Comparative Philosophy of Religion

First published Wed Mar 19, 2025

Comparative philosophy of religion is a subfield of both philosophy of religion and comparative philosophy. Philosophy of religion engages with philosophical questions related to religious belief and practice, including questions concerning the concept of religion itself. Comparative philosophy compares concepts, theories, and arguments from diverse philosophical traditions. The term “comparative philosophy of religion” can refer to the comparative philosophical study of different religions or of different philosophies of religion. It can thus be either a first-order philosophical discipline—investigating matters to do with religion—or a second-order philosophical discipline, investigating matters to do with philosophical inquiry into religion. When understood in the latter sense, comparative philosophy of religion is a form of metaphilosophy.

Following the famous dictum from Friedrich Max Müller (who was himself borrowing a phrase from Goethe), it may be claimed that, in the study of religion, someone “who knows one, knows none” (Müller 1882: 13, original emphasis). By this, Müller meant not that it is impossible to have a deep practical knowledge of a religion (such as a religion to which one is personally committed) without knowing about other religions; rather, his point is that one cannot come to know “what religion really is” if one has knowledge of only one (1882: 13). In other words, without comparison, one will not be able to take a step back from the specific instance and gain a perspective on the phenomenon of religion more generally. Applying this thought to philosophy of religion, it might be contended that if a philosophical understanding of religion (in general) is to be arrived at, rather than of only one religion, the method must involve comparison. Hence, just as it has been asserted by some that “All philosophy is comparative philosophy” (Allinson 2001: 270; see also Masson-Oursel 1951), so it might be argued that all philosophy of religion—or, at any rate, all good philosophy of religion—has a comparative element (Ruparell 2011: 45).

The present entry surveys different ways of understanding both the term “comparative philosophy of religion” and other terms that have been used to designate the same or similar fields of study. It also examines historical examples of comparative philosophy of religion, from ancient to modern times, along with competing approaches to this form of inquiry, some of which accentuate unity while others accentuate diversity. Then, after considering a selection of philosophically comparative studies of specific religious topics, the entry ends with some reflections upon challenges for the field, both methodological and political.

1. “Comparative Philosophy of Religion” and Comparable Terms

1.1 Meanings of “Comparative Philosophy of Religion”

“Comparative philosophy of religion” has two main meanings. On the one hand, it can denote the comparative philosophical study of two or more religions. This meaning is typified by Franklin Gamwell when he defines comparative philosophy of religion as “critical reflection that asks: What most general understandings of the similarities and differences among religious activities are valid?” or, more succinctly, “What are the most general similarities and differences among religions?” (Gamwell 1994: 22). On the other hand, the term can denote the comparative study of two or more philosophies of religion. Timothy Knepper, for instance, compares what he calls “traditions of philosophy of religion,” under which heading he includes, as representative examples, East Asian, South Asian, Mediterranean/Abrahamic, African, Indigenous American, and European/Academic philosophies of religion (Knepper 2023: 15).

Since the distinction between a religion, or a religious idea, and a philosophy of religion, or a philosophical idea about religion, is not always sharp, there will be occasions when there is a merging of the two meanings of “comparative philosophy of religion” that have just been outlined. As Victoria Harrison remarks, “the global philosophical project … will inevitably involve the practitioner with religious ideas simply because the world’s philosophical traditions are permeated with them” (2020: 29). If, for example, one were to compare the ideas of Śaṅkara (c. 8th century CE) with those of Thomas Aquinas (1225–1274 CE)—as some scholars have done (e.g., Willman-Grabowska 1938; Smet 2013)—would one be comparing religious ideas or philosophical ones? The answer is apt to depend on exactly which ideas one is concerned with. On the face of it, however, there is unlikely to be only one answer, for both Śaṅkara and Aquinas are commonly regarded as religious as well as philosophical thinkers. Furthermore, some would argue that the very distinction between religion and philosophy is a product of European modernity (e.g., Howard 1996; King 1999: 4–5).

In principle, comparative philosophy of religion could involve comparing ideas from two or more philosophical or religious thinkers from within the same cultural tradition. For example, the views of al-Fārābī (870–950 CE) on the relation between reason and revelation might be compared or contrasted with those of Ibn Rushd (1126–1198 CE) (see, e.g., Kurmanaliyeva 2021), even though each of these thinkers belongs to the tradition of Islamic philosophical theology. More often, however, comparative philosophy of religion compares ideas from thinkers or schools of thought located in different traditions. For this reason, the terms “cross-cultural philosophy of religion” (Clayton 2006; Maharaj 2018) or “intercultural philosophy of religion” (Garsdal 2012; Mosima 2022) are sometimes used in place of “comparative philosophy of religion.”

1.2 Descriptive and Normative Approaches

The term “cross-cultural philosophy of religion” has occasionally been preferred to “comparative philosophy of religion” on the grounds that “comparative” has become associated with a “descriptive or phenomenological approach” whereas cross-cultural philosophy of religion is a normative enterprise that seeks to evaluate the truth-claims of various religions (Dean 1995: 3–4). Although there is indeed a notable divergence between approaches that emphasize description and classification, on the one hand, and those that emphasize normative evaluation and construction, on the other, it would be misleading to assume that the terms “comparative” and “cross-cultural” are used universally to designate these respective approaches. Some philosophers of religion readily embrace the term “comparative philosophy of religion” while nonetheless regarding philosophy as being necessarily concerned with “evaluative questions of meaning, truth, and value” (Knepper 2017: 1–2; see also Braak 2020: 21).

1.3 Dialogue Rather than Comparison?

Some works of comparative philosophy of religion are composed in explicitly dialogical form (see 2.2 below). Even when the style of textual composition is not dialogical, however, works of comparative philosophy of religion may be regarded as dialogical in an extended sense of the term. Gamwell describes comparative philosophy of religion as “interreligious dialogue that has become critical reflection” (1994: 21); as he sees it, the comparative enterprise involves bringing different religious voices into implicit dialogue with one another and critically reflecting upon their similarities and differences (22). John Clayton, following Wilhelm Halbfass, understands his own comparative exercises as the pursuit of “dialogic comparison by constructing imaginary conversations between major thinkers” (Clayton 2006: 102; compare Halbfass 1997: 307). For both Halbfass and Clayton, these imagined conversations are “between major thinkers of the European and Indian traditions” (Clayton 2006: 102), but in principle they could be between thinkers from any place or time.

Raimundo Panikkar preferred the term “dialogue” to “comparison” because he held that “comparison” implies, per impossibile, adopting a detached and neutral standpoint from which to observe and evaluate the merits of two or more positions (1980: 357, 358). Panikkar’s favoured image is that of an “encounter” between dialogue partners, who meet one another on an equal footing (1999: 26). If the exchange of ideas proceeds in terms of reasons and arguments, then Panikkar calls this “dialectical dialogue”; if it takes a more directly interpersonal form—getting to know the other as a “you”—then Panikkar calls it “dialogical dialogue” (ibid.). Even if it remains difficult to transfer this model of verbal interaction to the written page, its emphasis on mutual understanding and reciprocal progress towards a shared goal—without simply glossing over genuine differences—evokes a sensibility that authors such as Halbfass and Clayton have sought to emulate.[1]

2. Comparative Philosophy of Religion in Historical Perspective

2.1 Early Sources

How far back we should assign the origins of the branch of philosophy known as “philosophy of religion” is a contested matter. As some have observed, philosophical arguments and speculations relevant to religion are traceable to the earliest known Western philosophers in ancient Greece (Oppy and Trakakis 2009). Similar claims have been made about other ancient traditions, such as those of India and China, where the origins of philosophy were bound up with methods of “self-cultivation,” as indeed they were in ancient Greece and Rome (Gowans 2021; Machek 2024). There are thus good reasons for regarding philosophy of religion as having emerged alongside, or as part of, philosophy tout court.

So, too, are there good reasons for viewing philosophy of religion as having had a comparative dimension from ancient times onwards. We see this in, for example, early doxographies in ancient Greece and Rome. A doxography is a text that provides an overview of the key doctrines or tenets of one or more philosophers, thinkers, or schools of thought.[2] In addition to ancient Greek and Roman sources, doxographies are also available from medieval India, compiled by figures in the Brahmanical, Buddhist, and Jain traditions. Given the fluidity between philosophy and religion in the ancient and medieval periods, both the Greco-Roman and the Indian doxographies commonly amount to works of comparative philosophy of religion. They typically place divergent views in juxtaposition to one another, often in a partisan way—for example, ranking systems of thought on a scale from least to most credible—but sometimes in ways that are designed simply to highlight salient similarities and differences. One illustrative example from the ancient Greco-Roman world is Cicero’s De Natura Deorum (“On the Nature of the Gods,” 45 BCE), which takes the form of a dialogue between representatives of Epicureanism, Stoicism, and Academic Scepticism on theological and related topics (Cicero DND). A further example is Stromateis (“Patchworks,” c. late 2nd to early 3rd centuries CE), attributed to Clement of Alexandria, which lays out several Christian themes (faith, marriage, martyrdom, God’s ineffability, sin, the nature of Christ) while contrasting Christian views with those of Greek philosophers, poets, and other writers (Clement of Alexandria S).

Indian doxographies include Madhyamaka-hṛdaya-kārikā (“Verses on the Heart of the Middle Way”) by the Mādhyamika Buddhist Bhāviveka (8th century CE); Ṣaḍ-darśana-samuccaya (“Collection of the Six Views”) by the Jain philosopher-monk Haribhadra (8th century CE); and Sarva-siddhānta-saṃgraha (“Compilation of All Philosophical Conclusions,” c. 10th–14th centuries CE) by a representative of the Advaita Vedānta school who has been traditionally, albeit almost certainly apocryphally, identified as Śaṅkara (see, e.g., Raṅgācārya 1909). Despite structural, stylistic, and sectarian differences between these texts, it has been argued by certain interpreters that they share a driving soteriological purpose: readers are “trained to elevate [their] view, through a systematic dialogue with competing opinions,” and to thereby make progress towards a liberated state of wisdom (Bouthillette 2020: 21).

2.2 The Dialogue Form

Composing texts in dialogue form has been a prevalent means of undertaking comparisons in both European and Indian philosophical traditions, for dialogues enable different philosophical or religious viewpoints to be juxtaposed with one another. An example from ancient India is the dialogue depicted in the Bṛhadāraṇyaka Upaniṣad (c. 8th century BCE) between the female sage Gārgī and the male sage Yājñavalkya. Gārgī pushes her questioning about the foundation of the universe so far that Yājñavalkya ends the discussion by telling her that if she asks too many questions, her “head will shatter apart!” (Olivelle 1996: 40). Further examples featuring characters that embody different viewpoints or social positions include the respective dialogues between a Brahmin named Soṇadaṇḍa and the Buddha in the Buddhist Dīgha Nikāya (c. 1st century BCE) and between a king named Janaka and a female ascetic named Sulabhā in the Brahmanical epic Mahābhārata (c. 4th century BCE to c. 4th century CE). In the first of these, the Buddha convinces Soṇadaṇḍa that morality and wisdom rather than caste status are the essential qualities of a Brahmin (Shulman 2017: 379); in the second, Sulabhā argues that spiritual liberation can be attained only through renunciation and that, for this reason, a king cannot be liberated (Black 2015).

A distinction may be made between didactic forms of dialogue, whose purpose is to show the superiority of the position of one of the interlocutors, and contemplative or impartial dialogues, which are more even-handed in their presentation of the competing positions. Instances of the didactic variety include some of the dialogues by Plato, such as Phaedo and Republic, in which the character Socrates appears to be “a Platonic mouthpiece” (Morgan 1992: 233); other characters act as foils, whose questions are responded to by Socrates and whose counterclaims serve only to show the more compelling force of Socrates’ arguments. Instances of contemplative dialogues include Cicero’s De Natura Deorum (mentioned in 2.1 above), the style of which influenced David Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion (1779; see 2.3 and 5.3 below). Clayton characterizes this contemplative style as “a kind of invitation to a conversation that is projected beyond the text at hand,” “an invitation to participate in a process of philosophizing” (Clayton 2006: 104).

2.3 Modern European Comparative Philosophy of Religion

David Tracy has argued that the figures who are primarily responsible for giving rise to philosophy of religion “as an autonomous and modern discipline” are David Hume, Immanuel Kant, and G. W. F. Hegel in the eighteenth and early nineteenth centuries, and that each of these three figures pursued a fundamentally comparative approach (Tracy 1990: 12–13).[3] In the case of Hume, the comparative method is explicit in his The Natural History of Religion (1757 [1956]) and implicit in the dialogical form of his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion (1779) (Tracy 1990: 19). The purpose of the former of these works is to show that religion has its origins not in reason but in human nature, with its hopes and fears. In developing the argument, Hume examines different types of polytheistic and monotheistic religion, formulating an evolutionary theory of how, notwithstanding some toing and froing between the two, monotheism superseded polytheism. The Dialogues, by contrast, examine reasons for and against holding a belief in God, with a particular focus on arguments that have come to be known as “teleological” or “design” arguments. By giving voice to divergent viewpoints through invented characters, Hume brings the particularities of each position into relief.

In the case of Kant, Tracy points to several factors that indicate his “interest in comparativist issues”: these include Kant’s lectures on Eastern religions; his curiosity with reports by travellers and explorers; remarks in his Opus postumum (OP) on Zoroaster and Job; and “his insistence, in Religion Within the Limits of Reason Alone [1792], that his philosophical analysis of religion applied not only to Christianity but to all the religions” (Tracy 1990: 19). Tracy admits, however, that Kant’s principal concern in the latter work is to provide a “philosophical elucidation of the Christian religion” (1990: 21), a concern that restricts the scope of Kant’s comparative interests.

Hegel, too, gives pride of place to Christianity, “The Consummate Religion” (Die vollendete Religion) (Hegel LPR: Part 3). For Hegel (as paraphrased by Thomas Lewis), “The consummate religion is the one in which religion’s object is not simply the object itself, ‘God,’ but also the consciousness of this object”—and Hegel maintains that it is in Christianity that “God and consciousness of God” are unified (Lewis 2011: 205). Hegel’s comparative analysis of religions such as Buddhism, Hinduism, and Judaism, along with the religions of China, ancient Egypt, Greece, and Rome, occurs in Part 2 of his Lectures on the Philosophy of Religion, in which he devises a typology of “Determinate Religion” (LPR: Part 2). As Tracy contends, “at his elucidatory best,” Hegel was at the forefront of “developing a comparative hermeneutics of the historical religions” (Tracy 1990: 25). At the same time, however, Hegel was prone to ignore such factors as “historical context,” “internal developments and differences in distinct strands of a religious tradition,” and “the religions as living religions” (Tracy 1990: 25). Thus, although Hegel was a pioneer in comparative philosophy of religion, he left room for improvement in his methods of analysis.

2.4 Twentieth- and Twenty-First-Century Developments

Influential figures in comparative philosophy of religion from the twentieth century onwards—even if not all of them would identify primarily as philosophers—include Nishida Kitarō (1870–1945), Sri Aurobindo (1872–1950), Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan (1888–1975), Wilfred Cantwell Smith (1916–2000), Raimundo (aka Raimon) Panikkar (1918–2010), John Hick (1922–2012), Ninian Smart (1927–2001), Keith Ward (b. 1938), Robert Cummings Neville (b. 1939), and Arvind Sharma (b. 1940). For reasons of space, the exposition here will focus on Nishida, Aurobindo, Radhakrishnan, and Smart, who together represent a diversity of approaches. (For more on Panikkar, see 1.3 above; for more on Hick, see 3.3 below.)

Nishida was an independently minded Japanese philosopher who drew upon ideas from both Western and Asian philosophical and religious sources. Regarding religion as “the ultimate view of the world and the most important question” (quoted in Yusa 1987: 63), Nishida developed a philosophy of religion that, while invoking Christian and Buddhist ideas, is not reducible to one tradition or the other. Key themes for Nishida include the notions of “absolute nothingness” and the “absolute present,” each of which is connected with what Nishida understood the Zen Buddhist state of enlightenment or “seeing one’s nature” (kenshō) to consist in (Nishida 1945 [1987: 108]). Although, for Nishida, religion amounts to the human quest for eternal life, he maintained that eternity is to be found not in a state of existence after death, but in the durationless present instant. Borrowing imagery from Christian theologians such as Nicholas of Cusa, Nishida describes this “eternal present” as an infinite circle or sphere: because it “has no circumference, every point, every act of consciousness, is a center radiating in infinity” (Nishida 1945 [1987: 53–54]). Having been one of the main founders of the Kyōto School of philosophy, Nishida has inspired subsequent generations of Japanese philosophers, some of whom, such as Abe Masao (1915–2006) and Ueda Shizuteru (1926–2019), have themselves made significant contributions to comparative philosophy of religion and Buddhist-Christian dialogue (see, e.g., Mitchell 1998; Davis 2022).

Aurobindo Ghose, better known as Sri Aurobindo, was a visionary philosopher for whom the integration of what he viewed as the materialistic tendencies of Western thought and the spiritual tendencies of Asian, especially Indian, thought was central to his philosophical project. He developed a conception of spiritual discipline that he termed “integral Yoga,” which he regarded as a synthesis of the various systems of yoga that have been advanced in India over many centuries (Aurobindo 1999: chap. 5). This discipline is “integral” insofar as its aim is to integrate the bodily, mental, and divine aspects of one’s life, and “to liberate them into their highest possibilities” (1999: 19). Aurobindo’s philosophy has frequently been termed “integral philosophy” (e.g., Banerjee 2012; Prince 2017) since it, too, seeks to integrate elements from diverse sources. His facility with Western as well as Indian philosophical and religious ideas enables Aurobindo to draw upon both in formulating his own constructive vision; for example, he identifies the concept of “Supreme Brahman” with “that which in Western metaphysics is called the Absolute” (Aurobindo 2005: 338). Aurobindo conceived of philosophy as a spiritual discipline, “an effort at inner perfection of the being” (2005: 912). In common with later thinkers such as Pierre Hadot (1995), he views this spiritual orientation as being present in ancient Greek and Roman schools of philosophy (such as the Pythagorean, Stoic, and Epicurean schools), as well as in certain strands of “later Christian or Neo-pagan” thought; but, again like Hadot, he regards this orientation as having been lost in modern Western philosophy, wherein “the spiritual urge and the intellectual reason” have largely “parted company” (Aurobindo 2005: 912). For this reason, Aurobindo accentuates the benefits of a “fusion” between “the old Eastern and the new Western knowledge” as a means of investigating how that which is eternal and infinite gives rise to, or manifests as, time and space (2005: 122).

Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan was both a philosopher and a politician. Among other positions, he held the Spalding Chair of Eastern Religion and Ethics at the University of Oxford from 1936 to 1952 and was President of India from 1962 to 1967. His interest in comparative philosophy and religion is evident from the titles of some of his books, such as East and West in Religion (1933), Eastern Religions and Western Thought (1939), and East and West: Some Reflections (1955). Radhakrishnan’s view of religion is comparable to the later religious pluralism of John Hick (3.3 below). “Religious experience is not the pure unvarnished presentment of the real in itself,” he writes, “but is the presentment of the real already influenced by the ideas and presuppositions of the perceiving mind” (Radhakrishnan 1927: 24). In some places, Radhakrishnan, like Hick, implies that all religions—or all the major ones—are on an equal footing when it comes to conceptualizing reality or the divine truth: “While all traditions are of value, none is finally binding” (Radhakrishnan 1937: 120). Elsewhere, he gives pride of place to the Hindu philosophical school of Advaita Vedānta, which, he claims, “is not a religion, but religion itself in its most universal and deepest significance” (1927: 23). The “idealist view of life,” of which Advaita Vedānta is a paradigm case, has, however, taken many forms in different times and places—forms which, despite their “variations and oppositions,” share “the same spirit” (1937: 16). Radhakrishnan was a strong advocate of cooperation between Western and Asian societies in both the practical and the intellectual domains. “The separation of East and West is over,” he wrote in 1955, “The history of the new world, the one world, has begun. It promises to be large in extent, varied in colour, rich in quality” (1955: 131).

Ninian Smart was a major figure in twentieth-century philosophy of religion and in the study of religions more broadly. His approach was comparative from the outset; for example, his first book was a comparative study of Christian and non-Christian discourse (1958), and his second takes the form of an imagined conversation between six representatives of different religious traditions: a Jew, a Christian, a Muslim, a Hindu, a Sri Lankan Theravāda Buddhist, and a Japanese Mahāyāna Buddhist (Smart 1960). Smart held that “philosophers of religion … cannot ignore the comparative study of religions” because seeking the truth of religion requires comparing the reasons for favouring one purported revelation over others (1960: 11). Smart’s notable contributions to comparative philosophy of religion include his phenomenological method, his multidimensional analysis of “the sacred,” and his expansive notion of a philosophy of worldviews. Notwithstanding Smart’s concern with religious truth in some of his works, his phenomenological method, adapted from the earlier phenomenological tradition of Edmund Husserl and others, involves “bracketing” questions of truth while describing religious phenomena in sufficient depth to convey “what it is like” to participate in religious activities (Smart 1973: 33, 75). Such a method, Smart maintains, has the potential to facilitate widening the scope of philosophy of religion; by “stepping back” from any specific religious commitment, the phenomenologist may describe and compare multiple religions (1973: 7). Smart’s multidimensional analysis goes beyond a fixation on theoretical or doctrinal aspects of religion, taking account also of other “dimensions of the sacred” (1996), such as the ritual, mythic, experiential, ethical, social, artistic, and political dimensions. Religions may be compared in relation to each of these (and other) dimensions. Finally, Smart’s promotion of the study of worldviews encourages the comparative investigation of human systems of belief and practice in general, including those such as nationalism and secular humanism, rather than focusing solely on religions (Smart 1981, 2000). This approach of Smart’s is one that continues to be developed further by others (e.g., Davies 2022; Stenmark 2022); it is also becoming increasingly popular in educational settings (see O’Grady 2022).

In addition to specific authors such as those mentioned above, it should be noted that the twentieth and twenty-first centuries have also produced eminent events, projects, journals, and book series that have made substantial contributions to comparative philosophy of religion. Notable events include the series of East–West Philosophers’ Conferences sponsored by the Department of Philosophy at the University of Hawai‘i, beginning in 1939. Out of this series grew the journal Philosophy East and West, founded in 1951. Although the focus of the journal is not specifically religion, many of its articles will be of interest to philosophers of religion.

In the 1990s and in 2001, two book series in comparative philosophy of religion were published by State University of New York Press. The first series, titled “Toward a Comparative Philosophy of Religions,” was led by Frank Reynolds and David Tracy of the University of Chicago Divinity School; it produced four edited volumes and nine single-authored monographs between 1990 and 1999. The second series was titled “The Comparative Religious Ideas Project.” Based at Boston University, the project produced three mutually complementary volumes in 2001, edited by Robert Neville (2001a,b,c).

Since 2012, the Comparison Project based at Drake University, Des Moines, Iowa, has hosted series of lectures and conferences in which different religious and philosophical perspectives are offered on issues of religious importance. Publications produced by the project include edited volumes on ineffability (Knepper and Kalmanson 2017), death and dying (Knepper, Bregman, and Gottschalk 2019), miracles (Zwier, Weddle, and Knepper 2022), and mysticism (Weed 2023).

From 2020 to 2023, the Global Philosophy of Religion Project, funded by a grant from the John Templeton Foundation, was led by Yujin Nagasawa at the University of Birmingham, UK. Outputs included special journal issues, videos, and a major open-access edited volume titled Global Dialogues in the Philosophy of Religion (Nagasawa and Zarepour 2024).

Besides Philosophy East and West, other relevant journals include Sophia: International Journal of Philosophy and Traditions (founded in 1962), Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy (founded in 2001), and Comparative and Continental Philosophy (founded in 2009), as well as the various journals that specialize in philosophy of religion.

3. Synthesizing Approaches to Comparison

A broad distinction can be drawn between two different orientations in comparative philosophy of religion. On the one hand are synthesizing approaches, which emphasize similarities between religious or religiously relevant philosophical ideas that derive from distinct traditions. On the other hand, there are heterogenizing approaches, which emphasize dissimilarities between such ideas. Although the differences between these alternative orientations are indeed largely a matter of emphasis, their respective emphases are often correlated with specific methodological preferences and aspirations.[4] This and the next section give representative examples to illustrate the two orientations in question.

3.1 Arthur Schopenhauer

The work of Schopenhauer (1788–1860) exemplifies a synthesizing approach to comparative philosophy of religion inasmuch as it draws upon ideas and doctrines from various religious and philosophical traditions—most notably Platonism, Kantian idealism, Indian Vedānta, and Buddhism—for the purpose of developing or augmenting what Schopenhauer describes as his own “organic” system of thought (1818 [1969: xii]). Schopenhauer’s philosophical productiveness flourished at a time—the early nineteenth century—when many texts from Asia, especially India, were reaching European readers for the first time; the efforts of translators and philologists were generating what came to be known as the “Oriental Renaissance” (Schwab 1950). Schopenhauer especially admired the ancient Indian scriptures known as the Upaniṣads, which he read in a Latin translation (which was itself rendered from a Persian edition rather than from the original Sanskrit); this edition, he declared, “has been the consolation of my life and will be that of my death” (1851 [1974: 397]).[5]

While incorporating references to Buddhist, Vedāntic, Platonic, and Kantian sources into his work, Schopenhauer viewed his own philosophical contribution as going beyond or perfecting those sources. For example, despite concurring with Buddhist and Vedāntic injunctions to renounce attachments and cultivate a desireless state of mind, Schopenhauer thought that proponents of these philosophies remained too attached to the promise of a positive state beyond renunciation: they were prone to fool themselves with “meaningless words, such as reabsorption in Brahman, or the Nirvana of the Buddhists,” whereas, for Schopenhauer, we should not be afraid to affirm that “the final goal” is “nothingness” (1818 [1969: 411]). Thus, Schopenhauer was not an uncritical appropriator of his sources: he was a constructive metaphysician who was pioneering in his openness to religious and philosophical ideas from outside his own nineteenth-century Germanic context.

3.2 Perennial Philosophy

The term philosophia perennis, “perennial philosophy,” is often assumed to have been “coined by Leibniz” (Huxley 1945 [1947: 1]; Bilimoria 2003: 360 n. 1). Although Leibniz does speak of perennis quaedam Philosophia (“a certain perennial philosophy”) in a letter to Nicolas-François Rémond in 1714 (Leibniz PS: 625), the term goes back at least as far as the Italian humanist theologian Agostino Steuco (1497–1548), who published a treatise titled De perenni philosophia in 1540 (Schmitt 1966: 506–507). From the early twentieth century onwards, proponents of the idea of a perennial philosophy (or “perennialists,” for short) have maintained that multiple philosophies and religions share a common core of doctrines that are grounded in a transcultural religious or mystical experience. Aldous Huxley, for example, characterized the perennial philosophy in terms of its metaphysical, psychological, and ethical components. Metaphysically, there is a “divine Reality” underlying all things; psychologically, there is a component of the soul that is at least similar and perhaps identical to that divine Reality; and ethically—or, we might say, soteriologically—the goal of life is to achieve knowledge of the Reality or “Ground of all being,” which is simultaneously transcendent and immanent (Huxley 1945 [1947: 1]). Together, these components constitute the “Highest Common Factor” at the heart of all theologies (ibid.).

Any attempt to substantiate the claim that ostensibly diverse religions, philosophies, or theologies in fact share common teachings or are simply different paths to the same destination inevitably requires comparative inquiry. Huxley quotes passages from sources as varied as the Christian mystics Meister Eckhart and William Law, the Brahmanical Chāndogya Upaniṣad and Vivekacūḍāmaṇi, the Daoist Zhuangzi, and the Mahāyāna Buddhist Laṅkāvatāra Sūtra (Huxley 1945 [1947: 8–14]). While admitting that differences of doctrine obtain between these sources, Huxley’s approach is to minimize the differences by seeking interpretations that accentuate commonalities. For example, in the case of the apparent divergence between Hindu affirmations of an eternal self (ātman) and Buddhist denials of any such self, Huxley proposes that these respective positions are reconcilable by prioritizing the specifically Advaita (nondualist) Vedānta doctrine that only the nonpersonal or cosmic “Self” is eternal and a certain understanding of Mahāyāna Buddhism according to which there is a “Universal Mind,” which is comparable to the “Self” of Advaita (Huxley 1945 [1947: 15–16]).

Perennialism—especially under the name “Perennial Psychology” (Forman 1998: 28)—remains prominent in the study of mysticism, where it takes the form of opposition to a competing view called contextualism. Contextualists (also termed, by their opponents, constructivists) maintain that mystical experiences are necessarily “mediated” or “shaped” by concepts that mystics inherit from their cultural environment (Katz 1978: 26). In response, perennialists assert that there really is a mystical state of consciousness that transcends conceptual mediation and is common to multiple traditions. To identify this “wakeful though contentless” state, Robert Forman coined the term “Pure Consciousness Event (PCE)” (1990: 8). Both sides in the debate engage in comparative analysis of relevant religious sources, though Forman (1990: 28) also appeals to a purportedly mystical experience of his own.

3.3 Religious Pluralism

Following some terminology coined by Alan Race (1983), philosophical or theological theories about religious diversity are frequently divided into three main categories: exclusivism, inclusivism, and pluralism.[6] In brief, exclusivists hold that only one religion is the true one that leads to salvation; inclusivists hold that only one religion is wholly true but non-adherents of that religion may partake of enough truth (or right action, etc.) to be saved; and pluralists hold that there is some sense in which more than one religion is both true and salvific. Holding any of these positions—and claiming to be justified in holding it—presupposes some knowledge of more than one religion. It is thus unsurprising that debates between exclusivists, inclusivists, and pluralists typically involve interreligious comparison. The most thoroughgoing comparativists tend to be the religious pluralists, for developing a credible argument that more than one religion is true and salvific requires extensive comparative analysis.

By far the best-known religious pluralist is John Hick, who argued that, as far as metaphysical truth, soteriological efficacy, and ethical rectitude are concerned, there is parity between all the “great world faiths” (or “great world religions”) (e.g., Hick 2010: 153; Hick 2004: xxxiii et passim). For Hick, the latter category includes Hindu, Buddhist, Christian, Jewish, and Muslim traditions; he also occasionally mentions other traditions, such as Daoism, Confucianism, and Sikhism (e.g., 2004: 2, 39). He draws a broad distinction between these “great” traditions, on the one hand, and the various forms of “archaic” or “primal” religion, on the other (2004: xiii, 23). So-called archaic religions are “pre-axial,” in the sense that they are characteristic of human religiosity prior to what Karl Jaspers dubbed the “axis of world history,” which he located in the period between 800 and 200 BCE, with 500 BCE being its fulcrum (Jaspers 1953: 1). Hick identifies small-scale indigenous religions of the present day as being continuous with those “archaic” religions; instead of being directed towards a salvific end, these remnants of pre-axial religions are concerned merely with maintaining “fragile human life on an even keel” (2004: 23).[7]

According to Hick, what distinguishes the “post-axial” or “great” traditions from the “pre-axial” or “archaic” ones is not only their global spread but also their soteriological ambitions: they all aim at “salvation/liberation/enlightenment” (2004: xl)—a state of ultimate human fulfilment—and they all affirm some supreme reality. Although the names and ways of conceptualizing this reality vary—Trinity, Allāh, Adonai, Brahman, Śūnyatā—there is, Hick contends, a single “transcategorial (or ineffable) Real” behind all these conceptions (xix). Borrowing vocabulary from Kant, Hick claims that the Real is noumenal whereas the sundry conceptions of it are phenomenal appearances (xix). Hick’s pluralism is thus a synthesizing approach insofar as it prioritizes the search for a unifying element that all the “great” religions have in common.[8]

3.4 Problem-Solving Approaches

Among the approaches to comparative philosophy of religion that are, to some extent, responses to the kind of pluralism advocated by Hick are what might be called problem-solving approaches. Yujin Nagasawa explicitly contrasts his preferred version of global philosophy of religion with those of Hick and Ninian Smart. Although the latter two philosophers had sought to incorporate interreligious perspectives into their work, they still operated with the assumption that philosophy of religion ought to be concerned with establishing “the validity of particular worldviews or traditions” (Nagasawa 2017: 45). Nagasawa’s alternative proposal involves a reorientation away from the comparative evaluation of existing systems of thought and practice, and towards collective reflection upon common philosophical or existential problems. “It would be fruitful,” he writes, “if philosophers from distinct traditions were to share their resources and tackle the common problems together” (2017: 45). As an example of a common problem, Nagasawa cites the problem of evil, his thought being that this problem might be responded to more proficiently by combining the efforts of, among others, Christian, Muslim, Jewish, Hindu, and Buddhist philosophers than by trying to solve it from only one religious or philosophical standpoint (46). Although there have been instances in which a philosopher draws upon ideas from ostensibly disparate traditions—such as Carlo Filice’s effort to supplement Abrahamic monotheisms with the idea of reincarnation (Filice 2006)—what Nagasawa has in mind is something more collaborative.[9] One way of pursuing such a collaborative venture is in the form of dialogue, where an initial proposal is made by one philosopher and then responded to by others, building up a multiperspectival analysis of a given topic (see, e.g., Nagasawa and Zarepour 2024).

4. Heterogenizing Approaches to Comparison

4.1 Internalist Pluralism

“Internalist pluralism” is a term coined by Victoria Harrison to designate an approach to the analysis of religious diversity that is inspired by Hilary Putnam’s theory of internal realism. Putnam contrasts his “internalist perspective” with an “externalist” one (1981: 49). The latter maintains that, first, the world is made up of “some fixed totality of mind-independent objects”; second, “the way the world is” is amenable to a single “true and complete description”; and third, truth consists in correspondence “between words or thought-signs and external things and sets of things” (49). The internalist view, by contrast, affirms that the question of what objects the world comprises makes sense only within some specific “theory of description” or “conceptual scheme” (1981: 49, 52).

Applying Putnam’s internal realism to the study of religions, Harrison contends that if the question of what exists, or what is real, cannot be addressed in a way that is “conceptual-scheme neutral,” then the meaningful discussion of whether, or what, “religious realities” exist can occur only internally to some specific “conceptual scheme or, what we might call, a ‘faith-stance’” (Harrison 2006: 292). For Harrison, “faith-stance” is not a synonym of “religion”; rather, any given religion may be constituted by several more-or-less overlapping faith-stances—or, in other words, by several more-or-less overlapping conceptual schemes (2012: 76). Nonetheless, a deliberate consequence of Harrison’s view is that what at first may appear to be disagreements between distinct religions are merely instances of members of the religions talking past one another, because each party in the purported dispute is operating from within a distinct conceptual scheme. Thus, for example, if a Hindu affirms that Śiva is the true god, whereas a Roman Catholic denies this and instead affirms that the true god is the Trinity of Father, Son, and Holy Spirit, these competing affirmations amount to a mere difference rather than to a genuine disagreement. From the perspective internal to the community of worshippers of Śiva, it is indeed the case that Śiva is the true god; and from the perspective internal to Roman Catholicism, it is the case that the Holy Trinity is the true god. There would be disagreement here only if the two communities shared the same conceptual scheme, but, Harrison contends, they do not (Harrison 2006: 293).

An implication of Harrison’s internalist pluralism for comparative philosophy of religion is that diverse religions, or faith-stances, may be compared, and their respective particularities highlighted, without any insinuation being made that there is some ultimate reality, transcendent of all conceptual schemes, to which religious concepts and beliefs are accountable. A potential objection might take the form of the observation that, in many cases, religious disputes do seem to involve genuine disagreement rather than mere differences. Even if we admit that when they affirm their respective beliefs, the Hindu and the Christian, the Buddhist and the Muslim, are operating with different concepts—perhaps even from within different conceptual schemes—it remains the case that each of them has much in common with the others: they all share a human form of life, and that involves sharing many concepts. Further work may thus be needed to show how, in view of this shared human framework, it may nevertheless be the case that apparent disagreements over religious matters are not genuine disagreements at all.[10]

4.2 Radical Pluralism

In the context of philosophy of religion, the term “radical pluralism” has become associated principally with the Wittgenstein-influenced philosopher D. Z. Phillips. (But see also Bilimoria 1991; Jeanrond and Rike 1991.) In a posthumously published essay, Phillips (2007) uses the terms “radical pluralism” and “radical plurality” to identify both the situation in which many people in the modern world find themselves—immersed in cultures that exhibit a radical diversity of religious and other ideological perspectives—and a distinctive philosophical approach to the analysis of this condition of diversity. Like internalist pluralism, the philosophical approach in question is comparative and nonreductive; but unlike internalist pluralism, it makes no claims to the effect that the various religious or ideological perspectives constitute a set of distinct and nonoverlapping conceptual schemes. A radical pluralist approach is “contemplative” rather than metaphysical in its aspirations, prioritizing the understanding of religious and nonreligious points of view in their particularities instead of seeking to establish a general theory about the nature of religion, the truth of religious beliefs, or the efficaciousness of religious practices.

Developing Phillips’s ideas further, Mikel Burley has combined philosophical analysis with the use of ethnographic and literary sources to expand the range of religions and religious phenomena to which philosophical attention can fruitfully be given (esp. Burley 2020). While admitting that the primary purpose of the resultant methods is to describe rather than evaluate, Burley maintains that description can itself serve a critical function. Not only can it bring out the complexity and diversity of phenomena that may previously have been assumed to be largely homogeneous—thereby disabusing us of misplaced assumptions about the phenomena in question—but description of a variety of beliefs, practices, or forms of life also exposes the contingency of those of oneself and one’s culture, calling into question the naturalness or necessity of one’s attitudes and norms.[11]

It has also been argued that the sort of radical pluralist approach recommended by Phillips provides a basis for the pursuit of interreligious dialogue. According to Randy Ramal, it can supply this basis by disclosing the “unreflective and primal religious reactions” that may reasonably be regarded as giving rise to diverse religious concepts across various religious traditions (2019: 136–137). To illustrate the point, Ramal suggests that the human primal reaction of feeling shame at being seen naked by those other than one’s most intimate acquaintances may lie at the root of certain religious attitudes towards nudity. Although significantly different attitudes are displayed by, for example, Christians and Digambara Jain monks, a recognition of basic human reactions may help to overcome the tendency to see “only incommensurability between their different forms of life” (Ramal 2019: 154). The overriding goal of a radical pluralist approach is thus to draw attention to differences where they obtain but without unduly rejecting the possibility that common aspects of our shared humanity underlie the plurality of expressions of religiosity.

5. Comparative Studies of Specific Religious Issues

Comparative philosophy of religion is a potentially vast subfield of inquiry. To illustrate its potential, there are numerous examples that could be cited of comparative philosophy of religion being done. This section mentions a representative sample.

5.1 Personal Identity, the Self, and Death

One rich vein for religiously relevant comparative philosophical investigation is the cluster of questions concerning personal identity and the notion of a self. These questions often bear upon the issue of what, if anything, persists of a human being once the physical body has expired. A pioneering work in this connection is John Hick’s Death and Eternal Life (1976), which comprises an extensive survey of various conceptions of death, postmortem continuation, and what it might be that survives. The principal traditions expounded by Hick include those of Christianity, Hinduism, and Buddhism, his ambition being to advance “a possible eschatology” (1976: chap. 22) in which, synthesizing elements from the diverse traditions, he tentatively puts forward his own best estimate of what happens to us after death. In brief, his conclusion is that some form of reincarnation is plausible, facilitating “moral and spiritual growth of one and the same self through many lives” (457), and that this growth leads ultimately to a final life or state of being, to which Hick is willing to apply, without any demarcation, terms such as “Vision of God,” “nirvāṇa,” “eternal consciousness of the ātman [‘self’] and its relation to Ultimate Reality” (464).[12]

More recently, the potential of fruitful cross-cultural comparisons relating to concepts of selfhood and subjectivity has been explored, notably by specialists in Indian and Buddhist philosophy, analytic philosophy of mind, and phenomenology. Typifying such interdisciplinary work is the volume Self, No Self? (Siderits et al. 2011), which, though not styled overtly as philosophy of religion, nonetheless grapples with questions of profound importance for religious practitioners. These include the question of whether, if being conscious of something is necessarily accompanied by self-consciousness or self-awareness, this would constitute “evidence for the existence of a self” (Siderits et al. 2011: 1). Such questions quickly take us into, for example, long-running disputes between Buddhist and non-Buddhist philosophers in the Indian and Asian context more broadly.[13]

5.2 Comparative Religious Ethics

In a comparative study of Xunzi (third century BCE) and Augustine of Hippo (354–430 CE), Aaron Stalnaker makes the perceptive observation that the two most salient challenges faced by works of comparative ethics are, first, to “bring distant ethical statements into interrelation and conversation,” and second, to “simultaneously preserve their distinctiveness within the interrelation” (Stalnaker 2006: 17; see also Cline 2013: 64). These challenges could well be said to apply to comparative philosophy—and a fortiori to comparative philosophy of religion—more generally.

Comparative studies in ethics or moral philosophy frequently have relevance to philosophy of religion, not least because, in many religious traditions, cultivating a virtuous character or performing morally right actions are among the means—and are sometimes the primary means—of progressing along the spiritual path. Some comparative works in this area identify two or more named representatives of distinct yet comparable ethical positions. Lee Yearley (1990), for example, provides a sustained comparative analysis of the positions of the fourth-century Confucian philosopher Mencius (Mengzi) and the thirteenth-century Dominican philosopher and theologian Thomas Aquinas. With particular attention to their respective theories of virtue and conceptions of courage, Yearley’s approach combines descriptive exposition with constructive synthesis. He aims to “chart similarities within differences and differences within similarities” while also arriving at “normative conclusions” that emerge from the comparison (1990: 1).

A similar approach is exhibited by Asher Walden (2015), who selects four philosophers from ostensibly disparate historical and cultural contexts—namely, Zhu Xi (twelfth-century China), Schopenhauer (nineteenth-century German Confederation), Śāntideva (eighth-century India), and Nishida Kitarō (twentieth-century Japan)—and compares their respective responses to the question of what justifies moral judgment. Notwithstanding the differences between the four philosophers under examination, Walden finds in each of them the affirmation of compassion as “a kind of meta-virtue” that furnishes the “basis for all the other virtues” (2015: viii). The fact that there is some degree of confluence between philosophers from diverse times and places is, of course, not in itself an argument for the truth of the claims that they make, and Walden does not suppose that it is. Nevertheless, the four-way comparative analysis deployed by Walden is one effective means of showing how a similar solution to a problem can be arrived at from different angles.

The concept of compassion (karuṇā) also has a prominent place in Ok-sun An’s book-length treatment of the relation between this concept as it occurs in early Buddhism and the notion of benevolence (jen or ren 仁) in Confucianism (An 1997). By means of interpretive exposition and comparative analysis, An calls into question oversimplifying assumptions, notably the assumptions that early Buddhism is solely concerned with individual liberation from the cycle of rebirth and that Confucianism is exclusively directed towards self-effacing service of the social order.[14]

5.3 Religion and (or beyond) Rationality

Since philosophy is a discipline concerned in large part with giving reasons and formulating arguments, it is little surprise that central among the preoccupations of philosophy of religion has been the construction or evaluation of reasons and arguments for certain religious beliefs, typically presented in propositional form.[15] Works in comparative philosophy of religion also often involve the comparison of arguments or “acts of religious reason-giving” (Knepper 2023: 58). John Clayton (2006), for example, undertakes a comparison of the respective arguments against natural theology in David Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion (1779) and Rāmānuja’s eleventh- or twelfth-century commentary on the Brahma Sūtra. Clayton finds similarities in the reasons of these philosophers for rejecting purported rational proofs of the existence or nature of the divine. Through the character of Philo, Hume expresses scepticism that any knowledge of God can be gained via inference or perceptual experience. Rāmānuja, likewise, denies that Brahman is knowable by these means; in doing so, he anticipates Hume’s principal objections to the “design argument” (Clayton 2006: 132). Unlike Hume, however, Rāmānuja maintains that knowledge of Brahman is received from scripture, “which rests on endless unbroken tradition” (Rāmānuja VS [1904: 25], quoted in Clayton 2006: 111).

Along with Rāmānuja, other philosophers who are sympathetic to religion while denying that religious beliefs are rationally supportable include Zhuangzi (4th century BCE) and Søren Kierkegaard (1813–1855). Karen Carr and Philip Ivanhoe (2000) argue that each of these latter two philosophers, in his own way, presents us with a form of “antirationalism.” By this, Carr and Ivanhoe mean not that rationality is entirely rejected, but that it is found to be “not only inadequate but potentially inimical to a proper appreciation of the truth” (2000: 118). While there is implicit agreement between Zhuangzi and Kierkegaard that reason cannot lead us to ultimate truth (or salvation), the respective “positive prescriptions” of these two thinkers diverge (2000: 119). Zhuangzi proposes leaping into and harmonizing one’s life with the dao—the “boundless Way” (120). Kierkegaard’s leap is the leap of Christian faith, in which one wholeheartedly commits one’s life to God. By means of their joint study, Carr and Ivanhoe exemplify a way of not only bringing Daoist and Christian perspectives into constructive comparative dialogue, but of doing so through the collaboration of scholars with different areas of expertise.

5.4 Concepts of Belief, Knowledge, and Witchcraft

Comparative studies involving African philosophies are growing in prevalence, and many of these are relevant to philosophy of religion. (See, e.g., Okafor 1997; Agada 2022; Stacey 2022.) One of the most long-term and impressive projects in this area remains the investigation of Yorùbá epistemological concepts carried out from 1974 to 1984 by Barry Hallen and J. Olubi Sodipo (1997). Deploying a method that they termed “collaborative analysis” (1997: 121), Hallen and Sodipo undertook extended conversations with respected figures in Yorùbá society known as oníṣẹ̀gùn (“masters of medicine”). Data were gathered and analyzed concerning the criteria that apply to the use of terms in the Yorùbá language that are typically translated into English as “knowledge,” “belief,” and “witch.” The conclusion of the study was that assumptions on the part of previous Anglophone researchers about the supposed universality of the concepts expressed by the latter English terms “have led to fundamentally false interpretations and analyses of Yoruba thought” (1997: 122).

Without denying the semantic overlap between the relevant English and Yorùbá vocabulary, Hallen and Sodipo argue that propositional attitudes such as those expressed by the English phrases “I believe that …” or “I know that …” ought to be viewed as culturally relative (124). Similarly, in the case of the Yorùbá term àjẹ́, which has routinely been translated into English as “witch,” Hallen and Sodipo maintain that this translation is misleading insofar as it tends to carry with it assumptions that are foreign to the Yorùbá context. When an African social group is attributed with the belief in witchcraft, Hallen and Sodipo observe, “The Western intellectual’s attitude is more or less a ‘Thank goodness we don’t believe in that anymore’, and that a society that does is primitive, sick and inhuman” (118). By contrast, for the Yorùbá spokespeople with whom Hallen and Sodipo conversed, àjẹ́ has a range of meanings that include someone who uses their medicinal abilities “for the welfare and benefit of mankind” (117). Perceptively, Hallen and Sodipo note that discovering the breadth of the concept of àjẹ́ ought to prompt those who regard “witchcraft” as expressing “a conceptual and cultural universal” to reflect upon the range of meanings that “witch” can have, and has had, in Western contexts (117); what remains problematic, as Hallen and Sodipo see it, is the uncritical application of potentially misleading translations without due attention to cultural specificities.

6. Challenges for Comparative Philosophy of Religion

6.1 The Eurocentric Legacy

One type of complaint against comparative philosophy of religion is that it all-too-often involves projecting or imposing culturally European—or, more broadly, Western—categories onto other cultures while assuming that those categories are universal and normative. An equivalent complaint has long been raised against the enterprises of “comparative theology” and “comparative religion,” which have been accused of assuming some version of Protestant Christianity to be the paradigm of what a religion is and then looking around to see the extent to which other religions satisfy, or fail to satisfy, the criteria laid down by that paradigm (Hedges 2022: 53). In the case of comparative philosophy of religion, Purushottama Bilimoria, from the perspective of postcolonial theory, identifies the standard Eurocentric categories as including, among others, “God (the Absolute or the Transcendent), Creation, the Problem of Evil, the Afterlife, Immortality, Sin, Redemption, Purpose, and the End” (Bilimoria 2003: 343). By assuming that these are the categories—or, at any rate, the primary categories—in terms of which religions, and philosophical analyses of religions, ought to be compared and appraised, comparative philosophers of religion (so the accusation goes) have biased their inquiry in favour of Western forms of Christianity from the outset.

One possible response to the charge of Eurocentrism (or Eurohegemony—cf. Masuzawa 2005: 29) would be to point out that neither Christianity as a whole nor Protestant Christianity in particular is solely Western, still less solely European. Christianity is itself a global phenomenon, having originated in the Middle East and spread across all the inhabited continents of the world. To conflate Christian categories with Western or European categories is thus itself a category mistake. The proponent of the charge could reply, however, that it is specifically Western forms of Christianity that tend to be presupposed in much philosophy of religion, part of the problem being that Western philosophers of religion have given insufficient attention to the diversity of Christianities, let alone the numerous other religions that exist. A consequence of this presupposition is that it is not merely Christian categories that have predominated in comparative philosophy of religion, but, more narrowly, a subset of Western Christian categories.

Even so, regardless of whether the charge is one of Eurocentrism, Western-centrism, or Christian-centrism, it does not amount to a charge against the viability of comparative philosophy of religion per se; it can be construed as a call for reform and revision—an insistence that participants in this field of study should critically interrogate their own conceptual categories and assumptions. This is precisely the call made by, for example, Sonia Sikka and Ashwani Kumar Peetush when, with reference not only to comparative philosophy of religion but to philosophy of religion across the board, they maintain that “philosophy of religion cannot be made more inclusive simply by inserting a wider number of ‘religions’ into the category slots of the subject as currently constituted. The shapes of the slots themselves need to be altered to fit varieties of beliefs and practices configured differently than Christianity” (Sikka and Peetush 2021: 2).

The demand for greater inclusivity is sometimes phrased in terms of “decolonization.” Leah Kalmanson (2017), for instance, utilizes the terms “dharma” (with reference particularly to Buddhism) and “dao” (with reference to Daoism) and raises the question of why these and other non-English terms should not be prioritized over the term “religion” when undertaking comparisons in philosophy of religion. In deploying the terms “dharma” and “dao,” Kalmanson aims not at “diversification but decolonization”; she intends to counter “the realities of ongoing power differences in academia” through her choice of words that do not contribute to “hegemonic practices” (2017: 255). Such moves, away from concepts expressed in European languages and towards the recognition of non-European “ways of knowing,” accords with broader academic trends that seek “to deconstruct and decentre the Eurocentric image of the world” (Afolayan, Yacob-Haliso, and Oloruntoba 2021).

6.2 Doing Violence to the Integrity of Traditions?

A potential objection that might be targeted most specifically at the kind of problem-solving approach to comparative philosophy of religion advocated by Chakrabarti and Weber (2016) and by Yujin Nagasawa (2017) is that such an approach fails to respect the integrity of religious or philosophical traditions. Chakrabarti and Weber envisage research projects in which the emphasis is placed on “solving hitherto unsolved problems” in philosophy without making any claim to be providing “‘correct exposition’” of the traditions from which ideas are being borrowed (Chakrabarti and Weber 2016: 22). The danger of this blasé attitude to accurate exposition is that ideas may end up being borrowed in ways that uproot them from the very cultural, religious, and philosophical contexts that give them the sense that they have.

The charge of doing violence to the integrity of traditions resembles the charge of “cultural appropriation,” which is held to occur when members of one culture appropriate, in the sense of illicitly adopt, ideas or practices from another culture. Cultural appropriation is widely regarded as especially pernicious when those who are doing the appropriating belong to a culture that is economically and politically more powerful than the one from which the ideas or practices are being appropriated. One thing that practitioners of comparative or cross-cultural philosophy of religion can do to avoid being guilty of illicitly appropriating ideas from other cultures is to give due attention to the cultural contexts in which the ideas they are discussing have their original place. Another option is to pursue Nagasawa’s aim of developing collaborative ventures in which conceptual and theoretical resources are shared by philosophers from different traditions to address common issues (see 3.4 above). Although this emphasis on collaboration circumvents the obvious danger of simply appropriating ideas from multiple traditions without bothering to expound the ideas correctly, it nonetheless presupposes the feasibility of combining ideas from disparate contexts without thereby diluting or distorting their respective meanings. It also presupposes that there are “common problems” which take sufficiently similar forms across diverse religious and philosophical traditions to be amenable to collective solutions. The fruitfulness of such collaborative philosophizing ought not to be prejudged, but will no doubt be shown through exemplary cases.

Before assuming that what has come to be designated as cultural appropriation is in every case malign, it should be acknowledged that views differ on this matter among certain marginalized or subordinated groups themselves. For example, notwithstanding many protests concerning the adoption by outsiders of the ceremonial items or practices of Native American peoples, “a significant minority” of these peoples welcome participation in “the red road” (that is, Native American ways of life) for the engendering of a more harmonious relationship with the earth (Taylor 1997: 187; see also Brunk and Young 2009: 96). This is among the vital lessons that comparative philosophy of religion, when done well, can teach us: that religious and philosophical traditions are rarely, if ever, homogeneous phenomena—they are likely to be internally complex and variegated.

6.3 The Entanglements of Traditions

The charge that there is anything suspect about bringing ideas from different religious or philosophical traditions into relation or into dialogue with one another becomes still less forceful when one acknowledges the extent to which these “traditions” have already undergone processes of mutual influence and intermingling over the long course of history. As the editors of a volume on world philosophy put it, “the notion of hermetically sealed traditions in parallel development is largely a historical fiction” (Edelglass and Garfield 2011: 4). A similar contention is made by Omedi Ochieng in a book on the “good life” in African philosophy: against those who assume that “Western”—or, as Ochieng prefers, “North Atlantic”—philosophy is the paradigm tradition of philosophy that was then exported to other countries and continents, Ochieng argues that “the North Atlantic canon” is itself “inextricably bound and indeed constituted by the presence of Africans, Asians, Arabs, Native Americans, and so on” (Ochieng 2017: 5). By this, Ochieng means that even in texts where the peoples heralding from places outside the North Atlantic region are not overtly referred to, such texts are nonetheless written with an implicit awareness of the lives and ideas of those peoples. Through the notion of a mutually constitutive relationship, Ochieng seeks to avoid oversimplified representations such as that of different “orders of incommensurable discourses” or, at the other extreme, traditions that are “subsumable or reducible to one another” (2017: 5–6).

The recognition of the “entanglement” (Chakrabarti and Weber 2016: 5) or “intertwinement” (Ochieng 2017: 6) of traditions need not vitiate the project of comparative philosophy of religion, but it does necessitate a degree of subtlety on the part of those who carry out the exercise. A balance must be struck that, as Ochieng recommends, avoids the extremes both of treating traditions—whether religious or philosophical—as incomparably alien to one another and of regarding them as mutually indistinguishable. It is possible to engage in comparison without assuming that what are being compared run on entirely separate tracks.

6.4 The Difficulty of Acquiring Expertise in Multiple Traditions

A final challenge for comparative philosophy of religion—although it is perhaps the first challenge faced by anyone who attempts to undertake this kind of philosophy—is the sheer difficulty of gaining sufficient expertise in more than one religion, or in more than one tradition of philosophizing about religion, to do justice to the subject matter under investigation. Clayton remarks that “The ideal would be, from intimate knowledge of several traditions, to develop a reflective style that is global and not simply bi-cultural”; he is quick to add, however, that this ideal “is just that — an ideal” (Clayton 2006: 101). In other words, no matter how much any one philosopher may aspire to develop extensive knowledge of multiple traditions, it is unlikely that this will be widely achieved; thus two-way (bicultural or bi-religious) comparisons may have to suffice for most budding comparative philosophers. This is especially true of the contemporary era, when there are career-related pressures for academic philosophers to become hyperspecialized in only one or two areas of philosophy, lest they fail to keep up to speed with the rapidly growing literature in their subfield.

Nonetheless, those who call for an expansion or diversification of philosophy of religion—regardless of whether they apply the term “comparative philosophy of religion” to that expansive endeavour—rarely demand that individuals should become experts in multiple religions or philosophical traditions. What is normally proposed is that the field of philosophy of religion as a whole should expand its parameters, the aim being for the field to become more welcoming of a variety of perspectives and topics of inquiry. The result might be that, collectively, philosophers of religion could legitimately claim that their branch of philosophy takes into account the whole gamut of religions—the “spectrum of worldviews” (Vroom 2006)—or at least a representative selection of them, rather than only a small minority or an unduly abstract conception of “theism.” Comparative philosophy of religion is indeed a collective enterprise, for it is only through the participation of many contributors that a rich understanding of the phenomenon of religion, and the plurality of religions, can be cultivated.

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