s nothing that determines whether the relevant sentences are true, or whether the relevant terms refer. For instance, in connection with the question of whether there are any such things as numbers, one might argue as follows:

(i) The only thing that could determine whether numerals refer (and, hence, whether numbers exist) is the effect that the referential success of numerals would have on the truth values of sentences containing numerals. But (ii) the referential success of numerals doesn’t have any effect on the truth values of sentences containing numerals (because the same sentences come out true and false, regardless of whether numerals refer to numbers). Therefore, (iii) nothing determines whether numerals refer—and, hence, whether numbers exist.

(Yablo 2009 suggests an argument of this kind. More specifically, he argues for premise (ii) and tells a just-so story about how premise (i) could be true—although he doesn’t really argue for premise (i).)

A third argument for non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views is based on the idea that we can distinguish two different quantifiers—a lightweight quantifier that’s used in ordinary discourse and a heavyweight quantifier that’s used in ontological debates. Given this, one might argue for non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views of certain kinds of ontological questions by saying something like the following:

The heavyweight quantifier is defective because we’re free to adopt multiple (distinct) domains of objects as the domain against which we evaluate ontological claims that are articulated with the heavyweight quantifier. Thus, if we’re speaking the language of ontology (and, hence, using the heavyweight quantifier), then the disputed sentences—e.g., sentences like ‘There are tables’—don’t have determinate truth values.

(Chalmers 2009 endorses a view of this kind in connection with the composite-object question, the coincident-object question, and the perdurantism-vs-endurantism question.[15])

Finally, a fourth way to argue for non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views is to argue that ontological questions—e.g., the composite-object question and the abstract-object question—are non-factual because they suffer from a certain sort of presupposition failure. More specifically, the idea here is that (a) these questions presuppose that there are deep metaphysical facts of a certain kind—facts that we can’t observe empirically and that would settle our ontological questions; and (b) there just aren’t any such facts. (Warren develops an argument of this kind in his 2016a paper.[16])[17]

In addition to the non-mere-verbalist versions of non-factualism that we’ve been considering so far, there are also mere-verbalist versions of non-factualism. We can define these views as follows:

Mere-Verbalist Non-Factualism about a metaphysical question MQ is the view that (a) there are at least two languages that matter vis-à-vis MQ, call them L1 and L2 (there might be more than two languages that matter here, but the important thing is that L1 and L2 matter); and (b) all of the languages that matter vis-à-vis MQ (e.g., L1 and L2) matter to the same extent—i.e., none of these languages matters more than any of the others vis-à-vis MQ; and (c) in all of these languages (and, in particular, in both L1 and L2), the answer to MQ is obvious (or trivial, or some such thing); and (d) in L1, we get one answer to MQ, and in L2, we get another answer to MQ; and so (e) there’s no fact of the matter about the answer to MQ.

For example, you could endorse mere-verbalist non-factualism about the temporal-ontology question by claiming that (a) there are exactly two languages that matter vis-à-vis the temporal-ontology question, namely, Presentese and Eternalese; and (b) neither of these two languages matters more than the other vis-à-vis the temporal-ontology question; and (c) [Dinosaur] is trivially true in Eternalese and trivially false in Presentese; and so (d) there’s no fact of the matter whether [Dinosaur] is true in the language that matters vis-à-vis the temporal-ontology question (and likewise for other sentences like [Dinosaur]), and so there’s no fact of the matter whether presentism or eternalism is true.

You might wonder why it would be true that L1 and L2 matter equally vis-à-vis MQ. The reason might be that (a) there’s no fact of the matter whether ordinary English is L1 or L2 (because the linguistic intentions of ordinary folk aren’t robust enough to determine what language they’re speaking). Or the reason might be that (b) there’s no fact of the matter whether the language of the philosophers who are debating MQ in print is L1 or L2 (because these philosophers haven’t been precise enough about what they mean by their words). Or the reason might be that (c) L1 and L2 are equally good in some sense, so that there’s no fact of the matter which of these two languages we should use.

(Many of the mere-verbalists mentioned in section 2.2.3 endorse something like mere-verbalist non-factualism; in particular, Carnap (1950), Putnam (1987, 1994), Sidelle (2002), Button (2013), and Parfit (1995) can all be interpreted as endorsing views of this kind.[18] And Cortens (2000) develops a very general version of this sort of view, but he doesn’t endorse it.)

3. Objections to Local Anti-Realist Views

3.1 The Objection from Metaphysical Privilege

Let’s begin with an objection to mere-verbalist views, in particular, quantifier-variantist views (i.e., views that say that quantifiers like ‘exist’ and ‘∃’ mean different things in the languages of the philosophers who endorse opposing views in connection with ontological questions[19]). The objection here is based on the idea that while it might be true that there are multiple candidate meanings of ‘exist’ and ‘∃’, one of these meanings is metaphysically privileged and, hence, is the one that matters in connection with ontological questions. One argument for this stance, developed by Sider (e.g., 2001, 2006, 2009, 2011), can be put in the following way:

The primitive terms of the best overall theory of the world carve nature at the joints—i.e., they’re natural terms in something like Lewis’s (1983) sense of the term. But ‘exist’ (or ‘∃’) is a primitive term in our best overall theory of the world, and so we have at least an initial reason to think that ‘exist’ is a joint-carving expression, or a natural expression, and hence that there’s a unique interpretation of ‘exist’—namely, the joint-carving interpretation—that’s metaphysically privileged.

This is an interesting argument, and it can provide certain kinds of metaphysicians (namely, those who think that the world contains deep structural facts, or that there are deep “joints” in reality) with a background view that justifies a realist view of ontological questions (in the metaontological sense of ‘realism’ outlined in section 1). But it seems unlikely that this argument will convince any anti-realists about ontological questions to give up their anti-realism; for anti-realists are likely to see this argument as relying on the claim that there are deep metaphysical facts of precisely the kind that, as anti-realists, they reject.

3.2 The Objection from Maximalism (and the Collapse Argument)

Let’s move on now to another objection to mere-verbalist views. Consider, e.g., mere-verbalism about the composite-object question. This view says (among other things) that there’s a language (namely, L1) in which, e.g., ‘Tables exist’ is obviously true and another language (namely, L2) in which ‘Tables exist’ is obviously false. Given this, we can object to mere-verbalist non-factualism by saying something like the following:

If ‘Tables exist’ comes out true in L1, then reality makes it true in L1. But this means that tables exist. And this means that there’s a clear, non-verbal fact of the matter about whether tables exist—they do. And this flies in the face of the mere-verbalist claim that there’s no non-verbal debate to be had about whether tables exist. Moreover, since mere-verbalism implies that ‘Tables exist’ is false in L2, it seems that this must be because the quantifiers of L2 are restricted, or something like that. (Arguments of this general kind have been developed by Hawthorne (2006) and Eklund (2008).)

(It might seem that the move from “‘Tables exist’ is true in L1” to ‘Tables exist’ begs the question against mere-verbalists. But Eklund responds to this by switching to sentences involving singular terms—like, e.g., ‘Herbie is a table’. The idea here is that if ‘Herbie is a table’ is true in L1, then ‘Herbie’ has a referent—i.e., it refers to a real object that exists in reality—and that object is a table.)

This argument can be used in connection with a wide variety of ontological questions, and in each case, the conclusion will be that the mere-verbalist view in question leads to the result that the maximal-ontology view is correct. E.g., in connection with the composite-object question, we’ll be led to mereological universalism (i.e., to the view that for any plurality of physical objects, there’s an object that’s composed of those objects[20]). And in connection with the abstract-object question, we’ll be led to plenitudinous platonism (i.e., to the view that the platonic realm is a plenitude in which all the abstract objects that could exist actually do exist[21]). And in connection with the coincident-object question, we’ll be led to the plenitudinous the view that for any physical object, there’s a plenitude of distinct objects that are coincident with that object (so, e.g., on this view, there is a massive plenitude of objects that are coincident with my computer, e.g., a pile of matter, and a sum of computer parts, and a thing that’s essentially on my table, and so on[22]).

Mere-verbalists might respond to this objection by claiming that the relevant existence claims are trivially true in the maximalist languages that they have in mind. E.g., in connection with the abstract-object question, the claim might be that sentences like ‘There exist numbers’ are analytic. And in connection with the composite-object question, the claim might be that ‘There exist tables’ is made true by the mere existence of simples arranged tablewise—and that the existence of simples arranged tablewise is obviously true and knowable via quick glances into dining rooms. And so mere-verbalists might maintain that even if the relevant existence claim—i.e., ‘Tables exist’, or ‘Numbers exist’, or whatever—is true in the maximalist’s language, we still have a deflationary, anti-realist view of the given metaphysical question.

But while mere-verbalists can surely stipulate that the maximalists that they have in mind are speaking a language in which these sentences are trivial, two different problems arise. One—which Eklund and Hawthorne both bring out—is that it’s hard to see how mere-verbalists could provide a compositional semantics for the maximalist language that they have in mind. E.g., it seems that in this language, the sentences ‘There are simples’, ‘There are tables’, and ‘There are numbers’ will all have different logical forms. (For a response to this worry about compositional semantics, see Hirsch & Warren 2019.)

The second problem is that while mere-verbalists can stipulatively create languages at will, their view will ultimately depend on the claim that the languages that they’re talking about are the languages that matter vis-à-vis the given metaphysical question. And that claim might be hard to justify. We will return to this issue in section 3.4.

(The argument from maximalism that we’ve been discussing in this subsection is similar in spirit to another widely discussed argument—namely, the collapse argument against quantifier variance. The main idea behind the collapse argument is that if ‘L1’ and ‘L2’ are understood in the manner of the first paragraph of the present subsection, then once we admit that ‘Tables exist’ (or ‘Numbers exist’, or whatever) is true in L1, we’ll be able to derive that ‘Tables exist’ (or ‘Numbers exist’, or whatever) is true in L2—as long as the word ‘exist’ obeys the usual inference rules for existential quantifiers in both L1 and L2—and this will undermine quantifier-variantist views of the debate about the existence of tables (or numbers, or whatever). If this argument is sound, it can be used to undermine quantifier-variantist views of all ontological disputes. The collapse argument is based on an argument in Harris (1982); versions of the argument have been developed by Hale and Wright (2009), Dorr (2014), and Rossberg (unpublished); and responses have been given by Warren (2015, 2022) and Sider (2023).)[23]

3.3 The Objection from Analyticity

The next objection we will consider is an objection against trivialist views, but it would be very easy to extend the argument so that it was directed against mere-verbalist views as well. We can put this objection in the following way:

Trivialists are committed to the claim that certain sentences are analytic. E.g., in connection with the composite-object question, they’re committed to the claim that sentences like the following are analytic:

[If-Table]
If there are simples arranged tablewise, then there are tables.

But sentences like this are, in fact, not analytic. For (a) the consequent of [If-Table] has ontological commitments that the antecedent doesn’t have—in particular, the table is supposed to be numerically distinct from the simples mentioned in the antecedent—and (b) we can’t define objects into existence. (Bennett 2009 develops an argument of this kind.)

Some trivialists might quibble with the claim that they’re committed to saying that sentences like [If-Table] are analytic; e.g., Rayo (2013) might prefer to say that the two sides of [If-Table] say the same thing, and he might not want to commit to the claim that they’re synonymous. But it seems clear that trivialists are committed to saying that sentences like [If-Table] are something like analytic—e.g., that the two sides of [If-Table] say the same thing, or some such thing. (And mere-verbalists are committed to similar claims that leave them vulnerable to objections of this general kind as well.)

It seems that trivialists (and mere-verbalists) have to respond to this argument by rejecting claim (a)—i.e., by denying that the consequent of [If-Table] has ontological commitments that the antecedent doesn’t have. And this, it seems, will force them to say that there’s some important sense in which the antecedent and consequent say the same thing. But, prima facie, this seems implausible. If we take claim (a) as a claim about ordinary English (or as a claim about the language that’s just like ordinary English except that it’s had the expression ‘simples arranged tablewise’ added to it), then it seems extremely plausible. And it also seems very plausible if we take claim (a) as a claim about the language that’s actually employed by typical ontological realists who are debating the composite-object question in print.

Now, of course, trivialists (and mere-verbalists) could respond to this by simply stipulating that in the language that they’re talking about, the antecedent and consequent of [If-Table] do not have different ontological commitments (because they say the same thing, or because they’re synonymous, or some such thing). But then the same two worries that arose in section 3.2 will reemerge here. First, if trivialists (and mere-verbalists) claim that the antecedent and consequent of [If-Table] say the same thing, then it seems that they’ll have to give up on compositionality—because it seems that they’ll have to say that expressions like ‘there are’ (and ‘there exist’ and ‘∃’ and so on) mean different things in sentences like ‘There are simples’ and ‘There are tables’ and ‘There are numbers’.

And second, trivialists and mere-verbalists will have to argue that the languages that they’re talking about here are the languages that matter vis-à-vis the relevant metaphysical questions. And as we’ll see in section 3.4, this might be hard to do.

3.4 The Objection from Substantialese

Another objection against mere-verbalist views and trivialist views, developed by Balaguer (2021)—and for similar but somewhat different objections, see Dorr (2005) and Sider (2009, 2011)—can be put like this:

(i) While trivialists and mere-verbalists can easily define languages in which the answers to our metaphysical questions are obvious (or trivial, or whatever), in every case, it’s easy to define a language—what we might call a substantialist language—in which the answer to the given metaphysical question is non-obvious. And (ii) in connection with most metaphysical questions, the substantialist language is the language that matters vis-à-vis the given metaphysical question.

For example, in connection with the composite-object question, we can define a language—call it Substantialist-Compositese—in which it’s stipulated that (a) ‘There are tables’ doesn’t follow analytically from ‘There are simples arranged tablewise’, and (b) the truth of ‘There are tables’ requires there to be an extra object that’s numerically distinct from the simples that compose it and that exists in a metaphysically substantive way. And in connection with the temporal-ontology question, we can define a language—call it Substantialist-Temporalese—in which it’s stipulated that (a) ‘There are dinosaurs’ doesn’t follow analytically from the claim that there used to be dinosaurs; and (b) this sentence doesn’t analytically entail the claim that dinosaurs exist at the present time, i.e., in the twenty-first century; and (c) the truth of ‘There are dinosaurs’ requires it to be the case that reality is a 4-dimensional block in which dinosaurs exist (in a metaphysically substantive eternalist way) in a past region of a 4-dimensional spatiotemporal block. And in connection with the abstract-object question, we can define a language—call it Substantialist-Platonese—in which it’s stipulated that (a) ‘There are numbers’ isn’t analytic, and (b) the truth of ‘There are numbers’ requires it to be the case that there are non-physical, non-mental, non-spatiotemporal objects that exist in a metaphysically substantive platonistic way. And so on.

In connection with just about all of our metaphysical questions, it seems, prima facie, that substantialist languages of this kind are the languages that matter vis-à-vis the relevant metaphysical questions. Balaguer supports this claim by arguing that (i) natural languages like English are best thought of as substantialist languages, not trivialist languages; and (ii) even if (i) isn’t true, mainstream philosophers who are actually debating the relevant metaphysical questions in print are best thought of as speaking substantialist languages rather than trivialist languages; and, most importantly, (iii) even if (i) and (ii) were both false—i.e., even if ordinary folk and mainstream metaphysicians were best interpreted as speaking trivialist languages—substantialist languages would still be the languages that matter vis-à-vis our metaphysical questions. The argument for claim (iii) is based on the fact that (a) if we debate our metaphysical questions in substantialist languages, then we get questions of the kind that we’re trying to ask, namely, substantive non-obvious metaphysical questions; and (b) if we debate our metaphysical questions in trivialist languages, then we get trivial, boring questions about things like whether there’s anything in the dining room that will keep our dinner from falling to the ground (in the composite-object debate), and whether dinosaurs are extinct (in the temporal-ontology debate), and how many witches there are in Salem, Massachusetts (in the abstract-object debate).

One way to respond to this argument would be to claim that substantialist languages of the above kind are, in some sense, not possible—that we can’t speak these languages. But this might be hard to justify because, intuitively, it seems that we can speak these languages—that it’s at least possible for us to debate our metaphysical questions in substantialist languages of this kind. And if trivialists and mere-verbalists admit that this is possible, then it’s hard to see how they could plausibly deny that these substantialist languages matter vis-à-vis our metaphysical questions; for it would seem rather odd to maintain that (a) if we wanted to, we could have a substantive debate about a metaphysical question MQ by speaking the language L, but (b) this doesn’t matter—we should stick to a trivialist language in which the answer to MQ is trivial.

Trivialists and mere-verbalists might try to motivate this stance by arguing that substantialist languages of the kind at issue here are imprecise—so imprecise that (a) the disputed sentences don’t have truth values in these languages, and (b) there’s no fact of the matter about the answers to our metaphysical questions in these languages. One might argue, however—and, in fact, Balaguer does argue—that even if substantialist languages are imprecise in this way, they’re still the languages that matter vis-à-vis our metaphysical questions. But, of course, trivialists and mere-verbalists might deny this.

3.5 The Problem of the Missing Second Language (and Unmasking Mere-Verbalists as Really Endorsing Anti-Realism In Metaphysics)

Another objection to mere-verbalist views is based on the observation that it’s often very difficult to figure out what the two languages are supposed to be. For instance, in connection with the composite-object question, one language will be the language of Thomasson-style trivialists. In this language, the existence of simples arranged tablewise is already sufficient for the truth of ‘There exist tables’, and so that sentence comes out trivially true. But what is the language in which ‘There exist tables’ comes out trivially false? It’s not clear that there’s any plausible answer to this question.

Bennett (2009) develops a version of this worry and suggests that mere-verbalists might claim that the second language here is a language in which ‘There exist tables’ is equivalent to the following sentence:

[T]
There are regions in which (a) there is a plurality of simples arranged tablewise, and (b) there is also an extra object that’s numerically distinct from the simples arranged tablewise.

But, as Bennett points out, it’s not clear that mereological nihilists mean to be speaking a language in which ‘There exist tables’ is equivalent to [T]. Moreover—and more importantly—it’s hard to see why we should think that [T] is trivially false. This would presumably be denied by anyone who thinks that the composite-object question is an important non-obvious question about the metaphysical nature of reality. In other words, realists about the composite-object question would presumably deny that [T] is trivially false. And so any language in which ‘There exist tables’ is equivalent to [T] isn’t a language of the kind that mere-verbalists need.

There’s also a second objection to mere-verbalist views that’s lurking in the background here. If mere-verbalists do claim that the nihilist’s language is a language in which ‘There exist tables’ is equivalent to [T]—and it’s hard to see what other language they could take to be the nihilist’s language[24]—then since mere-verbalists are committed to saying that ‘There exist tables’ is false in the nihilist’s language, they’ll also have to say that [T] is false. But [T] just seems to be an articulation of a metaphysically robust version of realism about composite objects like tables. Thus, if mere-verbalists about the composite-object question say that [T] is false, then it seems that they’re really just nihilists—i.e., it seems that they just reject the existence of substantive composite objects. And that seems incompatible with the whole spirit of mere-verbalism.

If this argument can be generalized to other ontological questions—and it’s not clear how far it can be generalized[25]—then it seems that mere-verbalists are really just anti-realists about objects of the kinds that our ontological questions are about. In other words, while mere-verbalists claim to be anti-realists about our ontological questions, if the argument under discussion here is correct, then mere-verbalists are unmasked as really being anti-realists about the objects that our ontological questions are about. Or to put the point into the lingo of section 1, the claim here is that mere-verbalists are unmasked as really being anti-realists in metaphysics, rather than anti-realists about metaphysics.

Dorr (2005) runs an argument that’s somewhat similar to this but also importantly different. In particular, Dorr argues that (a) ontological questions are best thought of as being debated in a special language in which semantically defective predicates are to be replaced with logically contradictory predicates; and (b) the two-place predicate ‘is a proper part of’ is semantically defective, and so in the language of ontology, nihilism (i.e., the view that there are no objects with proper parts) is true; and (c) mere-verbalists (and various other kinds of anti-realists about the composite-object question) should say that ‘is a proper part of’ is semantically defective, and so they are “unmasked” as really being nihilists.

One might reasonably think that similar remarks can be made about trivialists—i.e., that trivialists about the composite-object question can be thought of as “nihilists in disguise”, and that trivialists about the abstract-object question can be thought of as “anti-platonists in disguise”, and so on. At first glance, this might seem odd because trivialists claim to endorse the existence of objects of these kinds—i.e., they claim that sentences like ‘There are tables’ and ‘There are numbers’ are true. But it’s hard to resist the feeling that trivialists are engaged in a kind of “false advertising”; it’s hard to resist the feeling that trivialists don’t really believe in objects of the kinds that are under dispute among ontological realists—i.e., among philosophers who endorse realist views of our ontological questions. In other words, it’s hard to resist the feeling that trivialists don’t believe in the existence of full-blown (i.e., metaphysically substantive) abstract objects or full-blown composite objects.

3.6 The Problem of Metaphysical Equivalence

Consider the following pair or sentences:

[U]
There’s a table in Beth’s dining room.
[N]
There are simples arranged tablewise in Beth’s dining room.

These two sentences seem to give us different descriptions of reality. But mere-verbalists (and, in particular, quantifier variantists) seem to be committed to saying that if a mereological universalist utters [U] and a nihilist utters [N], then they’ve said the same thing about reality, or they’ve painted equivalent pictures of reality. Put differently, quantifier variantists seem committed to saying that these two utterances are metaphysically equivalent.

Given this, one might argue against mere-verbalist (and, in particular, quantifier-variantist) views by arguing that [U] and [N] are not metaphysically equivalent, or that we don’t have any good reason to believe that they’re metaphysically equivalent. (McSweeney 2016 constructs an argument of this kind. In particular, she argues that in order for us to be justified in believing that two theories T1 and T2 are metaphysically equivalent, there needs to be some perspective from which we can conceive of T1 and T2 as giving us a single unified theory, T+, that says everything that T1 and T2 say individually and nothing more. And then she raises doubts about whether we have such a perspective in connection with the pairs of theories that quantifier variantists think are equivalent.)

Intuitively, it seems that pairs of theories—or, more importantly, pairs of utterances—of the kind in question here are equivalent. Now, if you’re thinking of English, this claim might be surprising. For in English, pairs of sentences like [U] and [N] don’t seem to be equivalent. But that’s not what matters here. What matters is whether the Universalese sentence [U] (where Universalese is the language that mere-verbalists think that compositional universalists speak) is equivalent to the Nihilese sentence [N] (where Nihilese is the language that mere-verbalists think that compositional nihilists speak). And it seems that once we learn to speak Nihilese and Universalese, it becomes very intuitive to think that these two sentences are equivalent. This is because, in Universalese, the fact that makes [N] true—i.e., the existence of simples arranged tablewise in Beth’s dining room—is already sufficient for the truth of [U]. And so it seems that in order to undermine mere-verbalist views with an argument of the above kind, you would need to argue that we don’t understand these two languages as well as we seem to. (In McSweeney’s lingo, the claim here is as follows: the fact that the above two sentences seem intuitively equivalent to us suggests that we do have a perspective from which we can conceive of them as giving us a single unified theory.)

4. Global Anti-Realist Views

This entry has been focused on local kinds of anti-realism—i.e., on anti-realist views of specific metaphysical questions, like the abstract-object question and the composite-object question. But it’s important to note that there are also some more global anti-realist views in the literature. As was pointed out at the start of the entry, Wittgenstein (1921, 1953) and the logical positivists (e.g., the early Carnap 1928, 1934) offered very general critiques of metaphysics. But those critiques are largely believed to have failed for a variety of reasons. Perhaps the most important reason is that these views are thought to be self-refuting; in other words, the arguments that these philosophers gave against metaphysics seemed to refute their own anti-metaphysical views.

We won’t consider the critiques of Wittgenstein and the logical positivists—for more on their views, see the entries on Ludwig Wittgenstein and logical empiricism[26]—but in this section, we will briefly consider some critiques of metaphysics that have been put forward recently that are more general than the local sorts of critiques considered in section 2.

One sort of view here might be called global anti-metaphysical scientism. Views of this kind say that we can get all the metaphysics that we need from science, or that we shouldn’t endorse any metaphysical claims that go beyond what the sciences say, or something along these lines. (Views in this general vicinity have been endorsed by van Fraassen (2002), Maudlin (2007), and Ismael (2013). Ladyman and Ross (2007) endorse a similar view; they argue that the only legitimate kind of metaphysics is aimed at explaining how multiple scientific theories can be unified.)

A second way to develop a more general variety of anti-realism is to argue for a general trivialist view of ontological questions. There are multiple versions of this kind of view. One version, developed by Thomasson (2015), is based on the idea that once we get clear on the meanings and truth conditions of certain kinds of sentences, it becomes clear that the kinds of questions that are typically asked by ontologists are easily answerable—either conceptually (as in the case of the question of whether there any numbers) or via easy empirical experiments (as in the case of the question of whether there are any tables, which can be answered by simply looking into certain dining rooms). A second version of general trivialism about ontological questions, developed by Hofweber (2016), is based on a distinction between two kinds of quantifiers—one that’s existentially loaded (the external quantifier) and one that’s not existentially loaded (the internal quantifier). Somewhat roughly, the view here is that for just about any predicate F, (i) if the quantifiers associated with our talk of Fs are internal, then the sentence ‘Fs exist’ is trivially true when ‘exist’ is read internally, and it’s trivially false when ‘exist’ is read externally; and (ii) if the quantifiers associated with our talk of Fs are external, then the question of whether there are any Fs is trivially settled by our empirical scientific theories. For example, on Hofweber’s view, the quantifiers associated with our talk of numbers are internal, and so ‘Numbers exist’ is trivially true in the internal sense and trivially false in the external sense; and the quantifiers associated with our talk of ordinary objects like rocks are external, and the claim that things like rocks exist follows immediately from our empirical theories.

It’s worth noting that neither of these versions of general trivialism is supposed to be entirely general. On Thomasson’s version of the view, there are some existence questions that are difficult to answer because they’re conceptually or empirically difficult; e.g., it might be conceptually difficult to determine whether there’s a largest pair of twin primes, and it might be empirically difficult to determine whether there are planets with moons orbiting Alpha Centauri A. And similar remarks can be made about Hofweber’s version of the view. Moreover, even if we limit our attention to the kinds of ontological questions that metaphysicians ask, the view still isn’t entirely general; for it’s compatible with the claim that some of these questions (e.g., ‘Does God exist?’) are not trivial.

(It seems likely that some of the trivialists and mere-verbalists discussed in section 2 would endorse very general trivialist views as well. In particular, it seems that Carnap (1950) and Rayo (2013) would endorse very general trivialist views of ontological questions. And Cortens (2000) develops view that’s similar but also a bit different—it’s better thought of as a general version of mere-verbalist non-factualism. Cortens interprets Putnam as endorsing this view, but he doesn’t endorse it himself. Finally, Unger (2014) seems to endorse a general version of mere-verbalism as well. But Hirsch (2002, 2009) would not endorse as general a view as some of these other philosophers; he endorses trivialist/mere-verbalist views of numerous ontological questions, but he doesn’t endorse a view of this kind of the abstract-object question.)

A third very global kind of anti-realism, developed by Balaguer (2021), can be called neo-positivism. Very roughly, glossing over some details, neo-positivism is the view that for any metaphysical question MQ, either (a) a non-mere-verbalist non-factualism is true of MQ, or (b) a local anti-metaphysical sort of scientism is true of MQ (i.e., very roughly, MQ is an ordinary empirical question about physical reality, and we can’t make any substantive progress on MQ by using philosophical arguments). For example, Balaguer argues for non-mere-verbalist non-factualist views of the composite-object question and the abstract-object question (and he suggests that similar arguments can be run in connection with the coincident-object question and the non-natural-moral-fact question); and he argues for local anti-metaphysical scientistic views of conceptual-analysis questions, the question of whether we have free will, the question of whether mind-brain materialism is true, and the question of whether God exists.

It’s important to note that at least some of these more recent views fare better with respect to self-refutation worries than earlier versions of global anti-realism do—in particular, they fare better than the views of Wittgenstein and the logical positivists do. For example, the general trivialist views of Thomasson and Hofweber aren’t self-refuting because (a) these views are about ontological questions only, and (b) these views aren’t themselves ontological claims. And Balaguer’s neo-positivism isn’t self-refuting because neo-positivists can endorse anti-metaphysical scientism about the question of whether neo-positivism is true; more specifically, they can take neo-positivism to be an empirical hypothesis about the actual metaphysical questions that are debated in print by actual metaphysicians; and they can claim that the argument for neo-positivism is a piecemeal inductive argument based on specific arguments for neo-positivist views of specific metaphysical questions.[27]

On the other hand, it’s not clear that advocates of global anti-metaphysical scientism can avoid the worry of self-refutation. Perhaps they could argue that our scientific theories imply (or suggest, or some such thing) that we should be anti-realists about metaphysical theorizing that goes beyond what the sciences tell us; but it is far from clear that this is true.

Similar remarks can be made about the “just-more-metaphysics worry”—i.e., the worry that anti-metaphysical views don’t succeed in getting rid of metaphysics because they are themselves metaphysical theories. This isn’t a serious problem for general trivialism or neo-positivism; for advocates of those views can just grant that their theories are metaphysical theories, and they can simply deny that they’re trying to get rid of metaphysics altogether. Since general trivialist theories are about ontology only—and since these theories aren’t themselves ontological theories—advocates of these theories can simply claim that their theories belong to a part of metaphysics that doesn’t concern ontology. And advocates of neo-positivism can say (and, indeed, Balaguer does say) that neo-positivism is a metaphysical theory but that we can endorse anti-metaphysical scientism (and, hence, neo-positivism) about the question of whether neo-positivism is true.

It’s less obvious, however, that advocates of global anti-metaphysical scientism can shrug off the worry that their theories are metaphysical theories. For it’s not obvious that our scientific theories imply that global anti-metaphysical scientism is true.[28]

Bibliography

  • Agassi, Joseph, 2018, “A History of Anti-Metaphysics”, in his Ludwig Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations: An Attempt at a Critical Rationalist Appraisal (Synthese Library 401), Cham: Springer International Publishing, 27–43. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-00117-9_2
  • Balaguer, Mark, 1995, “A Platonist Epistemology”, Synthese, 103(3): 303–325. doi:10.1007/BF01089731
  • –––, 1998, Platonism and Anti-Platonism in Mathematics, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195122305.001.0001
  • –––, 2010, Free Will as an Open Scientific Problem, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. doi:10.7551/mitpress/9780262013543.001.0001
  • –––, 2021, Metaphysics, Sophistry, and Illusion: Toward a Widespread Non-Factualism, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198868361.001.0001
  • Belleri, Delia, 2017, “Verbalism and Metalinguistic Negotiation in Ontological Disputes”, Philosophical Studies, 174(9): 2211–2226. doi:10.1007/s11098-016-0795-z
  • Bennett, Karen, 2004, “Spatio-Temporal Coincidence and the Grounding Problem”, Philosophical Studies, 118(3): 339–371. doi:10.1023/B:PHIL.0000026471.20355.54
  • –––, 2009, “Composition, Colocation, and Metaontology”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 38–76 (ch. 2). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0002
  • –––, 2016, “There Is No Special Problem with Metaphysics”, Philosophical Studies, 173(1): 21–37. doi:10.1007/s11098-014-0439-0
  • Broad, C. D., 1923, Scientific Thought (International Library of Psychology, Philosophy, and Scientific Method), London: K. Paul, Trench, Trubner & co.
  • Builes, David, 2021, “The World Just Is the Way It Is”, The Monist, 104(1): 1–27. doi:10.1093/monist/onaa023
  • –––, 2023, “A Humean Non-Humeanism”, Philosophical Studies, 180(3): 1031–1048. doi:10.1007/s11098-023-01927-5
  • Burge, Tyler, 1979, “Individualism and the Mental”, Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4: 73–121. doi:10.1111/j.1475-4975.1979.tb00374.x
  • Burgess, Alexis and David Plunkett, 2013a, “Conceptual Ethics I”, Philosophy Compass, 8(12): 1091–1101. doi:10.1111/phc3.12086
  • –––, 2013b, “Conceptual Ethics II”, Philosophy Compass, 8(12): 1102–1110. doi:10.1111/phc3.12085
  • Burgess, John P., 2007, “Against Ethics”, Ethical Theory and Moral Practice, 10(5): 427–439. doi:10.1007/s10677-007-9063-9
  • Button, Tim, 2013, The Limits of Realism, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199672172.001.0001
  • Cappelen, Herman, 2018, Fixing Language: An Essay on Conceptual Engineering, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198814719.001.0001
  • Carnap, Rudolf, 1928 [1967], Der Logische Aufbau der Welt, Berlin: Weltkreis. Translated as The Logical Structure of the World: Pseudoproblems in Philosophy, Rolf A. George (trans.), Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1967.
  • –––, 1934 [1937], Logische Syntax der Sprache (Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung), Wien: J. Springer. Translated as The Logical Syntax of Language, Amethe Smeaton (trans.), London: Routledge & K. Paul, 1937.
  • –––, 1950, “Empiricism, Semantics, and Ontology”, Revue Internationale de Philosophie, 4(11): 20–40.
  • Chalmers, David J., 2009, “Ontological Anti-Realism”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 77–129 (ch. 3). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0003
  • –––, 2011, “Verbal Disputes”, The Philosophical Review, 120(4): 515–566. doi:10.1215/00318108-1334478
  • Chalmers, David John, David Manley, and Ryan Wasserman (eds), 2009, Metametaphysics: New Essays on the Foundations of Ontology, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.001.0001
  • Correia, Fabrice and Sven Rosenkranz, 2015, Nothing to Come: A Defense of the Growing Block Theory of Time, Cham, Switzerland: Springer Verlag.
  • Cortens, Andrew Joseph, 2000, Global Anti-Realism: A Metaphilosophical Inquiry, Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
  • Dennett, Daniel C., 2013, “Kinds of Things—Towards a Bestiary of the Manifest Image”, in Ross, Ladyman, and Kincaid 2013: 96–107 (ch. 5). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199696499.003.0005
  • Dorr, Cian, 2005, “What We Disagree about When We Disagree about Ontology”, in Fictionalism In Metaphysics, Mark Eli Kalderon (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 234–286 (ch. 8). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199282180.003.0009
  • –––, 2014, “Quantifier Variance and the Collapse Theorems”, The Monist, 97(4): 503–570. doi:10.1093/monist/97.4.503
  • Emery, Nina, 2019, “Actualism without Presentism? Not by Way of the Relativity Objection”, Noûs, 53(4): 963–986. doi:10.1111/nous.12247
  • –––, 2020, “Actualism, Presentism and the Grounding Objection”, Erkenntnis, 85(1): 23–43. doi:10.1007/s10670-018-0016-6
  • Eklund, Matti, 2008, “The Picture of Reality as an Amorphous Lump”, in Sider, Hawthorne, and Zimmerman: 382–396 (ch. 9.2).
  • –––, 2016, “Carnap’s Legacy for the Contemporary Metaontological Debate”, in Ontology after Carnap, Stephan Blatti and Sandra Lapointe (eds), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 165–189 (ch. 8). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199661985.003.0009
  • Fairchild, Maegan, 2019, “The Barest Flutter of the Smallest Leaf: Understanding Material Plenitude”, The Philosophical Review, 128(2): 143–178. doi:10.1215/00318108-7374932
  • Fine, Kit, 2003, “The Non-Identity of a Material Thing and Its Matter”, Mind, 112(446): 195–234. doi:10.1093/mind/112.446.195
  • –––, 2009, “The Question of Ontology”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 157–177 (ch. 5). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0005
  • Finn, Suki and Otávio Bueno, 2018, “Quantifier Variance Dissolved”, Royal Institute of Philosophy Supplement, 82: 289–307. doi:10.1017/S135824611800005X
  • Flocke, Vera, 2021, “Ontological Expressivism”, in The Language of Ontology, J. T. M. Miller, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 65–87 (ch. 4). doi:10.1093/oso/9780192895332.003.0005
  • Hale, Bob and Crispin Wright, 2001, The Reason’s Proper Study: Essays towards a Neo-Fregean Philosophy of Mathematics, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/0198236395.001.0001
  • –––, 2009, “The Metaontology of Abstraction”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 178–212 (ch. 6). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0006
  • Harris, J. H., 1982, “What’s so Logical about the ‘Logical’ Axioms?”, Studia Logica, 41(2–3): 159–171. doi:10.1007/BF00370342
  • Haslanger, Sally, 2000, “Gender and Race: (What) Are They? (What) Do We Want Them To Be?”, Noûs, 34(1): 31–55. doi:10.1111/0029-4624.00201
  • Hawley, Katherine, 2001, How Things Persist, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199275434.001.0001
  • Hawthorne, John, 2006, “Plenitude, Convention, and Ontology”, in his Metaphysical Essays, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 53–70 (ch. 3).
  • Heller, Mark, 1990, The Ontology of Physical Objects: Four-Dimensional Hunks of Matter (Cambridge Studies in Philosophy), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781139166409
  • Hinchliff, Mark, 1996, “The Puzzle of Change”, Philosophical Perspectives, 10: 119–136. doi:10.2307/2216239
  • Hirsch, Eli, 2002, “Quantifier Variance and Realism”, Philosophical Issues, 12: 51–73. doi:10.1111/j.1758-2237.2002.tb00061.x
  • –––, 2009, “Ontology and Alternative Languages”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 231–259 (ch. 8). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0008
  • Hirsch, Eli and Jared Warren, 2019, “Quantifier Variance and the Demand for a Semantics”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 98(3): 592–605. doi:10.1111/phpr.12442
  • –––, 2020, “Quantifier Variance”, in The Routledge Handbook of Philosophy of Relativism, Martin Kusch (ed.), London: Routledge, 349–357.
  • Hofweber, Thomas, 2016, Ontology and the Ambitions of Metaphysics, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198769835.001.0001
  • Horgan, Terence and Matjaž Potrč, 2000, “Blobjectivism and Indirect Correspondence”, Facta Philosophica, 2(2): 249–270. doi:10.5840/factaphil20002214
  • Hudson, Hud, 2001, A Materialist Metaphysics of the Human Person, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Hume, David, 1748, An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, London: A. Millar.
  • Ismael, Jenann, 2013, “Causation, Free Will, and Naturalism”, in 208–235 (ch. 10). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199696499.003.0010
  • Kant, Immanuel, 1781/87, Critik der reinen Vernunft, first edition, Riga: Hartknoch. Second edition 1787. Translated as Critique of Pure Reason, Norman Kemp Smith (trans.), London: MacMillan, 1929.
  • Kelly, Thomas, 2008, “Common Sense as Evidence: Against Revisionary Ontology and Skepticism”, Midwest Studies In Philosophy, 32: 53–78. doi:10.1111/j.1475-4975.2008.00165.x
  • Korman, Daniel Z., 2015, Objects: Nothing out of the Ordinary, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198732532.001.0001
  • Ladyman, James and Don Ross with David Spurrett, and John G. Collier, 2007, Every Thing Must Go: Metaphysics Naturalized, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199276196.001.0001
  • Lewis, David K., 1983, “New Work for a Theory of Universals”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 61(4): 343–377. doi:10.1080/00048408312341131
  • –––, 1986, On the Plurality of Worlds, Oxford/New York: Basil Blackwell.
  • –––, 1991, Parts of Classes, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: Basil Blackwell.
  • Linsky, Bernard and Edward N. Zalta, 1995, “Naturalized Platonism Versus Platonized Naturalism”, Journal of Philosophy, 92(10): 525–555. doi:10.2307/2940786
  • Markosian, Ned, 1998, “Brutal Composition”, Philosophical Studies, 92(3): 211–249. doi:10.1023/A:1004267523392
  • –––, 2004, “A Defense of Presentism”, in Oxford Studies In Metaphysics, Volume 1, Dean W Zimmerman (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 47–82 (ch. 3). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199267729.003.0003
  • Maudlin, Tim, 2007, The Metaphysics within Physics, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199218219.001.0001
  • McSweeney, Michaela Markham, 2016, “An Epistemic Account Of Metaphysical Equivalence1”, Philosophical Perspectives, 30: 270–293. doi:10.1111/phpe.12075
  • Merricks, Trenton, 2001, Objects and Persons, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/0199245363.001.0001
  • –––, 2007, Truth and Ontology, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199205233.001.0001
  • Parfit, Derek, 1995, “The Unimportance of Identity”, in Identity: Essays Based on Herbert Spencer Lectures given in the University of Oxford, Henry Harris (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 13–45. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198235255.003.0002
  • Plunkett, David and Tim Sundell, 2013, “Disagreement and the Semantics of Normative and Evaluative Terms”, Philosopher’s Imprint, 13: article 23. [Plunkett and Sundell 2013 available online]
  • Prior, A. N., 1970, “The Notion of the Present”, Studium Generale 23: 245–248. Reprinted in The Study of Time, J. T. Fraser, F. C. Haber, and G. H. Müller (eds), Berlin/Heidelberg: Springer, 1972, 320–323. doi:10.1007/978-3-642-65387-2_22
  • Putnam, Hilary, 1987, “Truth and Convention: On Davidson’s Refutation of Conceptual Relativism”, Dialectica, 41(1–2): 69–77. doi:10.1111/j.1746-8361.1987.tb00880.x
  • –––, 1994, “The Question of Realism”, in his Words and Life, James Conant (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 295–312.
  • Quine, W. V., 1950, “Identity, Ostension, and Hypostasis”, The Journal of Philosophy, 47(22): 621–633. doi:10.2307/2021795
  • Rayo, Agustín, 2013, The Construction of Logical Space, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199662623.001.0001
  • Rosen, Gideon and Cian Dorr, 2002, “Composition as a Fiction” (Blackwell Philosophy Guides 8), in The Blackwell Guide to Metaphysics, Richard M. Gale (ed.), Oxford/Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 151–174 (ch. 8). doi:10.1002/9780470998984.ch8
  • Ross, Don, James Ladyman, and Harold Kincaid (eds), 2013, Scientific Metaphysics, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199696499.001.0001
  • Rossberg, Marcus, unpublished, “On the Logic of Quantifier Variance (2008)”. [Rossberg unpublished available online (pdf)]
  • Schiffer, Stephen, 2003, The Things We Mean, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/0199257760.001.0001
  • Sidelle, Alan, 2002, “Is There a True Metaphysics of Material Objects?”, Philosophical Issues, 12: 118–145. doi:10.1111/j.1758-2237.2002.tb00064.x
  • –––, 2007, “The Method of Verbal Dispute”, Philosophical Topics, 35(1/2): 83–113. doi:10.5840/philtopics2007351/25
  • Sider, Theodore, 2001, Four-Dimensionalism: An Ontology of Persistence and Time, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/019924443X.001.0001
  • –––, 2006, “Quantifiers and Temporal Ontology”, Mind, 115(457): 75–97. doi:10.1093/mind/fzl075
  • –––, 2009, “Ontological Realism”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 384–423 (ch. 13). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0013
  • –––, 2011, Writing the Book of the World, Oxford: Clarendon. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199697908.001.0001
  • –––, 2013, “Against Parthood”, in Oxford Studies in Metaphysics, Volume 8, Karen Bennett and Dean W. Zimmerman (eds), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 236–293. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199682904.003.0006
  • –––, 2023, “The New Collapse Argument against Quantifier Variance”, The Monist, 106(3): 342–361. doi:10.1093/monist/onad018
  • Sider, Theodore, John Hawthorne, and Dean W. Zimmerman (eds), 2008, Contemporary Debates in Metaphysics (Contemporary Debates in Philosophy 10), Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishing.
  • Smart, J. J. C., 1963, Philosophy and Scientific Realism (International Library of Philosophy and Scientific Method), London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
  • Sosa, Ernest, 1999, “Existential Relativity”, Midwest Studies In Philosophy, 23: 132–143. doi:10.1111/1475-4975.00007
  • Thomasson, Amie L., 2007, Ordinary Objects, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780195319910.001.0001
  • –––, 2009, “Answerable and Unanswerable Questions”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 444–471 (ch. 15). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0015
  • –––, 2015, Ontology Made Easy, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199385119.001.0001
  • –––, 2017, “Metaphysical Disputes and Metalinguistic Negotiation”, Analytic Philosophy, 58(1): 1–28. doi:10.1111/phib.12087
  • Tooley, Michael, 1997, Time, Tense, and Causation, Oxford: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/0198250746.001.0001
  • Unger, Peter K., 2014, Empty Ideas: A Critique of Analytic Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199330812.001.0001
  • van Cleve, James, 2008, “The Moon and Sixpence : A Defense of Mereological Universalism”, in Sider, Hawthorne, and Zimmerman: 321–340 (ch. 8.1).
  • van Fraassen, Bas C., 2002, The Empirical Stance (The Terry Lectures), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. doi:10.12987/9780300127966
  • van Inwagen, Peter, 1990, Material Beings, Ithaca, NY/London: Cornell University Press.
  • Vargas, Manuel, 2009, “Revisionism about Free Will: A Statement & Defense”, Philosophical Studies, 144(1): 45–62. doi:10.1007/s11098-009-9366-x
  • Warren, Jared, 2015, “Quantifier Variance and the Collapse Argument”, The Philosophical Quarterly, 65(259): 241–253. doi:10.1093/pq/pqu080
  • –––, 2016a, “Internal and External Questions Revisited”, Journal of Philosophy, 113(4): 177–209. doi:10.5840/jphil2016113411
  • –––, 2016b, “Trapping the Metasemantic Metaphilosophical Deflationist?”, Metaphilosophy, 47(1): 108–121. doi:10.1111/meta.12173
  • –––, 2020, Shadows of Syntax: Revitalizing Logical and Mathematical Conventionalism, New York, NY: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780190086152.001.0001
  • –––, 2022, “Quantifier Variance, Semantic Collapse, and ‘Genuine’ Quantifiers”, Philosophical Studies, 179(3): 745–757. doi:10.1007/s11098-021-01685-2
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig, 1921 [1922], “Logisch-Philosophische Abhandlung”, Wilhelm Ostwald (ed.), Annalen der Naturphilosophie, 14: 185–262. Translated to English as Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, Charles Kay Ogden and Frank P. Ramsey (trans), London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1922.
  • –––, 1953, Philosophical Investigations, G. E. M. Anscombe (trans.), Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Yablo, Stephen, 1987, “Identity, Essence, and Indiscernibility”, The Journal of Philosophy, 84(6): 293–314. doi:10.2307/2026781
  • –––, 2009, “Must Existence-Questions Have Answers?”, in Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009: 507–525 (ch. 17). doi:10.1093/oso/9780199546046.003.0017
  • Zimmerman, Dean, 1998, “Temporary Intrinsics and Presentism”, in Metaphysics: The Big Questions, Peter van Inwagen and Dean Zimmerman (eds), Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 206–219.

Other Internet Resources

Copyright © 2025 by
Mark Balaguer <mbalagu@calstatela.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free