Notes to Comparative Philosophy of Religion

1. Affinities between Panikkar and Halbfass on this matter are accentuated by Clooney 1997: 34.

2. The term “doxography” derives from doxographi, which was coined by Hermann Diels (1879) to denote authors of such texts, principally with reference to ancient Greek authors.

3. See also H. E. Root (1956: 7): “It could well be claimed that Hume’s two complementary works, The Natural History of Religion and the Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, mark the beginning of what is now generally, if loosely referred to as the philosophy of religion.”

4. For alternative ways of categorizing different approaches to comparative philosophy of religion, see Cheetham 2008; Griffiths 2010.

5. Schopenhauer’s praise for the Latin translation of the Upaniṣads is accompanied by a dismissive attitude towards “Jewish superstition … and all philosophy that slavishly serves this” (1974: 397).

6. This threefold typology is not accepted universally. For critical assessments, see several of the contributions to Harris, Hedges, and Hettiarachchi 2016.

7. For reservations about the “Axial Age” theory, see Tsonis (2012) and Hoyer and Reddish (2019).

8. For exposition of other perspectives on religious pluralism in addition to that of Hick, see the essays in Knitter 2005.

9. Accounts of dual- or multi-tradition approaches that lack the collaborative dimension envisaged by Nagasawa include what Chakrabarti and Weber (2016: 21–22) describe as the fourth of four “stages” of comparative philosophy; this involves “appropriating elements from all philosophical views and traditions one knows of” for the purpose of “solving hitherto unsolved problems.” For this fourth stage, Chakrabarti and Weber borrow Mark Siderits’s term “fusion philosophy” (compare Siderits 2015: 1–4).

10. For a critical appraisal of Harrison’s internalist pluralism, see Burley 2019.

11. For critical discussion of Burley’s approach, see Schilbrack et al. 2021.

12. The terms are transliterated here as nirvāṇa and ātman with the standard diacritical marks. These marks are omitted in Hick’s text.

13. Other publications dealing with conceptions of self, personal identity, and related themes in a comparative manner include Ganeri 2012; Kuznetsova et al. 2012; Siderits 2015.

14. Other comparative studies of Buddhism and Confucianism include Shuming (1989) and Cokelet (2016).

15. Hence phrases such as “reason and religion” or “reason and religious belief” feature prominently in the titles of many books on philosophy of religion (see, e.g., Cahn 2006; Peterson et al. 2012; Rescher 2013; Philipse 2022). No doubt the penchant for alliterative book titles also has a bearing on the prevalence of such titles.

Copyright © 2025 by
Mikel Burley <m.m.burley@leeds.ac.uk>

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